Notes to Aesthetic Judgment

1. What Mary Mothersill calls her “Second Thesis” in her book Beauty Restored is the thesis that a judgment of taste, such as “Beethoven’s first Rasumovsky quartet … is beautiful (has artistic merit)” (1984: 145) “is a ‘genuine’ judgment” (1984: 146). However, as she realizes, we then need to know what makes a judgment a genuine judgment. She mentions truth, but wisely does not stop there. What she then adds in order to explain this are various normative characteristics, such as the aspiration to correctness (1984: 157–170). So, in the end her view on this matter converges with the normative idea already described.

2. For this reason, it is difficult to be gripped by the central puzzle of Mary Mothersill’s Beauty Restored—which is how there can be aesthetic truths without aesthetic laws—although this problem is perhaps a cousin of the problem that Hume and Kant think is central.

3. Contrary to many commentators, it seems that Nietzsche, in the passages referred to here, is responding directly to Kant, not as mediated through Schopenhauer, who Nietzsche knew had a somewhat different view (see Zangwill 2013).

Copyright © 2023 by
Nick Zangwill <zangwillnick@gmail.com>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free