The Ethics of Abortion

First published Wed May 14, 2025

Abortion is the intentional termination of a pregnancy, either via surgery or via the taking of medication. Ordinary people disagree about abortion: many people think abortion is deeply morally wrong, while many others think abortion is morally permissible. Philosophy has much to contribute to this discussion, by distinguishing and clarifying different arguments against abortion, distinguishing and clarifying different responses to those arguments, offering novel arguments against abortion, offering novel defenses of abortion, and offering novel views about the relevant issues at stake.

This entry’s central question is: is abortion morally wrong? This question has important legal and political implications. If abortion is morally wrong, it is nevertheless an open and further question whether abortion should be outlawed or legally restricted in some way. It is also a substantive question how a society should decide whether to outlaw or restrict abortion. This entry focuses on the moral question and does not delve into these important legal and political questions.

The first six parts of this entry present six arguments against abortion. Subsections of those parts present responses to these arguments – that is, defenses of abortion. The seventh part discusses why the ethics of abortion matters.

1. The argument from a right to life
2. The argument from loss
3. The argument from the Golden Rule
4. The argument from intrinsic value
5. The argument from moral risk
6. The expressive argument against selective abortion
7. Why the ethics of abortion matters
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1. The argument from a right to life

Let’s start by considering the following argument:

1.: The fetus is a person.
2.: All persons have a right to life.
3.: Therefore, the fetus has a right to life.
4.: It is morally wrong to kill something that has a right to life.
5.: Abortion kills the fetus.

Therefore, abortion is morally wrong.

This argument has some real intuitive appeal. Abortion is the killing of a human being, so it does seem to be the killing of a person. In general, it is wrong to kill persons; it does seem that all persons have a right to life.

We’ll consider five lines of objection to this argument.

1.1 The equivocation objection

We might object to the argument from a right to life by arguing that the argument equivocates. The word “person” could have two different meanings for the purposes of the argument. Suppose that “person” means any animal that is a human being; on this reading, saying a being is a person tells us what species the being is. It is on this reading that claim 1 is obviously true: it says that the fetus is human. But suppose that “person” means “moral person” or something with full moral status – something that counts fully for moral purposes, the way that an ordinary adult human being counts. It is on this reading that claim 2 is obviously true: it says that all moral persons have a right to life. The objection is that the argument is only plausible if claim 1 is interpreted with one meaning of “person” and claim 2 is interpreted with another meaning of “person”.

What this objection shows is that the argument from a right to life, as we have presented it, has two different versions. One version of the argument uses “person” to mean “human being” throughout. For this version of the argument, premise 2 is a controversial assumption: it says that all human beings, even early human fetuses, have a right to life. Another version of the argument uses “person” to mean “moral person” or “being with full moral status.” For this version of the argument, premise 1 is a controversial assumption: it says that all fetuses, even the early human fetuses that die in first-trimester abortions, have full moral status.

This objection shows that the argument from a right to life has (at least) one controversial assumption: either premise 1 or premise 2 is controversial.

1.2 The violinist case objection

Suppose that a famous violinist is very sick with a serious kidney disease. All medical records have been searched, and you are contacted with the following surprising request: would you please come stay in the hospital for nine months, lying in a bed next to the violinist, so that your kidneys can cycle his blood? You are the only person who is the right match to help him, and after nine months he will have made a full recovery. You think it over, and reluctantly decline. While you would love to help another person, spending nine months in the hospital is a huge sacrifice that you are not prepared to make. The next day after you decline, you wake up in the hospital, attached to the violinist. It turns out that the Society of Music Lovers kidnapped you. The doctor tells you that, while it was wrong to kidnap you, it would also be wrong for you to unplug yourself: the violinist needs to stay attached to you for nine months, or he will die. If you unplug him, you would be killing him, and he has a right to life. While you have a right to control what happens in and to your body, his right to life is surely stronger.

What may you do in this case? Surely you may unplug yourself. (So claims Thomson 1971, which introduced this famous case.) But this shows that the argument we have been considering, the argument from a right to life, does not succeed. The violinist does have a right to life; yet it is permissible to kill him. Thus, it is not always true that one may not kill another human, just because that human has a right to life. The violinist case appears to show that claim 4 of the argument from a right to life is false. (The violinist case also undermines another claim, the claim that it’s not okay to violate one person’s right to life for the sake of a weaker right; this is the claim that Thomson aims to undermine, when she offers the case.)

Note that the violinist case objection defends abortion while granting the claim that the fetus has a right to life. The objector claims that even if the fetus has a right to life, it simply does not follow that abortion is morally wrong.

Consideration of this case may adjust our moral framing of the choice whether to abort a fetus. While it is natural to see this simply as a choice whether to kill a living being, reflection on the violinist case may lead us to see it rather as a choice whether to provide life-sustaining aid to a living being – with the further fact that one must kill that being to avoid providing the aid.

1.2.1 Response from consensual sex

The violinist case might appear to defend abortion only in the case of rape. It may seem to be important to the case that you were taken into the hospital against your will.

Thus, one might respond to the violinist case by offering a different argument against the permissibility of abortion:

1.: A pregnant woman who has consensual sex is responsible for the fetus’s dependence on her body.
2.: If you are responsible for someone’s dependence on something of yours, then it is morally wrong to deprive him of that thing.

Therefore, abortion is morally wrong.

To respond to this new argument, we might consider the following variant of the violinist case. Suppose that after you declined to help the violinist, you heard that the Society of Music Lovers was planning to kidnap you. You could stay home, in which case you would be safe. Or you could go about your normal life, with some hired bodyguards, hoping that any kidnapping attempt would fail. You choose to go about your normal life, with the bodyguards, and yet you are kidnapped and hooked up to the violinist. Surely in this case (the argument goes), you may still detach from the violinist, thereby killing him. This is true even though your choice to go about your normal life was a cause of your kidnapping, and in that sense you are responsible for the situation in which the violinist is dependent on you. Thus, claim 2 is shown to be false: although you are responsible for his dependence, you may deprive him of your aid. Surely a woman who has sex with contraception is no more responsible for the fetus’s dependence on her than you are in this variant of the violinist case; thus, claim 2 is false as applied to her case as well. (For further discussion of the responsibility objection, see Kamm 1992 and Boonin 2003.)

Perhaps surprisingly, one thing that emerges from considering this worry is that it may matter whether having sex is a central and important life activity, such that abstaining from sex would be a significant burden. In the variant of the violinist case, it may be important that staying at home to avoid kidnappers would be onerous. Would refraining from sex similarly be onerous?

(A different argument regarding responsibility holds that a pregnant woman is a mother to the fetus and has the role-based duties associated with that relationship. But that assumes that there is already, and will be in the future, a meaningful relationship between the woman and the fetus. See Little 1999.)

1.2.2 Does the violinist case provide its own positive argument?

So far we’ve discussed the way that the violinist case can be used to defend the permissibility of abortion in the face of the argument from a right to life. We might also consider using the violinist case in an argument to establish that abortion is morally permissible:

1.: If abortion is morally wrong, then it’s morally wrong to detach oneself from the violinist.
2.: It’s not morally wrong to detach oneself from the violinist.

Therefore, abortion is not morally wrong.

This argument isn’t made in Thomson 1971, but it is worth considering. Much of the discussion about whether the violinist case provides an effective response to the argument from a right to life will also shed light on whether this is a sound argument. What are the differences between the abortion case and the violinist case? Do they make a moral difference?

1.3 What is a right to life?

One might object to the argument from a right to life by probing the question of what a right to life is, and what kinds of duties it creates in others. This probing may provide another way of rejecting premise 4.

We can begin by noting that a right to life is not a right to be given whatever is necessary to sustain one’s life. If a person is dying, and all that she needs to save her life is the touch of (famous actor) George Clooney’s hand on her forehead, then nevertheless she has no right that he come to her bedside to cure her with his touch. (See Thomson 1971, page 55.) Similarly, the famous violinist mentioned above has no right to the use of your kidneys to cycle his blood. And he has no right that you remain attached to him – even though detaching yourself deprives him of what is necessary to sustain his life.

For a yet more fanciful example, suppose you are trapped in a tiny house with a rapidly growing child. The house is very small, and the child is extremely large – if his growth continues unchecked, he will crush you to death. The child himself will be unscathed; eventually he will grow big enough that the house will burst apart and he will walk free. Does the child’s right to life mean that you cannot defend yourself from the threat he poses to you? Must you simply submit to die in this way? Surely not, Thomson 1971 argues.

It might seem that a right to life is at least always a right not to be killed. But it is not always wrong to kill another person, even though that person has a right to life. If someone attacks you, and the only way to defend yourself is to kill him, then you may kill him. And consider again the violinist: detaching yourself kills him, yet it is permissible to detach yourself. These observations might seem to show that if someone has a right to life, it is not simply wrong to kill them, but rather it is wrong to kill them unjustly. Perhaps a right to life is merely a right against being unjustly killed (Thomson 1971). But if that is correct, then the argument from a right to life needs a different premise:

5*.: Abortion kills the fetus unjustly.

This premise is much more controversial than the original premise.

Can self-defense justify abortion?

Some of the cases we have just been considering involve innocent threats and the idea that a being with full moral status can become liable to be killed in self-defense even when they are morally innocent. For example, the growing gigantic child who will crush you in your house unless you kill him first is not blameworthy for posing a threat to you; but he poses a threat nonetheless.

The idea that the fetus has full moral status from the moment of conception can actually be used to argue for the permissibility of abortion, as follows. Pregnancy itself is caused by the embryo, which implants into the woman’s uterus. If the fetus is an independent person, then it is like a mentally incompetent agent who perpetuates an illicit bodily intrusion against a woman, and then starts redirecting vital resources and nutrition away from her. Understood in this way, ending pregnancy is simply defending oneself against attack from another independent being. (See McDonough 1996.)

But one might deny that morally innocent threats can be treated in the way that morally guilty threats can be treated – at least when it comes to what third parties may do. Consider the following view: a person who is threatened by an innocent threat may kill to save her own life, but a third party may not choose sides between the innocent threat and the innocent potential victim. On this view, the threatened person has a mere “agent-relative permission” to defend herself: while she can defend herself, that does not mean that a third party can also act to defend her. (By contrast, it is of course true that a third party can act to defend someone against a culpable assailant.) If this view is right, then we cannot use the idea of self-defense to defend ordinary surgical abortion in the face of the argument from a right to life. While granting that women would be morally permitted to perform abortions on themselves, it would not follow that doctors are permitted to perform abortions. (See Davis 1984. For the view that doctors can act as the pregnant woman’s agent in her self-defense, see English 1975.)

What should we think about this worry?

First of all, it is important to note that the reframing of abortion that the violinist case suggests need not be understood in terms of “self-defense”; rather, abortion is reframed as fundamentally about the withdrawal of aid.

Second, it is implausible that mere moral innocence renders a threat immune to attack from third parties. It does seem that a temporarily insane person who rushes at an innocent person can be killed by anyone, not just by the attacked person; this seems true no matter how blameless the attacker is. (For more on innocent threats, see Frowe and Parry 2024.)

1.4 Potentiality

The objections we considered in sections 1.2 and 1.3 granted the claims that fetuses are persons, and that persons have a right to life: these objections granted claims 1, 2, and 3 of the argument from a right to life. Let’s turn now to considering a challenge to claim 3, which holds that fetuses have a right to life. The objector holds that having the potential to become a being with a right to life (or with full moral status) is not sufficient to currently have a right to life (or to currently have full moral status).

(Note that this objector will also deny either claim 1 or claim 2. They will deny claim 1 if it is read as the claim that fetuses have full moral status, or they will deny claim 2 if it is read as the claim that all human beings have a right to life. See section 1.1.)

We’ll consider two different challenges to the idea that potentiality is sufficient for a right to life.

1.4.1 The kitten serum case objection

Suppose that there was a serum we could inject into kittens that would make them into cognitively sophisticated cats; these cats would be as intelligent as human adults, and they would have the emotional complexity that human adults have. One of these cats would surely have full moral status; it would surely have a right to life. (So claims Tooley 1972, which introduced this famous case and offered the following argument.) While we would have strict moral duties concerning these cats, just as we have strict moral duties regarding other persons, we would not have any duty to turn kittens into these sophisticated cats: we would not be obligated to inject any kittens. Furthermore, if a kitten were injected, but the serum had not yet had any effect, it would be morally permissible to inject a neutralizing agent that would prevent the serum from working; this would be just as permissible as failing to inject. A kitten who had been injected with the serum plus a neutralizing agent would be just like any ordinary kitten. Kittens have no right to life: there is no moral requirement to refrain from painlessly killing them (so the argument goes). But now consider a kitten that has just been injected with the serum. It has the potential to have a right to life. But it lacks a right to life: it is morally permissible to inject the neutralizing agent and then to painlessly kill it; this would not be morally permissible if it had a right to life. So the kitten that has just been injected with the serum is a counterexample to the claim that a being with the potential to have a right to life must already have a right to life. (This is the argument of Tooley 1972.)

For those who believe we may painlessly kill kittens, this argument poses a powerful challenge to the idea that fetuses have a right to life. But the rhetorical effectiveness of this argument may be greatly diminished by the fact that nowadays, many people think that animals do have a right to life, or at least that there are strong moral reasons against killing animals even painlessly.

Perhaps a variant of the argument can nevertheless gain some traction, even with those who believe that kittens do have a right to life. Consider the view that all conscious animals have a right to life, but that some animals have only a low level of moral status, while other animals have a high level of moral status. On such a view, it is natural to think that kittens have a low level of moral status, compared to the full moral status that adult humans have. If we consider the kitten serum case, it does seem right that we are not morally obligated to inject any kittens with the serum, and also that it would be morally permissible to inject a neutralizing agent after injecting the serum. But this does seem to show something about potentiality – it seems to show that having the potential to have a certain level of moral status does not already give a being that level of moral status. Consider a kitten that has just been injected with the serum. It has the potential to become a being with full moral status. If it already had full moral status, surely it would be wrong to inject the neutralizing agent, thus depriving it of the rich experiences that greater cognitive and emotional sophistication would provide. But it is permissible to inject the neutralizing agent; thus it does not already have full moral status.

Thus, even without the assumption that kittens lack a right to life, the kitten serum case can provide something important: an argument that the potentiality to have a certain level of moral status is not sufficient for already having that level of moral status. (This argument may provide a good response to other arguments against abortion, even if it does not engage the argument from a right to life.)

1.4.2. The actual future principle

Another objection denies the significance of the fetus’s potential future by contrasting it with the significance of the fetus’s actual future. Arguments for the claim that potentiality is sufficient for moral status may include claims such as “the fetus is the beginning stage of a person.” But this is not true for all fetuses. Some fetuses are the beginning stages of persons; the fetus that became you was the beginning stage of a person. But many fetuses are not; for a fetus that dies early in pregnancy, there is no person such that they were the beginning stage of that person. On one view, it is not potential future personhood but actual future personhood that makes for moral status: according to the Actual Future Principle, pre-conscious fetuses that will become persons already have moral status, while pre-conscious fetuses that will die as pre-conscious fetuses lack moral status. (See Harman 1999, which introduces the Actual Future Principle and argues that the Actual Future Principle makes sense of various commonly-held but apparently conflicting claims, such as the following two claims: that early abortion requires no moral justification, while nevertheless it is appropriate to love (and wrong to harm) those early fetuses that are being carried to term.)

1.5 The self-consciousness objection

Another objection to the argument also targets claim 3, that fetuses have a right to life. This objection holds that for a being to have a right to something, the being must desire that thing. But to desire to continue to live, one must have a conception of oneself as a being that persists through time. Fetuses lack any such conception. Therefore, they lack a right to life. (See Tooley 1972, which also argues that human infants lack a conception of themselves and thus argues that infanticide is morally permissible.)

A distinct objection arises from the weaker claim that to have moral status or a right to life, a being must be conscious (if not necessarily self-conscious), because to have any interests at all a being must be conscious. Since early abortions kill fetuses that are not yet conscious, this view defends abortion in these cases. (See Steinbock 1992.)

1.6 The miscarriage objection

Here is yet another objection to claim 3. If fetuses are really full moral persons with a right to life, then whenever a miscarriage occurs, it is a tragedy just like the death of any person. But miscarriage is very common; at least ten percent of pregnancies end in miscarriage. This would make miscarriage the greatest moral tragedy, and the greatest public health crisis, that we face. (See Berg 2017.) But this simply isn’t true, so claim 3 must be false.

2. The argument from loss

Consider the following argument:

1.: Abortion deprives the fetus of a valuable future.
2.: Killing an adult human is wrong (unless justified) because it deprives them of a valuable future.
3.: If what makes killing an adult human wrong (unless justified) is present in another activity, then that activity is also wrong (unless justified).

Therefore, abortion is wrong (unless justified).

To understand this argument, let’s start by considering the claim that killing an adult human is wrong unless justified. What does this say? The claim says that it is normally wrong to kill an adult human, while acknowledging the reality that there are cases in which it is permissible to kill an adult human; in these cases, there is some justification for the killing. (See section 1.3 for discussion of the related fact that even though persons have a right to life, it is sometimes morally permissible to kill them.) (Sometimes philosophers talk of something’s being wrong unless justified by saying it is “pro tanto wrong”.)

The central innovation of this argument against the moral permissibility of abortion is that it proceeds without claiming that the fetus is a person, that the fetus has moral status, or that the fetus has a right to life. It seeks to show that abortion is wrong (unless justified) without a detour into those thorny issues. (The argument was introduced by Marquis 1989. Relatedly, Quinn 1984 uses a close examination of identity over time to argue that the fetus suffers a significant loss in abortion.)

The argument from loss is intuitively compelling. It is hard to explain our reasons against killing adults without appealing to what adults lose in death. And when a fetus is killed in an abortion, it loses a tremendous amount – it loses out on (at least a good chance of) life as a person. Not only does the fetus lose the same thing an adult loses, but the fetus loses more of that thing.

2.1 The moral status objection

However, the argument’s apparent escape from the thorny issue of personhood and moral status may be an illusion. One might object to premise 2 of the argument as follows. When we ask what makes it wrong to kill a person, the fact that the person is deprived of a valuable future is only a partial answer. This explains why the person’s death is bad for them. But what gives us a compelling moral reason? That the person has moral status and that death is bad for them are the two facts that together provide the compelling moral reason, the objection asserts.

The objector maintains that premise 2 is false, and that it would have to be revised as follows to be true:

2*.: Killing an adult human is wrong (unless justified) because it deprives them of a valuable future and they have moral status.

The argument thus needs an additional premise:

4.: A fetus has moral status.

But claim 4 is controversial, and is exactly the controversial claim on which the argument hoped to avoid relying.

2.2 The future-like-ours objection

Another objection takes aim at premise 1 of the argument from loss. This objection denies that abortion deprives the fetus of a valuable future. Now, it might seem obvious that abortion does deprive the fetus of a valuable future. After all, if it were not for the abortion, the fetus would very likely go on to have a normal life as a person, and a person’s life is well worth having, even given the various hardships that people endure. The objector agrees to all of that. What the objector denies is that the fetus now has that future, and that the fetus is deprived of that future. The objector claims that ordinary persons have a future that they lose in death because ordinary persons bear strong psychological and neurophysiological connections to their immediate futures, and overlapping chains of such connections to their more distant futures. Ordinary persons in the immediate future will remember the present, and will have the same desires and intentions as in the present. Furthermore, ordinary persons have some control (but of course not total control) over how their futures develop. The objector claims that it is these connections with the future that mean that a person now has a future that they can lose. By contrast, fetuses early in pregnancy do not have experiences that can be remembered, they certainly do not have desires or plans, and they have no capacity to control what happens to them. Thus, the objector claims, they do not now possess futures that they can lose. (See McInerney 1990.)

Similarly, one might object to premise 1 by saying that while the fetus does lose out on a future life, that loss is of little significance to the fetus currently. The “time-relative interests view” (McMahan 2002) holds that how much something good or bad in my future matters to me now depends on the level of psychological connection between me now and me when I would have that future experience. A good thing that would happen to me far in the future, when I am a very different person, is less in my own interests now, than something else which is less valuable but would happen sooner, to a version of me that is more like my current self. On this view, the pre-conscious fetus has no interest in any of its valuable future, since it has no psychological connection at all to that future. Even a fetus with some consciousness still has virtually no psychological connection to its future, in that its future self will not remember its current life; so it also has no interest in getting to have that future life (DeGrazia 2007).

2.3 How this relates to the violinist case argument

The argument from loss is often taught to students alongside the argument from the violinist case (see section 1.2). Since the first argument is against abortion, and the second argument defends abortion, the two arguments might appear to disagree. It is important to see that they do not. The argument from loss concludes with the claim that abortion is wrong unless justified. But this is the very same assumption that the violinist argument grants to opponents of abortion. The argument from loss seeks to make the case that there’s a strong reason against abortion. The violinist case argument grants that there is a strong reason against abortion, and argues that nevertheless abortion can be defended. (Marquis 1989 includes a brief paragraph stating the assumption that if there is a strong reason against abortion, then, all things considered, abortion is wrong; no argument for this is given, and Thomson 1971 is not cited or discussed.)

3. The argument from the Golden Rule

Consider the following argument:

1.: We should treat others as we would want to be treated ourselves. (The Golden Rule.)
2.: We are glad that we were not aborted.

Therefore, we should not abort others.

There is some intuitive plausibility to this argument. (The argument is offered by Hare 1975.) The claim that we should treat others as we would want to be treated ourselves does seem right. Teaching children the Golden Rule is a useful way of teaching them to treat other children nicely.

Like the argument from loss, this argument aspires to settle that abortion is morally wrong without addressing the thorny question of whether a fetus is a person, or has moral status. If the Golden Rule is all we need, then we can side step these thorny issues.

But the apparent side step may not work. An objector may say that claim 1 is implausible when taken with sufficiently wide scope. Is “others” meant to range over all things? All living beings? It is too controversial in that form. Surely the plausible version of claim 1 is this:

1*.: If a being has full moral status, then we should treat it as we would want to be treated.

This claim captures that we should treat persons as we would want to be treated. It does not say anything about how we should treat animals, if they have some moral status but not full moral status. (And that’s good: the Golden Rule is not very plausible when applied to animals. We should not treat animals the way we treat people. Or alternatively, “the way we would want to be treated” would mean “if we were animals”; but then we wouldn’t really know what to say about that: it wouldn’t provide guidance.)

But if the argument includes claim 1* rather than claim 1, then the argument needs the following claim:

3.: Fetuses have full moral status.

Thus, the argument can be rejected simply by rejecting the claim that fetuses have full moral status. (See Harman 2009, footnote 12.)

4. The argument from intrinsic value

Consider the following argument:

1.: It is wrong to destroy something with intrinsic value, absent justification.
2.: Human life has intrinsic value.

Therefore, abortion is wrong, absent justification.

Like the argument from loss (section 2), this argument does not establish that it is morally wrong to have an abortion, all things considered. Its conclusion is that abortion is wrong unless it can be justified. (Thus, as discussed in section 2.3, nothing in this argument disagrees with the defense of abortion from the violinist case (section 1.2).)

It has been argued that popular opposition to abortion in the United States is best seen as expressing a view along the lines of the argument from intrinsic value (see Dworkin 1993). After all, opponents of abortion in the United States often think that abortion in the case of rape is morally permissible. This view would be hard to understand if they believed that abortion was akin to the murder of an innocent person. (It’s not okay to murder an innocent person, even if somehow murdering that innocent is the only way to psychologically move on after having been raped.) So, we can make more sense of their opposition to abortion if we see them as believing that abortion involves the destruction of something with intrinsic value. This is the kind of moral consideration that might be overruled by considerations of the trauma that a rape victim is likely to experience if she is forced to continue a pregnancy to term.

It has been argued (by Dworkin 1993) that those who are “pro-choice” in the United States (that is, those who believe that abortion should be legally permissible) are also committed to the view that human life has intrinsic value. After all, people who are pro-choice are typically reluctant to call themselves “pro-abortion”; rather, they see abortion as a regrettable occurrence that should nevertheless be available to women. It would be far better if unwanted pregnancy were entirely avoided through effective birth control, they think. They do think that something bad happens in an abortion; they simply think that it is not wrong to cause this bad outcome. After all, they acknowledge that it makes sense to regret an abortion, and that abortion is not as trivial as an appendectomy. (Similarly, Hursthouse 1991 argues that abortion “is always a matter of some seriousness” (page 238).)

Thus, on the view we’re considering, those in the United States who oppose abortion and those who defend abortion rights actually have very similar views. They are not diametrically opposed, one side believing that abortion is trivial and the other believing that abortion is murder. Rather, both sides agree that human life has intrinsic value; they simply disagree on the significance of this fact: how bad is the fetus’s death, and what does it take to justify causing that death? This is a disagreement of degree, not of kind, the view holds. (For another argument that both sides of the abortion debate accept the same basic principles, see Warnke 1999.)

Against the claim that those opposed to abortion are opposed on the grounds that fetal life has intrinsic value, it has been pointed out that many U.S. citizens are Catholic, and the Catholic church does treat abortion as murder (Thomson 1995).

And against the claim that those who are “pro-choice” also believe that fetal life has intrinsic value, it has been argued that we can make sense of regret for abortion, and of the fact that abortion is not trivial, by appeal to the significance of the flipside of abortion: continuing a pregnancy is of great moral consequence (Harman 1999).

(Dworkin 1993 draws a political and legal conclusion from his claim that both sides of the abortion debate believe that fetal life has intrinsic value and simply disagree about what it takes to justify destroying that value. He adds the further claim that beliefs about the value of fetal life are religious in nature. His conclusion is that we cannot outlaw abortion, because that would impose a religious view on some people who don’t hold it. Dworkin nevertheless holds that, because abortion is a serious matter, waiting periods may be legally imposed. Stroud 1996 responds that we can’t in general impose waiting periods on people while they work out where they stand on religious questions; for example, it would not be okay to impose a waiting period before joining a church.)

5. The argument from moral risk

Consider the following argument:

1.: If you have considered arguments that abortion is wrong and rejected them, you may have made a mistake in your reasoning: there is some chance that abortion is seriously wrong despite your rejection of these arguments.
2.: If there is some chance that abortion is seriously wrong, then in having an abortion you would be taking a moral risk.
3.: There is a strong moral reason against taking a moral risk of doing something seriously wrong.

Therefore, there is a strong moral reason against having an abortion.

This argument holds that, from the perspective of anyone deciding whether to have an abortion, even if she has rejected arguments against the permissibility of abortion, there is nevertheless a strong moral reason against abortion given by the moral risk that she would be taking. There’s some chance that she’s mistaken about whether abortion is morally permissible; perhaps, contrary to her own thinking, abortion is morally wrong. (The argument is offered in Moller 2011. A similar argument against abortion is made by Lockhart 2000. Baker 2016 uses considerations of moral risk to argue that abortion should be illegal.)

One thing to emphasize about this argument is that it holds that there is a strong moral reason against abortion even if in fact all the anti-abortion arguments are bad arguments. The mere existence of these arguments, and the fallibility of our own moral reasoning, generates a strong moral reason against abortion even if, in itself, abortion is really morally unproblematic.

How might one respond to this argument? One might grant the conclusion and hold that nevertheless, actual abortions are permissible because the burdens on women of not aborting are significant. (Moller 2011 allows that this may be the case.) One might deny that someone whose moral reasoning is sound really is in a position in which she should acknowledge that it might be true that she is mistaken about the ethics of abortion. Or, one might challenge the idea that this kind of epistemic moral risk – stemming from the possibility that one’s moral thinking is mistaken – generates any moral reasons at all: one might hold that while non-moral risks generate moral reasons, purely moral risks do not (Weatherson 2019 and Harman 2015).

6. The expressive argument against selective abortion

Some arguments conclude that some abortions are wrong (including some early abortions), without also concluding that all abortions are wrong. Some abortions are performed because prenatal testing reveals a genetic abnormality in the fetus that would cause the fetus to be disabled. Consider the following argument:

1.: Abortion of an otherwise wanted pregnancy because the fetus will have a disability expresses a discriminatory attitude: that disabled people should not have been born, don’t have a right to exist, or are less valuable than non-disabled people.
2.: Expressing a discriminatory attitude like that is morally wrong.

Therefore, Abortion of an otherwise wanted pregnancy because the fetus will have a disability is morally wrong.

This argument is compatible with the claim that, in general, abortion is morally permissible. According to this argument, it’s the reason for these abortions that makes them wrong, not the mere fact that they are abortions. (See Asch 1989, Wendell 1996, and Parens and Asch 2000.)

One way of arguing for premise 1 would be to point out that prospective parents often have mistaken, distorted impressions of what life with a disability involves, and doctors and genetic counselors too often emphasize the negatives without sharing positive stories of lives of disabled persons (Parens and Asch 2000, Kaposy 2018). Many disabled persons argue that a life with a disability is not a worse life than a life without a disability, when all is considered (Barnes 2016).

6.1 The burdens objection

One objection to this argument disputes premise 1 by saying that a pregnant woman may worry not that her disabled child would have too hard a life, but that raising the child would be too difficult for her and her family, given their limited resources. For example, she might already be raising a disabled child. (See Kittay 2019.)

6.2 The objection from preventing disability

Another objection to this argument disputes premise 1 by pointing out that women can morally permissibly prevent their fetuses from becoming disabled by taking folic acid and avoiding medicines that would cause abnormalities in their fetuses. Thus, it appears that it is morally legitimate for parents to aim to have non-disabled children. (See Parens and Asch 2000.)

6.3 The objection from lack of harm

A third objection to the argument disputes premise 2 by saying that expressing a discriminatory attitude is morally wrong only if the expression leads to harm for the relevant people. The objector then goes on to argue that it is very hard to show, and it is implausible, that there are any harms that disabled people suffer that they would not suffer if these expressions did not occur. After all, there is unfortunately plenty of prejudice against disabled people, independent of people’s procreative decisions and what they express. (See Nelson 2007.)

6.4 The objection from equivocation about value

A fourth objection to the argument points out that there is a difference between holding that a disability would be bad for the person who is disabled, on the one hand, and holding that disabled persons are less valuable or less worthy of existing, on the other hand. The objector maintains that abortion of a disabled fetus expresses only the first of these ideas, not the second.

7. Why the ethics of abortion matters

If abortion is murder, then it’s quite straightforward why the ethics of abortion matters: there is murder going on, and we should recognize that. But suppose that abortion is not murder; indeed, suppose that abortion is morally permissible. Why is that fact important?

The violinist case argument (Thomson 1971) looms large in philosophical teaching and discussion of abortion. The argument aims to establish that even if fetuses have a right to life, then nevertheless abortion is permissible. But there are two ways in which the prominence of this argument is misleading regarding what is at stake when it comes to the ethics of abortion. First, the argument proceeds by relying heavily on the burdens on a woman of pregnancy: it is precisely because pregnancy is onerous (and pregnancy and childbirth are dangerous) that we may permissibly decline to undergo these burdens for another, even if that other has a right to life. But the importance to women of abortion access is not fundamentally about the burdens of pregnancy; it is also about the burdens and life-altering nature of motherhood. The liberation of women has depended crucially and fundamentally on women’s gaining the ability to decide whether, and when, to become parents to new children. The autonomy of women is at stake. (The burdens of pregnancy might be enough to entitle women and anyone who can become pregnant to a right to abortion, but they alone do not tell the fundamental story of why that right is needed.)

Second, and relatedly, the argument proceeds by granting that fetuses have a right to life. While it is certainly important to show (if it can be done) that abortion is permissible even on this assumption, it is also important for us to remember—in thinking about the importance of the ethics of abortion—that the claim that fetuses have a right to life is a controversial claim that no one is entitled to take as common ground. And without that claim, there is no need to appeal to the burdens of pregnancy to justify abortion. Indeed, there is no need for justification at all.

One might object that pregnancy cannot force anyone into motherhood as long as one has the option of making an adoption plan for one’s child. A pregnant woman can avoid motherhood by continuing her pregnancy and making an adoption plan—there is no need for access to abortion to avoid motherhood. But this objection ignores the reality that many women bond with and come to love their fetuses while they carry them to term, and/or many women simply prefer not to make an adoption plan for their own child, even while they would strongly prefer to end a pregnancy and not to become a mother to a new child at this time. Thus, the reality is that restrictions of abortion access consign many women to motherhood at times they would prefer not to become mothers—even if the option to make an adoption plan is available. And of course, it is not just women who are affected in this way, but anyone who can become pregnant; this includes women, some nonbinary persons, and transgender men. For many pregnant people, lack of access to abortion forces them to turn a fetus that they think does not matter at all into a child they deeply love. (See Harman 2021.)

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Other Internet Resources

“Is Abortion Immoral?” a video episode of the podcast Brain in a Vat, featuring Nathan Nobis, January 24, 2021.
“Judith Jarvis Thomson,” a podcast episode of Philosophy Talk, March 16, 2025.
“Love and Abortion,” videos of The Uehiro Lectures in Practical Ethics at Oxford University, given by Elizabeth Harman, April 25–May 9, 2024.

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The Ethics of Abortion