Isaac Albalag

First published Thu Aug 20, 2020; substantive revision Wed Jul 2, 2025

Isaac Albalag stands out as one of the most rigorous representatives of the Jewish Averroism school which flourished in Western Europe in the thirteenth century and continued until the Renaissance. This school contained notable figures such as Ibn Kaspi, Shem Tov Ibn Falaquera, Moses Narboni, Isaac Polqar, Gersonides, and Elijah Delmedigo who regarded Averroes’ philosophical writings, particularly his commentaries on Aristotle, as the primary sources for studying science and philosophy. Averroes’ influence on these philosophers extended to the question of the relationship between religion and philosophy. Many Jewish philosophers, drawing on Averroes’ religious epistemology, which established a theoretical basis for reading Scripture and demonstrative sciences as different representations of the same truth rather than conflicting truths, sought to interpret Judaism as a philosophical religion, a philosophical-theological approach that was arguably championed by the prominent Jewish philosopher Maimonides (d.1204). Characteristically, Albalag displays unreserved admiration and fidelity to Aristotle whose teachings, as interpreted by Averroes, he considers synonymous with the truth. Restoring Aristotelianism and establishing it among Jewish students of philosophy are central goals of Albalag’s philosophical project. Within this framework, Albalag addresses the critical question of the relationship between Judaism and philosophy, uniquely advocating the doctrine of double truth.

1. Life and Works

Little is known about Isaac Albalag. All we know about him is that he lived in the second half of the thirteenth century either in Catalonia or Provence (Sirat 1985: 238). References to Albalag in fifteenth-century Spanish Jewish literature suggest that he did not enjoy a good reputation, as his name appears in some sources associated with critiques and accusations of heresy. For example, the Kabbalist Shem Tov Ibn Shem Tov (d.1440) accuses Albalag of espousing a heretical view regarding the fate of the soul after death (Sefer ha ʾemunot [the Book of Beliefs], I:1). Similarly, in Sefer Neveh Shalom (Indwelling of Peace), the fifteenth-century Spanish thinker Abraham Shalom condemns Albalag’s account of celestial motion, which he believes radically undermines the doctrine of creation (Vajda 1960: 271). Albalag’s worth as a philosopher did not go unappreciated, notwithstanding. His younger contemporary Isaac Polqar (14^th century), the author of ʿEzer ha-dat (The Support of Faith), holds Albalag in great esteem, citing him approvingly in his treatment of the controversial issue of the origin of the world (ʿEzer ha-dat: part II: p.46. For Polqar’s treatment of the origin of the world see Haliva 2018 ).

Albalag wrote only one treatise, Sefer Tiqqun ha deʿot (The Emendation of the Opinions)— using Manekin’s translation of the title (Manekin 2007: 140). This treatise is a translation, accompanied by a commentary, of Abu Hamid al-Ghazali’s encyclopedic treatise kitāb Maqāṣid al-Falāsifah (The Aims of the Philosophers), specifically the sections on Logic and Metaphysics. The third part on Natural Philosophy was completed by Isaac Polqar (Vajda 1960: 268).

The composition of the Tiqqun was driven by two goals. As the title (Emendation of the Opinions) suggests, the main goal was to offer philosophical corrections. Albalag believed that most errors in philosophical discourse stemmed from deviation from or misunderstanding of the teachings of Aristotle. He particularly regarded Avicenna as a major source of such errors, and thus developed several anti-Avicennian critiques. Although Avicenna is central to Albalag’s corrective enterprise, criticism is extended also to other figures such as al-Farabi, Maimonides, and al-Ghazali. It is likely that Albalag, like Medieval Latin philosophers, considered Maqāṣid al-Falāsifah a genuine representation of al-Ghazali’s philosophical opinions (for al-Ghazali’s philosophical image in Latin literature, see Shihadeh 2011). ^[1] Since Maqāṣid al-Falāsifah offered a concise presentation of the opinions of the philosophers, it furnished Albalag with an ideal framework for pursuing the announced process of “emendation” (Tiqqun). In most of his discussions, critiques, and corrections Albalag derived what he considered the correct understanding of Aristotle from Averroes’ writings.

The second goal of the Tiqqun is pedagogical. Once again, al-Ghazali’s Maqāṣid al-Falāsifah serves as an adequate vehicle for this purpose. Al-Ghazali’s clear and accessible style, which resonates with “popular beliefs”, makes the Maqāṣid a suitable medium for instructing students with limited philosophical background (Tiqqun preface: 4). By translating and commenting on al-Ghazali’s Maqāṣid, Albalag aims to offer a step-by-step instruction in philosophy, starting with a presentation of Ghazali’s summary of the doctrines of the philosophers and progressing towards the establishment of Aristotelian demonstrative doctrines. Overall, the Tiqqun follows the structure of the Maqāṣid, although Albalag occasionally diverges into extensive digressions.

2. Logic

The first part of the Tiqqun (Logic) is a mostly faithful translation of the Maqāṣid. While this part section is generally unoriginal, it can be credited with a specific contribution. The manuscripts of the Tiqqun include a sympathetic discussion of the fourth figure of syllogism. This figure was attributed by most Medieval logicians to Galen, although this attribution remains disputed in modern scholarship (Rescher 1965; Sabra 1965), and was dismissed as lacking utility and “naturalness” by Averroes (see Gersonides Sefer ha-heqqesh ha-Yashar [The Book of the Correct Syllogism]: 147). However, it is unclear whether Albalag himself wrote this discussion or it was authored by Abner of Burgos, a thirteenth-century Jewish-convert-to-Christianity philosopher, as suggested by some textual evidence (Vajda 1960: 275–276). If Albalag himself included this interpolation in the Tiqqun, without any explicit criticism, that would indicate that Albalag agreed with its positive assessment of the fourth figure of the syllogism.

According to Aristotle, syllogisms are composed of two predicative sentences sharing a common (middle) term and two distinct terms (minor and major). He arranges the premises in three figures as follows:

in the first figure, the middle term is subject in one premise and predicate in the other,
in the second, it is subject in both premises, and
in the third, it is predicate in both (Manekin 1996: 50).

Some later logicians distinguished the order of the major and minor premises with the result that the first figure was divided into two figures:

in the first, the middle term is the subject in the minor and predicate in the major premises, and
in the second, it is the subject in the major and the predicate in the minor premises (ibid, 1996: 50).

The additional fourth figure “is sometimes placed after the first figure, rather than the third” (ibid, 1996: 50).

The Tiqqun provides a quasi-defense of the fourth figure as a “valuable” form of reasoning (Tiqqun n.5:12). This interrupts Albalag’s overall adherence to Averroes who, like the majority of Medieval logicians, rejects the fourth figure due to concerns about its “naturalness.” According to Averroes, “the form of reasoning embodied in the fourth figure of syllogism does not exist in us by nature” and involves “absurd self-predication” (Manekin 1996: 56). In Hebrew logical writings, limited attempts were advanced to support that figure, most notably by Gersonides. The discussion in the Tiqqun represents another effort in this direction, where the author subjects even Aristotle to criticism for omitting this form of reasoning (Tiqqun n.5: 12).

3. Epistemology

3.1 Knowledge, Belief and Intellectual Perfection

Like most Medieval Aristotelians, Albalag understands the ultimate goal of man in terms of intellectual perfection (Tiqqun preface: 2–3, n.30: 42; cf. Maimonides, Guide III:54; Farabi, Selected Aphorisms: 61; Averroes, Epistle on the Possibility of Conjunction: 103). Achieving this goal requires acquiring knowledge of existents in a manner “that dispels doubt” (Tiqqun preface: 3). The phrase “dispelling doubt” points to the conception of certainty (yaqīn), which, in the Arab Aristotelian tradition, is defined as a cognitive state in which the cognizer acquiesces that what she perceived is necessarily true and cannot be otherwise (see Black 2006: 15–25). In line with this tradition, Albalag specifies the logical tool of demonstration as the means to the fulfilment of the criterion of dispelling doubt (i.e., attaining certainty) (Tiqqun preface: 3–4). This implies that achieving the ultimate goal of man is exclusively tied to philosophy, whereas religion, which generally conveys knowledge via non-demonstrative methods, plays no substantial role in this regard. This implication becomes evident from a dichotomy that Albalag draws between ʾemunah (belief) and yediʿah (scientific knowledge), confining the former to religion/Scripture. Whether ʾemunah qualifies to parallel or substitute philosophy in fulfilling the epistemic requirement for intellectual perfection is a complex question (for a detailed discussion of this point, see Abdalla 2025, 53–68). One factor to consider is that the conception of ʾemunah in the Tiqqun varies from the philosophical conception of belief (for which ʾiʿtiqād and taṣdīq were the technical terms) espoused by many Jewish and Muslim philosophers and theologians (see, for instance, al-Farabi Book of Demonstration: 63–4; Saadya Gaon The Book of Doctrines and Beliefs: 34; Maimonides Guide I:50). The latter conception involves a judgment or affirmation, derived from cognitive processes and syllogistic reasoning, that a given perceived object is true. Belief in this sense is associated with certainty or approximation of certainty depending on the form of reasoning.

The Tiqqun, in contrast, points to a traditional conception of belief; one that involves the simple acceptance of a given scriptural doctrine or set of doctrines as true, without prior rational justification (Tiqqun n.30: 51; for background on the traditional conception of belief in Jewish thought see Wolfson 1942: 213–261; Kellner 1986; Rosenberg 1984: 273–307),). While it might be argued that simple belief can serve as a source of certainty due to prophetic authority, and thus can contribute to fulfilling the epistemological requirements for intellectual perfection, Albalag displays a skeptical stance toward prophetic knowledge that ultimately challenges this view. In the Tiqqun, we come across remarks stressing the inaccessibility of the Torah’s prophetic secrets to non-prophets —we will see below that the Torah has two layers of esoteric knowledge, one of which is prophetic and the other is philosophical. Only philosophical knowledge is accessible to non-prophets through allegorical interpretation of Scripture in terms of what they learned from demonstrative sciences (see below). The assent evoked by Scripture in someone proficient in demonstrative sciences (i.e., a philosopher) amounts to reason-based, namely demonstrative, assent (cf. Averroes Decisive Treatise: 17–18). Therefore, associating Scripture solely with simple belief (ʾemunah peshuṭah) would be incomprehensible, unless we grant that belief pertains only to the surface layer of Scripture to which assent requires no extra interpretive or rational effort. However, this would imply that belief has little epistemic value, since it is linked to a scriptural layer that, as Albalag maintains, addresses the multitude of people who, “like animals”, lack reason (Tiqqun n.30: 45).

3.2 Human Knowledge: Means and Limits

Although Albalag does not devote a specific discussion to the theory of knowledge, the Tiqqun include remarks about human knowledge, its features and limits, and the means to it, most of which show indebtedness to Aristotelian epistemological theories as developed by Arab Aristotelians, in particular Averroes. Following the standard definition of knowledge within the framework of Arabic Aristotelianism, Albalag divides knowledge into representation and assent. The former, which is a prerequisite for the latter, is acquired by definition, while assent is acquired through proof (Tiqqun [Logic]: 98; cf. Maqāṣid: 12). As noted previously, Albalag assigns a primary significance to demonstrative syllogisms in evoking certain assent. Moreover, like Averroes, Albalag highlights the empirical foundation of human knowledge (for Averroes’ epistemology see Black 2019). As he explains, intelligible thoughts arise in the soul through the cognitive processes of abstraction and syllogistic reasoning. Without external images, the soul cannot apprehend intelligible forms, just as a person deprived of visual data cannot apprehend the quiddity of colors (Tiqqun, n.11: 16, n.44: 71; cf. Aristotle De Anima III, 7, 431a, 14–17).

Although the Tiqqun is generally characterized by confident rationalism, it involves skeptical elements that echo Maimonides’ critiques of the limitation of the human intellect with respect to metaphysical knowledge (for these critiques in Maimonides see Pines 1979; Stern 2013). Albalag admits, like Maimonides, that attaining complete knowledge of immaterial beings lies beyond the capacity of the human intellect. This limitation is primarily due to the material component of human beings (ḥomer), which serves as both a constant impediment to the pursuit of knowledge and a cause of intellectual deficiency (Tiqqun n.11: 16, n.38: 58; cf. Guide III:9).

4. Conception of Being and God’s Existence

Avicenna’s proof of God’s existence, famously known as “Burhān al-ṣidiqin” (Demonstration of the Truthful (Mayer 2001)) occupies a significant portion of Albalag’s critical discussion. Avicenna presents this proof as a metaphysical argument for the existence of God, emphasizing its inclusion within the science of metaphysics and reliance on analyses of the conception of existence qua existence. He divides “actual” beings into those that are necessary in themselves and those that are possible in themselves but necessary through another (Davidson 1987: 292–3; McGinnis 2010: 159–164). The necessary in itself is that which has existence as part of its essence and an impossibility arises if it is assumed not to exist. The possible in itself but necessary through another is that which “has no existence in essence” and “no impossibility” arises whether it is assumed to exist or not (Avicenna al-Najāt: 2:77; cf. al-ʾisharāt: 122; cf. al-Ghazali Maqāṣid: 100–101); both existence and non-existence are equal states with respect to it. Accordingly, an external cause must act to preponderate the state of existence over non-existence in a possible thing. Let us consider all possible things as an “aggregate” (jumlah). This raises two assumptions: (1) the aggregate is self-caused, or (2) the aggregate is caused by an external cause (Avicenna, al-Najāt: 2: 89). Avicenna excludes the former assumption, explaining that the nature of what is possible in itself cannot change without a cause. Hence, an aggregate of possible things remains possible in itself; it must be caused by another cause to become necessary. Given that the series of causes and effects cannot progress ad infinitum, we must conclude that the existence of an aggregate of possible things relies on a cause that is necessary in itself, that is, a cause that requires no cause for its existence, but on whose existence all other existents ultimately depend. The trait of “necessary existence” entails a number of divine attributes such as oneness, simplicity and goodness, which permits identifying the Necessary Existent with the deity (Adamson 2013: 172).

Albalag finds Avicenna’s proof of God as Necessary Existent open to criticism due to its deviation from Aristotle on some crucial points. Firstly, Albalag argues that Avicenna’s method for establishing the existence of the First Principle in the science of metaphysics is incorrect (Tiqqun n.8: 13–14). In contrast to Avicenna, Albalag contends that the existence of the Prime Mover must be accepted from natural philosophy. However, the metaphysician should not accept the Prime Mover as the deity outright; rather, he must devote further effort to examine its states and attributes to determine whether the Prime Mover is indeed the deity. The theoretical basis for Albalag’s objection to Avicenna is Aristotle’s rule that “no master of any art can demonstrate the proper principles of his art” (Metaphysics IV 1003a21–22). According to Averroes, this rule suggests that a given science does not demonstrate the existence of its subject, but must concede to its existence either as something which is “self-evident” or as “something that has been demonstrated in another science” (Wolfson 1950–1 : 691). Since the First Principle is the subject matter of metaphysics, its existence cannot be established in this science.

Secondly, Avicenna breaks away from Aristotle as he proceeds in establishing the existence of the First Principle through an analysis of the conception of being, rather than motion and moved objects, as Aristotle does (for Aristotle’s argument see Physics 7 & 8). To establish the Necessary Existent, Avicenna proceeds from a conception of being that Albalag dismisses as spurious (cf. Averroes, al-kashf: 14). Albalag’s discomfort with this approach primarily stems from the fact that it deviates from Aristotle’s method. Moreover, Albalag points out errors and implications, particularly in the science of metaphysics, that arise from Avicenna’s method of distinguishing two types of necessary existents: that which is necessary in itself and that which is necessary by another. For instance, Albalag argues that if we accept Avicenna’s view that anything not necessary in itself involves both necessity and possibility, then separate intellects would also involve both necessity and possibility. However, since possibility resides in a substratum, this would absurdly undermine the nature of separate intellects as essentially immaterial beings (Tiqqun n.8: 14, n.29: 27).

These deviations from Aristotle provided Albalag with sufficient reason to reject the metaphysical proof of God. Moreover, from Albalag’s perspective, Avicenna’s supplementary arguments, reproduced by al-Ghazali in the Maqāṣid, that the Necessary Existent is one, simple and incorporeal fall short of satisfying the epistemic criterion of dispelling doubt (i.e., certainty). In contrast, Aristotle’s argument from motion which, as Albalag asserts, “dispels doubt” (Tiqqun n.33: 53. For further discussion of Albalag’s criticism of these argument, see Abdalla 2024). However, although Albalag only trusts Aristotle’s argument, he points to a subtle problem rooted in ancient commentaries on Aristotle: the problem of the relation of the Prime Mover to the deity (for this problem see Avicenna Shifāʾ [Metaphysics]: 13). Aristotle’s argument from motion leads to the existence of a mover that is not a body or a force in a body. But whether that mover is the First Principle/Cause, i.e., the deity, or a first effect remained an open question to philosophers (Tiqqun n.8: 14, n.38: 61). While Avicenna concludes that the deity is ontologically superior to the Prime Mover known from Aristotle’s analyses of motion (Tiqqun n.38: 61), Averroes identifies the Prime Mover with the deity in his writings (see for instance Ibn Rushd’s Metaphysics : 172)—the exception being, as Albalag correctly notes, the Epitome of Metaphysics (see Talkhīṣ mā baʿd al-ṭabiʿah: 149) where Averroes follows Avicenna’s standpoint (Tiqqun n.69: 96).

Curiously, Albalag does not immediately align himself with either camp. However, his discussion of the relation of the Prime Mover to the celestial and sublunary realms ultimately supports Averroes’ standpoint, since it establishes the primacy of the Prime Mover as the cause of all sublunary and celestial entities, and its absolute unity and simplicity—the most essential specifications of the deity (see below).

5. God-world Relationship

To reconstruct a rough picture of Albalag’s understanding of the God-world relationship, we consider three themes: the origin of the world, divine will, and divine wisdom.

5.1 The Origin of the World

On philosophical grounds, Albalag dismisses the doctrine of temporal origination as “defective” and accepts the eternal existence of the universe as an indisputable truth (interestingly, he still accepts the former on the authority of Scripture, as will be shown later). However, Albalag attempts to present the Aristotelian theory of eternity and its fundamental premises in a theologically appealing fashion. Instead of describing the world as eternally existent, Albalag introduces the theory of “eternal origination” (ḥidūsh niṣiḥi), explaining that “there was no time at which the universe was not originated” (Tiqqun n.30: 30). As can be seen, this theory combines two seemingly inconsistent assumptions about the universe: (1) That the universe has no temporal beginning, and (2) that the universe is originated. Albalag accepts the former based on Aristotle’s demonstration of the perpetual existence of celestial spheres and their motion (see for instance Tiqqun, n.30: 30, 60:84–97; cf. De Caelo I: 2–3). To verify the latter, he devotes an entire chapter in which he explains that the universe is not self-sufficient and that it necessarily relies for its eternal existence and continuation on a cause. In addition to philosophical explanation he offers scriptural exegesis showing that the theory of eternal origination is compatible with the esoteric meaning of Scripture (for this exegesis, see Feldman 2000: 19–30). These philosophical and interpretive notes enable Albalag to ultimately redress what he considers a common mix-up of the philosophical doctrine of eternity with the Epicurean view that “the universe exists without a cause” (Tiqqun n.30: 45), and to defend the philosophers against charges of heresy leveled against them on the assumption that they deny the universe’s dependence on a divine cause that creates it and sustains its existence.

Albalag’s discussion of the eternal origination of the universe alludes to elements of al-Ghazali’s refutation of the philosophers in Tahāfut al-Falāsifah. Al-Ghazali contends that the philosopher’ exposition of the relation of God to the universe is based on two contradictory assumptions: that the universe is eternal and that it has a Maker (see Tahāfut al-Falāsifah third and tenth discussions). As seen, Albalag maintains, contrary to al-Ghazali, that these premises are consistent, and thus the philosophers’ adherence to the theory of eternal origination is immune to criticism. Indeed, Albalag insists that the theory of eternal origination constitutes a more adequate way for articulating divine causation than the doctrine of temporal origination, the “defective” doctrine of the multitude. This temporal view confines God’s creation of the world to a specific time in the past, which is incompatible with the characteristics of divine perfection. If perfection implies absoluteness, the Creator’s action must be free from temporal limitations. Accordingly, His act of creation can only be eternal, rather than temporal.

In explaining the mechanism of eternal origination, Albalag introduces a conception of the universe as a moving entity in which the cause-effect relationship is a relation between a mover and a moved object (see Tiqqun n.30: 29; cf. Tahāfut al-Tahāfut: third discussion, 101). In the natural realm, all processes of generation and corruption consist in motion—for instance the movement from potential to actual existence—and occurs through motion. All natural changes depend on the movements of the celestial spheres, which in turn depend on the mover of the outermost sphere, the Prime Mover (Tiqqun n.30: 29, n.39: 62).

Beyond this well-known Aristotelian conception of the Prime Mover as the ultimate cause of motion, Albalag seeks to establish the idea of the creator, without compromising his faithfulness to Aristotelian principles. To this end, he argues that the very act of producing motion is sufficient to make the Prime Mover a cause/creator of the universe. Albalag differentiates between two classes of existents:

existents whose subsistence requires motion, and
existents whose subsistence does not require motion; only their generation requires motion.

The key difference between the two classes of existents lies in the duration of their dependence on the cause of motion. The latter class depends on the cause of motion only for their generation, but they can continue to exist after the cause has perished —for instance, a house continues to exist after the death of its builder. In contrast, existents in the former class are intrinsically linked to motion and vanish as soon as motion stops—for instance wind ceases to exist as soon as the air becomes still (Tiqqun 30: 30; cf. Averroes Tahāfut al-Tahāfut, fourth discussion: 156–8). Given their essential association with motion, such existents are said to need a cause more than any others, for if the cause of motion disappears from existence “for a twinkling of an eye”, they will perish (Tiqqun n.30: 30). Albalag maintains that the universe as a whole belongs to the class of existents whose continued existence depends on motion, concluding that the Mover that perpetuates its motion is its Cause of existence (Tiqqun, n.30: 30. For further discussion of the details of the theory of eternal generation and the causal role of the Prime Mover, see Abdalla 2025, 215–224).

5.2 Divine Will

Albalag addresses the contentious issue of the nature of divine will within the framework of the theory of eternal generation. This discussion also bears elements reminiscent of al-Ghazali’s critique of the philosopher’s opinions in Tahāfut al-Falāsifah, where the main point of contention is the nature of divine causation. Al-Ghazali considers volition a fundamental characteristic of any acting cause. In his opinion, an acting cause, or an agent, must be willing, in the sense of knowing and choosing “what is willed” (Tahāfut al-Falāsifah, third discussion: 135). A cause that acts by necessity, that is, without willing, falls into the category of natural, involuntary causes. With this conception of agency in mind, al-Ghazali accuses the philosophers of denying divine will, particularly due to their support of the eternity scheme, which entails the idea of causal necessity. According to al-Ghazali, the philosophers maintain that the universe perpetually proceeds from God by necessity in the same manner that light proceeds from sun by necessity (Tahāfut, third discussion: 135; cf. Tiqqun n.23: 24). Unlike al-Ghazali, Albalag sees no conflict between ascribing volition to God and upholding the the eternity scheme. This perspective is evident in the way Albalag responds to a question about causality in his discussion of the theory of eternal generation: Are natural and involuntary causes the actual doers of effects? In this context, Albalag broadens the conception of agency to include both involuntary/natural and voluntary causes. However, he emphasizes that natural/involuntary causes are not autonomous producers of effects, as their casual efficacy is primarily indebted to close or remote voluntary causes. For example, a sword can kill a person. However, it does not kill that person on its own, as it is primarily employed by a voluntary cause for this purpose. Yet both the sword and the voluntary cause are considered actual agents in the act of killing. In light of this understanding of causal relations, Albalag states that the Prime Mover, being the prime cause of all movements taking place in the natural and celestial realms, is the First Maker of all effects. In its context, this statement aims to confirm, contrary to the accusations of al-Ghazali, that the Prime Mover is the ultimate voluntary cause of the universe. Nonetheless, apart from this brief explanation of the God-world causal relationship in terms of motion, Albalag barely ascribes any active role to divine will in the perpetual generation of the world.

In other contexts, Albalag offers some reflections on the nature of divine causation, rejecting associating God with natural and voluntary actions. In his view, God’s actions are neither natural not voluntary but belong to a unique, intermediary class of actions that lies beyond human understanding. This does not mean, however, that God is deprived of volition; rather God has a capacity analogous to what will constitutes for human beings. The exact nature of this capacity, which human beings call will, is obscure, though demonstration establishes its existence. Nonetheless, considering the defining criteria of divine perfection, Albalag infers that this capacity shares no features with empirical will. Unlike empirical will which is driven by external incentives and seeks to fulfill desires, divine will is self-sufficient. While empirical will is temporal and perishes as soon as the desired outcome is achieved, divine will is eternal and immutable, being characterized as a benevolent and immutable capacity to eternally “choose” the best of two opposite options:

Even though He possesses power over everything, His will constantly attaches itself to a single object, the best among two opposites. Certainly, if He willed evil He would be capable of doing it, but His will desires nothing but the good only. (Tiqqun n.23: 24 [my translation]; cf. Guide III:25 where Maimonides states that God acts in the best way; cf. Averroes, Tahāfut al-Tahāfut, first discussion: 22)

On this basis, the universe maintains a fixed natural order such that “nothing can be added to or reduced from it” (Tiqqun n.30: 39), since God’s will continuously and immutably chooses this order.

5.3 Divine Knowledge

The possession of will by God presupposes His possession of knowledge, as choosing among alternatives requires knowing them. When discussing the nature of divine knowledge, Albalag emphasizes the importance of meeting the criteria for divine perfection. For this reason, he distinguishes divine knowledge from human knowledge, categorizing them as distinct types rather than mere ranks. This distinction precludes any comparison between divine and human knowledge, thus preventing inference about God’s mode of apprehension and knowledge from the characteristics of human cognition. Echoing Maimonides, Albalag employs the theory of equivocation to explicate these ideas. According to Maimonides, terms like wisdom, power, and will are predicated of both God and creatures equivocally (Guide I:56; cf. Tiqqun n.23: 24; for further discussion of the theory of equivocation in the context of the Tiqqun, which can also be linked to Averroes’ emphasis on the distinction between divine and human knowledge, see Abdalla 2025, 182–189). Such terms possess distinct semantic content when applied to God and creatures, sharing only nominal similarity. Furthermore, when attributed to God, these terms offer limited informational value, constituting an artificial language necessitated by our incapacity to comprehend and express His true nature (Benor 1995; Stern 2013: 198–204).

Albalag’s discussion of divine knowledge critically engages with Avicenna’s theory of divine knowledge, as relayed by al-Ghazali in the Maqāṣid, according to which “God knows particulars in a universal way ” (Maqāṣid: 118). Avicenna’s theory of divine knowledge has been subject to different interpretations (Marmura 1962: 299–312; Adamson 2005: 257–278; Belo 2006: 177–199). As understood by Albalag, it associates God with a type of knowledge that is particular to human beings: universal knowledge. Due to the improper similarity between God and humans that Avicenna’s theory of divine knowledge entails, Albalag dismisses it as inappropriate, and scolds al-Ghazali for diffusing false doctrines about God. In opposition to both Avicenna and al-Ghazali, Albalag contends that divine knowledge surpasses human knowledge qualitatively, not merely in rank, involving entirely distinct characteristics. Unlike human knowledge, it is neither particular nor universal, transcends time, is indivisible, absolutely actual and independent, and exclusively grounded in a unique mode of self-intellection inherent to God and separate intellects (Tiqqun n.42: 76).

Given this idea of transcendence, it seems that the scope of divine knowledge would be so limited; neither the celestial realm nor sublunary species and individuals would be known to God. Nonetheless, Albalag insists that God’s knowledge is all-encompassing. To substantiate this, he adopts Averroes’ conception of the divine essence as a unified form encompassing the forms of all existents (Ibn Rushd’s Metaphysics: 197), explaining that by apprehending His own essence God knows all existents, including those within the sublunary realm (Tiqqun n.42: 66). While attributing knowledge of all existents to God might seem to compromise His perfection and transcendence, Albalag endeavors to circumvent this implication by affirming that forms within the essence of God do not exactly mirror the forms of sublunary entities as material objects. Rather, they exist in the divine essence in their purest form, being absolutely simple, indivisible, and independent of accidents.

5.4 The Problem of Determinism

In the Maqāṣid, al-Ghazali reiterates the deterministic implications of Avicenna’s understanding of the scope of God’s knowledge as containing future events. According to al-Ghazali, all possible beings are necessitated by their causes; when a cause exists, its effect necessarily follows. This necessary cause-effect relationship entails the predictability of future events. In particular, since God possesses complete knowledge of the patterns of causes operating in the world and their hierarchy, all future events are foreknown to Him (Maqāṣid: 118; cf. Avicenna al-Najāt: 2: 103–105)

In Albalag’s opinion, this deterministic implication stems from a focus on a narrow scope of cause-effect relationship, which he challenges by delineating distinct patterns of causal operations. As he explains, possible things are actualized by either material or efficient causes, or both. Efficient causes are either volitional or natural. The efficacy of volitional causes “hinges solely on the power of the chooser”, meaning that their effects are neither necessary nor predictable. Effects produced by natural causes are necessary only when the natural causes are necessary, that is, when they maintain a fixed order and cannot be hindered by other accidental or voluntary causes. An example of this is a solar eclipse. Foreknowledge of this and similar events is correspondingly necessary with respect to the knower. In contrast, some natural causes, despite having an order, can be impeded by voluntary or accidental causes. In these cases, the effects are not necessary, and thus it is not possible to make predictions about their occurrence with certainty.

I maintain that for any possible thing, if all its proximate an remote causes succeed each other essentially and maintain order in their actions, and no hindrance can prevent any of them, then it is to be judged the same as a necessary thing with respect to knower. However, regarding other possible things one cannot know with certain knowledge the fact or the time of their occurrence before their occurrence. (trans. Manekin 2007: 141)

Albalag is aware that this note entails a denial of God’s knowledge of every future event. For this reason, he clarifies that his intention is not to propose that God is ignorant of future events, for, indeed, he thinks that God knows them, but in a manner that is different from human knowledge.

Overall, Albalag is critical of al-Ghazali’s account of God’s foreknowledge, and although he appreciates the easy style with which al-Ghazali articulates the subject, which makes it accessible to those who are not well-trained in philosophy, he eventually condemns its religious implications, as follows:

When you examine al-Ghazali’s statements carefully you will find that they entail the annulment of man’s choice and the conclusion that his actions are compelled, as well as the annulment of the nature of the possible altogether. These opinions not only constitute repudiation of philosophy but also heresy with respect the Torah. (trans. Manekin 2007: 142)

6. Cosmology

In discussing the fundamental traits of the Necessary Existent, al-Ghazali considers the implications of Its absolute simplicity to the conception of the universe. Al-Ghazali explains, following Avicenna, that from what is one and simple (i.e., the Necessary Existent) only one thing proceeds (Maqāṣid: 157; cf. al-Shifāʾ [Metaphysics]: 326–334). Underlying this viewpoint is a conception of the relationship between cause and effect as one of correspondence, which entails the consistency of an action with the essential nature of its cause (Kogan 1984: 249). Accordingly, a simple cause has one act and produces only a single effect. In keeping with this conception, and considering the absolute simplicity of the First Principle, al-Ghazali describes a cosmological scheme in terms of emanation, where the First Principle causes multiplicity of effects not directly, but through a series of emanative intermediary causes proceeding from one another. The First Principle produces only one entity, the first intellect, by thinking Itself. In turn, the first intellect produces the second intellect and the first celestial sphere (Maqāṣid: 157). This multiplicity stems from the conceptual multiplicity of the first emanated intellect, for in addition to thinking its Principle, it thinks itself insofar as it is possible and insofar as it is necessary by virtue of the First Principle. The emanation continues in a descending manner, ending with the Active Intellect, the intellect of the sphere of the moon, the immediate source of the forms of sublunary existents.

Convinced that the scheme of emanation is an unsatisfactory deviation from Aristotle, Albalag devotes an extensive discussion to elucidating its inconsistency and to alternatively establishing what he considers the correct Aristotelian scheme. Unlike the scheme of emanation, this scheme posits that simplicity does not restrict the causal domain of God to singularity and that God effectively remains the cause of the universe’s manifold existents. As Albalag asserts, from the One, a multiplicity of existents come to be (Tiqqun n.96: 69).^[2] The explanation of this notion of divine causation is carried out through outlining a hierarchical cosmological scheme of separate intellects and celestial spheres in which each separate intellect relates to the corresponding sphere as a cause of motion, while the First Principle/Intellect relates to all separate intellects as a formal cause.^[3] Two theories underlie this cosmological scheme:

the theory of divine knowledge, which, as illustrated formerly, maintains that the First Intellect apprehends the forms of all existents by thinking Its essence, and
the Aristotelian theory of cognitive identity, according to which the knowing subject, the known object and thinking are identical in actual thinking (for further details about this theory see Black 1999).

As understood by Albalag, separate intellects are intellects in actu whose substantiation is the very act of thinking. Without knowledge, the essence of the separate intellect would be nullified. Thus, separate intellects, just like the First Intellect, possess actual knowledge of the forms of all existents. In actual thinking, the knower, the known, and knowledge are identical (Tiqqun n.42: 65), the relationship of identity being particularly formal as Aristotle’s dictum of cognitive identity establishes (De Anima 3.8 431b21). This means that in separate intellects “essence/form”, the known object, and thinking are the same. The First Intellect is said to be “the formal cause” of the separate intellects on the grounds that It provides them with “their forms”, i.e., the intelligible forms which they apprehend and by means of which they are what they are, intellects in actu (Tiqqun n.69: 98).^[4]

This cosmological account, however, presents a challenge for explaining how separate intellects are differentiated. After all, separate intellects share the feature of immateriality, which precludes their openness to differentiation. In the Avicennian-cosmological scheme, each intellect is differentiated by its causal relation to the effect emanating from it (Wolfson 1958 : 244). Given his rejection of the emanation scheme, Albalag cannot speak of a distinction among the separate intellects in terms of respective causal relations to emanated effects. Alternatively, he follows Averroes in positing ontological hierarchy as the differentiating factor (Tahāfut al-Tahāfut, fifth discussion: 173). While each separate intellect derives its knowledge directly from the First Intellect, each stands in a different hierarchical relation to the First Intellect, the ranking of each intellect being in accordance with the extent of its mode of apprehension’s simplicity; the simpler the mode of apprehension the closer the intellect in rank to the First Intellect. Overlap between these modes is not possible, which is why the separate intellects remain differentiated.

Beyond this cosmological account, Albalag indicates that multiplicity in the sublunary realm also comes forth from the deity; the First is said to be the cause of multiplicity inasmuch as It is the ultimate cause of the cosmic unity. Were it not for the unifying force that holds the parts together, the universe as a totality and its parts—each of which comes to be by virtue of a unifying force that conjoins its constituent parts like matter and form and the elements—would not exist (Tiqqun n.69: 97; cf. Averroes Tahāfut al-Tahāfut, third discussion: 108).

7. Celestial Motion

According to Albalag, the Avicennian-cosmological scheme ascribes celestial motion to two principles:

the internal souls of the spheres, and
the separate intellects corresponding to the spheres.

Whereas celestial souls function as the efficient causes of motion, the separate movers, insofar as they represent objects of love and desire, function as the final causes of motion. As Albalag explains, both principles contribute to the production of celestial motion, but its perpetual continuation is particularly ascribed to the separate intellect. Celestial souls are corporeal and finite, which is why they cannot carry on the spheres’ perpetual activities. The perpetuation of celestial motion is made possible by the incorruptible separate intellects, of which the mover of the outermost spheres is the highest in rank (Tiqqun n.64:91; cf. Avicenna Shifāʾ [Metaphysics]: 308; cf. Maqāṣid: 149).

As with many of Avicenna’s theories, Albalag raises a number of objections to this account of celestial motion. Firstly, he rejects the idea of complementary efficient-final causation because it absurdly implies that a final cause can continue the activity of a perished efficient cause. Secondly, Albalag rejects the theory of the spheres’ animation by souls (For background on this theory see Wolfson 1962: 65– 93; Freudenthal 2002: 111–137). His argument against that theory proceeds from the eternity premise as follows. Any force inherent in a body is finite, and thus cannot infinitely move the body in which it resides. However, since demonstration proves that celestial motion is eternal, such that it has no beginning or end, it follows that it cannot be attributed to forces inherent in celestial bodies. Possessing internal souls would thus be superfluous for celestial bodies, since such souls would play no essential role in perpetuating their motion. Since Nature does nothing in vain (cf. Aristotle Politics 1252b30–1253a1), the assumption that celestial spheres possess internal forces, souls, must be rejected (Tiqqun n.61: 87); cf. Ibn Rushd’s Metaphysics: 178). Although the basic lines of this argument are derived from Averroes, Albalag seems to adopt a firmer position than Averroes in denying that the spheres are animated by souls. While Averroes rejects Avicenna’s twofold account of celestial motion and argues in some of his works (especially De Substantia Orbis: 71; cf. Ibn Rushd’s Metaphysics: 164) that celestial motion could hardly be dependent on finite forces inherent in celestial bodies, he uses the term soul interchangeably with form as he refers to the principles of motion in celestial spheres: the immaterial separate intellects. Furthermore, other works incorporate indications that celestial spheres are ensouled (e.g., Tahāfut al-Tahāfut, fourth discussion). These variations have given rise to different interpretations of Averroes’ celestial physics in modern scholarship (see Donati 2015; Kogan 1984: 190–201).

As for Albalag, his account of celestial motion consistently attributes celestial motion to the efficient, formal, and final causation of separate intellects. Relying on Averroes while crediting Aristotle, Albalag argues that these modes of causation are unified in the divine realm (cf. Averroes Ibn Rushd’s Metaphysics: 149). While separate intellects are themselves invariable, they produce motion in the spheres in three different manners (Tiqqun n.64: 92).

8. The Relationship Between Religion and Philosophy

Albalag has acquired attention in modern scholarship mostly due to his view of the relationship between religion and philosophy, which presents a unique acknowledgement of the presence of instances of tension between philosophy and Scripture. Thus, his name is usually associated with the doctrine of the “double truth”, which maintains that the truth of prophecy and the truth of philosophy may contradict each other while at the same time remaining simultaneously true (Sirat 1985: 238; Zinberg 1973: 107]; Vajda 1960: 264–265). The origin of this doctrine had long been attributed to Averroes and Latin Averroists until recent studies challenged this attribution. Some scholars have argued that the double truth doctrine never existed as an actual dogma (Dales 1984). Similarly, some scholars question associating the double truth doctrine with Albalag, particularly as a genuine dogma rather than a rhetorical device (Guttmann 1966: 227–229; Abdalla 2022; Sadik 2024:204), and Elijah Delmedigo, another Jewish Averroist whose treatment of the question under discussion involves elements that can be understood in light of the double truth doctrine (for Delmedigo, see Fraenkel 2013).

Discussion of the question of the relationship between religion and philosophy in the Tiqqun is complex and spans a number of contexts. On the one hand, Albalag states in the preface to the Tiqqun that there is no essential distinction between philosophy and the Torah, except that the former, addressing the select few, conveys the truth in a demonstrative manner, while the latter, addressing the multitude, conveys the truth in a figurative language that suits their limited comprehension. This aligns with the view of religion as an imitation of philosophy, which was founded by al-Farabi and adopted by many Muslim and Jewish philosophers, most significantly Averroes and arguably Maimonides (see al-Farabi The Book of Letters: 19–26; Maimonides Guide: preface; Averroes Decisive Treatise: 1–3, 7–10). Both Averroes and Maimonides maintain that religion and philosophy are compatible. Additionally, given this compatibility, they assign to philosophy a crucial role in arriving at the true, inner meaning of Scripture, particularity by suitably employing it in figurative interpretations of Scripture (Maimonides Guide: preface; Averroes Decisive Treatise: 1–3, 7–10). Furthermore, Averroes advances a religious epistemology, proceeding from the assumption that “truth does not oppose truth; rather, it agrees with and bears witness to it” (Decisive: 9). In light of this assumption, contradictions between al-Shariʿah (Religious Law) and philosophy are viewed as mere seeming, rather than essential, contradictions that result from the literary form of Scripture— which involves similes, metaphors, and stories. Since al-Shariʿah cares for all people, “the red and black”, it conveys the truth in distinct methods in accordance with the types of assent for which people of different intellectual capacities are fit (ibid, 8). Only those who are adept in science (al-rasikhuna fi al-ʿilm) can have access to the internal meaning of Scripture, which is designed according to the truth as it is, thereby attaining certain, demonstrative, assent to Scripture. Drawing on Averroes’ religious epistemology, post-Maimonidean philosophers, continuing Maimonides’ philosophical-theological enterprise,^[5] undertook to interpret Judaism as “a philosophical religion” by giving principles of Judaism that appeared to them to be in conflict with philosophy naturalistic interpretations (for the concept of philosophical religion see Fraenkel 2012: 5). In a similar vein, Albalag engages in allegorical interpretations of some elements of the Account of the Beginning, stating that “it is possible to extract the philosophical doctrine of eternal generation from the Torah” (Tiqqun n.30, 33).

On the other hand, Albalag reveals ambivalence about the feasibility of the philosophical approach to religion, as he points to the difficulty of accessing the true meaning of Scripture. Importantly, prophetic secrets enclosed in Scripture remain exclusive to the understanding of the prophet. Even the ablest philosopher can hardly understand them or have access to the “intention” of the prophet. Accordingly, when a philosopher assigns a philosophical meaning to a verse he may just be deviating from its actual, concealed meaning.

Furthermore, the philosophical approach to religion poses implications for both religion and philosophy to which Albalag points through his critique and description of Maimonides as one of the “hasty” people who did harm to both faith and wisdom (Tiqqun n.1: 5; Tiqqun n.30: 44). From Albalag’s perspective, the attempts of Maimonides and his followers to rationally support religious doctrines drove them to act “with ignorance”:

They denied demonstrative philosophical doctrines, advocating, instead, weak speculative arguments, and
They ascribed meanings to Scripture in terms of these arguments and based on their own understanding of Scripture.

Two considerations underlie Albalag’s critique. The first is that Maimonides and those who followed in his footsteps were pushed to compromise philosophy to satisfy their theological commitments. The second is that philosophers confidently interpreted Scripture allegorically on the assumption that they correctly understood the internal meaning of Scripture, whereas, in fact, the true intention of the prophet cannot be accessible. Given these implications, Albalag offers what may be characterized as a restrictive scheme of scriptural interpretation in terms of philosophy (for a discussion of Albalag’s approach to Scripture in light of skeptical considerations, see Lemler 2019). This scheme specifies demonstration as the proper method for attaining the truth by natural means and Scripture as a divine source of the truth. Scripture contains two layers of secrets: philosophical and prophetic. A philosopher may have the ability to arrive at the former layer by engaging in allegorical interpretation after having obtained true knowledge by natural means, i.e. through demonstration:

for one who seeks the truth, it is not proper [for him] to seek its premises from what he apprehends from Scripture by his own effort without primarily [engaging in] demonstrative reasoning. Rather, he has to learn the truth first through demonstration and thereafter seek support from Scripture. (Tiqqun n.30: 37; cf. Averroes Decisive Treatise: 7)

When a Scriptural doctrine conflicts with a demonstrative conclusion, one is led to assuming the presence of a deeper layer of secrets, prophetic secrets to which only a prophet has access. In this occasion, it is recommended that one accepts the former based on simple faith, while at the same time maintaining adherence to the latter based on demonstration. Both doctrines remain “true” (ʾemet) for the philosopher-believer.

These claims have led to the ascription of the double truth doctrine to Albalag in modern scholarship. It should be noted, however, that the double truth is meagerly applied throughout Tiqqun; only within the context of the tension between religion and philosophy about the origin of the world. Towards the end of his discussion of this issue Albalag states that he accepts as “true” both the philosophical doctrine of eternal generation and the biblical doctrine of temporal creation, the former based on “nature” and by means of “demonstration” and the latter based on “ prophetic authority and by way of miracle” (Tiqqun n.30: 52). This peculiar way of treating the question of the relationship between religion and philosophy separates Albalag, at least partially, from the tradition of Jewish Averroism in which religion and philosophy are held to be different representations of the same truth.

9. Theory of Prophecy

Underlying the double truth doctrine is a unique theory of prophecy. Departing from the widely adopted conception of prophecy in medieval Jewish and Islamic philosophy, which views prophets as accomplished philosophers, Albalag associates prophets with the realm of separate intellects. According to Albalag, prophets are extraordinary individuals endowed with a special mode of apprehension that grants them access to knowledge distinct from philosophical knowledge in both content and type. Prophets not only arrive at answers to questions that lie beyond the capacity of human reason, but they also grasp the truth in a transcendent manner, independently of physical tools and the cognitive processes required for rational knowledge (Guttmann 1945: 86; Ṣadik 2015; Abdalla 2022: 677).

Their [the philosopher’s and prophet’s] modes of apprehension are distinct. In fact, they are opposite [one another]: [the philosopher] perceives the intelligible through sensory objects, while the latter [the prophet] perceives sensory objects through the intelligible. (Tiqqun n.30: 44 [my translation])

Here, Albalag suggests that the prophetic mode of apprehension parallels that of the separate intellects, which is described in the Tiqqun in similar terms, as “ opposite ” to the human intellect in that it obtains knowledge independently of physical tools (Tiqqun n.11: 16; cf. n.42: 67). This distinction entails differences in the characteristics of the perceived knowledge. While human knowledge transitions from potentiality to actuality, is universal and particular, pertains to time, and involves features of multiplicity, and compositeness, divine knowledge is transcendent, being neither particular nor universal, constantly actual, indivisible, simple, and atemporal (Tiqqun n.42: 67). From this perspective, prophetic knowledge is said to harbor qualitative distinctions from philosophical knowledge, which is why conflict between them arises on some occasions

Just as they [the philosopher and the prophet] apprehend things in distinct ways, their respective understandings are so distinct that it is possible for the former to perceive from below [based on natural means] the opposite (hefekh) of what the latter perceives from above. (Tiqqun n.30: 45 [my translation])

In contrasting the realms of prophecy and philosophy, Albalag’s theory of prophecy diverges from the prevailing view in his intellectual milieu, which saw prophets as accomplished philosophers, distinguished from philosophers only by their possession of a strong imaginative faculty. This faculty enabled prophets, unlike philosophers, to carry out the crucial political role of establishing laws conducive to the welfare of society and reformulate theoretical knowledge in a way that the general public could easily understand. Whatever theoretical knowledge a prophet attains through emanation from the Active Intellect—the intellect of the sphere of the moon to which philosophers ascribed epistemological and ontological roles in the sublunary realm—aligns with philosophical knowledge, with the difference being particularly quantitative (Macy 1986; Rahman 1958). Even the Avicennian theory of prophecy, which links the prophetic mind to the divine realm, does not attribute any qualitative superiority to prophetic knowledge over philosophical knowledge. Instead, prophets are thought to apprehend the principles of all existents, the middle term of every syllogism and intelligible forms instantaneously and effortlessly through divine intuition (ḥads). (Rahman, 1958: 32; Marmura 1963: 49–51; Morris 1992: 84). In other words, in this Avicennian view of prophecy, no room is left for contradiction between prophetic and philosophical knowledge.

10. Political Thought

In the context of medieval Jewish and Islamic philosophy, political thought emerged from exploring the connection between social good and human happiness on one hand, and philosophy and religion on the other. In the final section of the Metaphysics of the Maqāṣid, al-Ghazali relates the philosophers’ standpoint on the relationship between social welfare and religion. Proceeding from the Aristotelian dictum that “man is political by nature” (Aristotle Politics 1252b30–1253a1), the philosophers explain that it is necessary for people to live in societies in order to satisfy their basic needs. Through social interactions and cooperation, they can ultimately attain the highest good. However, society can be conducive to these goals only when it is justly governed. Such a state of justice is tied to the existence of a lawgiver who enacts laws and promotes doctrines that ensure social and spiritual well-being.

Albalag begins the Tiqqun with the political theme with which al-Ghazali concludes the Maqāṣid. In the preface to the Tiqqun, Albalag emphasizes the political nature of human beings and the essential role of society in realizing the well-being of individuals. Nonetheless, Albalag explains that society could be led to a different fatal direction if it contained diverse beliefs and practices, given that lack of unity might result in constant tension and warfare, ultimately threatening human existence. Therefore, a lawgiver is needed to foster social harmony by uniting people through shared beliefs and practices.

Albalag accommodates the Torah into this political theme, assigning it a crucial role in establishing social and political order and maintaining the divinely ordained perpetual existence of the human species. This outlook aligns with the Medieval Aristotelian view on the socio-political function of divine Law. Maimonides, for instances, considers the Torah a key factor in the establishment and maintenance of social well-being. However, Albalag departs from Maimonides, as well as prominent Muslim philosophers such and Averroes, by confining the Torah’s purpose to this socio-political function. These philosophers, in contrast, define divine Law by its dual goals, explaining that, unlike man-made laws, which care only for the welfare of society, divine Law cares for both the welfare of society and welfare of the soul (Fraenkel 2012: 175; Z. Harvey 1980: 199–200). In Maimonides’ understanding, the Torah does not exclusively focus on the practical domain, but it is also concerned with theoretical virtues. Reflecting this understanding, he interprets the commandment to “love the Lord” (Deuteronomy 6:4–5) as an injunction for the true worship of God: intellectual worship. The Torah, accordingly, calls upon people to seek knowledge of all existents by virtue of which man attains intellectual perfection, truly worshiping God (Eight Chapters: 78; cf. Guide III:53).

In one context, Albalag relates religious commandments to the injunction of exerting oneself to the true worship of God, which involves a fundamental intellectual aspect (Sadik 2022: 362). Nonetheless, this briefly mentioned perspective is overshadowed by a clear distinction drawn between philosophy and the Torah in the preface to the Tiqqun in terms of their respective goals: philosophy aims for the happiness of the select few, which is intellectual in nature, while the Torah aims for the happiness of the multitude, focusing exclusively on civic well-being. In the same context, Albalag introduces four foundational principles of the Torah.

reward and punishment,
the survival of the soul after death,
the existence of a deity that rewards and punishes, and
the existence of divine providence that watches over human beings, each according to his deeds.

It is evident that these principles fall under the category of those necessary for social well-being (Touati 1962: 44–47; Schweid 2008: 320–321; Guttmann 1945: 90–91). While Albalag acknowledges that these principles are also shared by philosophy and other laws, his philosophical analysis reveals a divergence between philosophy’s approach and the Torah’s presentation of these and other doctrines for societal purposes. Furthermore, the Torah’s profound commitment to the multitude’s happiness is made all the more evident by highlighting its strategic use of concealment and revelation. As Albalag explains, only doctrines conducive to social well-being are revealed, either directedly or indirectly, by the Torah. Doctrines that might conflict with this aim or potentially harm society are either concealed or omitted.

11. Conclusion

Sefer Tiqqun ha deʿot represents a significant development in both Jewish thought and philosophy. During a period when post-Maimonidean philosophers sought to advance Maimonides’ philosophical-theological enterprise, as they interpreted it, Albalag advocated the double truth doctrine, which stands at odds with the principles and objectives of the Maimonidean enterprise. In practice, however, this doctrine is applied in a remarkably limited scope, while the superiority of philosophy as a source of true knowledge and certainty is highlighted throughout the Tiqqun. Unlike the religious domain, where truth is qualified by degrees and is ultimately accessible by prophets and is subject to human interpretations, philosophical truth is seen as absolute. It can be obtained through demonstrative reasoning and learned from Aristotelian sciences. This understanding of philosophical truth motivated Albalag to critically examine philosophical discourse, aiming to eliminate errors and restore what he perceived as correct Aristotelianism, as understood through the lens of Averroes, the Commentator. The outcome is a philosophical treatise that, overall, marks a keen attempt to move away from major Neo-Platonic trends that had influenced the Avicennian-Farabian interpretation of Aristotle.

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Adamson, Peter, 2016, “Masters of the University: ‘Latin Averroism’”, in History of Philosophy without any gaps, episode 251, King’s College London.
Hillier, H. Chad, “Ibn Rushd (Averroes) (1126–1198)”, in Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Horovitz, S., 1905, “Albalag, Isaac”, Jewish Encyclopedia and also the for Isaac Albag within it.

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Isaac Albalag

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