Alberic of Paris

First published Tue Oct 28, 2025

Alberic of Paris, also known as Alberic de Monte, was, according to his contemporaries, one of the most prominent philosophers in Paris in the twelfth century, a period in which the Latin-speaking West saw a marked revitalization of philosophical and scientific learning, and in which Paris rose to become its leading educational center. Alberic was the main rival to Peter Abelard (1079–1142) and, in the words of one of his pupils, “a most fierce opponent of the nominalist school”—that is, of Abelard and his followers (John of Salisbury, Metalogicon, 2.10). He is best known for having proved that Abelard’s logic was, on its own axioms, inconsistent.

1. Life and Works

Prior to the foundation of the University of Paris in c. 1200, the Parisian educational scene was dominated mainly by individual teachers who taught, often in rented quarters, at various places in and around the city. It was a dynamic and fiercely competitive environment in which masters vied keenly with each other to attract fame and students, great numbers of which flocked to Paris from far and wide. The most influential teachers acquired dedicated followings, and the five most dominant of these “schools of thought” (sectae) were the Nominales (aka Vocales), the Parvipontani (aka Adamitae), the Porretani (aka Gilbertini), the Melidunenses (aka Robertini) and the Albricani (aka Montani). The Nominales were the followers of Peter Abelard, the Parvipontani those of Adam of the Petit Pont (aka Adam of Balsham), the Porretani were the followers of Gilbert Porreta (aka Gilbert of Poitiers) and the Melidunenses were those of Robert of Melun; the Albricani were the followers of Alberic (Iwakuma & Ebbesen 1992; Courtenay 2009; Goubier & Rosier-Catach 2019; Marenbon & Hansen 2022; Hansen, Donato, & Schuman forthcoming a).

Alberic taught in the area of the Abbey of Sainte-Geneviève, located on the left bank of the Seine, where the Pantheon is today. It was then a hill on the outskirts of town, and it is from this hill, Mont Sainte-Geneviève, that Alberic appears to have acquired his cognomen “de Monte” (Courtenay 2009: 38; Hansen, Donato, & Schuman forthcoming a). In modern scholarship, he is usually referred to as Alberic of Paris. This practice has no medieval precedent, but it is long standing and was seemingly established centuries ago in order to distinguish him from other twelfth-century Alberics, with some of whom, Alberic of Rheims in particular, he has often been confused (Hansen, Donato, & Schuman forthcoming a). The medieval sources usually refer to him simply as master Alberic (magister Albericus), and the only extant medieval source to actually use the cognomen “de Monte” did not surface until the 1960s (Huygens 1962).

Very little is known about Alberic’s life. He may have studied, and perhaps even taught, under Abelard before setting up his own school (Courtenay 2009: 39; Hansen, Donato, & Schuman forthcoming a). He certainly knew Abelard’s views very well and seems to have made his name in part by his fierce opposition to them, much as how Abelard rose to fame by forcefully attacking the views of his own teacher William of Champeaux.

As for Alberic’s career as a teacher, the autobiographical accounts of some of his prominent students allow us to establish some rough dates for his activity. Thus, John of Salisbury (c. 1115–1180) tells us that, when in 1136 he went to Paris to study, he first studied briefly under Peter Abelard, and then:

After that, when he went away, all too hastily as it seemed to me, I attached myself to Master Alberic, who stood out among the rest as a dialectician of the highest renown, and was in point of fact a bitter opponent of the nominalist school. I thus spent almost two years at Mont Sainte-Geneviève, having as my teachers in this art Alberic and Master Robert of Melun. (John of Salisbury, Metalogicon, 2.10; trans. Hall)

Moreover, William of Tyre (c. 1130–1186) relates that during the period he spent studying liberal arts in Paris from c. 1146 to 1155 he not only studied under a number of principal teachers, but

also went to hear others, even if not regularly, then often and especially for the sake of disputation, all were outstanding men and worthy of all praise: master Alberic de Monte, master Robert of Melun, master Mainerus, master Robert Amiclas, master Adam of the Petit Pont. These seemed to be the major luminaries. (William of Tyre, Chronicon 19.12)

Thus, Alberic was teaching already in the mid-1130s and was still active for at least part of the period between the mid-1140s to the mid-1150s. It is also known that at one point he was away from Paris. According to John of Salisbury, Alberic at some point after John had studied with him

set out for Bologna and unlearned what he had taught; and then indeed came back and untaught it. Whether for the better must be assessed by those who heard him before and after. (John of Salisbury, Metalogicon, 2.10; trans. Hall)

It cannot, at the current state of research, be determined when precisely and for how long Alberic was in Italy, but it was perhaps in the 1140s (De Rijk 1962–67, 1:82–88; Hansen, Donato, & Schuman forthcoming a). Nor is it possible to say what his change of mind consisted in, but some scholars have speculated that it may have been brought about by access to some of the Aristotelian works that were coming to be rediscovered and/or translated into Latin in this period (Courtenay 2009: 36). Previously, philosophers in the Latin West had developed their views mainly on the basis of a small number of ancient and late-ancient philosophical texts (Aristotle’s Categories and Peri hermeneias (in translation), Porphyry’s Isagoge (in translation), and Manlius Boethius’ commentaries to these texts and his logical opuscula), but they were now slowly gaining access to translations of the rest of Aristotle’s logical texts (Sophistical Refutations, Topics, Prior and Posterior Analytics). Alberic himself wrote a commentary on the Sophistical Refutations and may have been the first in the Latin West to do so (Ebbesen forthcoming).

It is not known when Alberic stopped teaching, but like the other great masters of his day his influence seemingly outlasted his tenure; there were still teachers teaching philosophy on the basis of his views in the second half of the twelfth century (Hansen, Donato, & Schuman forthcoming a). On the whole, however, the logical schools appear to have fizzled out, and there are not many signs of life after the end of the century (Ebbesen 1992: 77).

None of Alberic’s writings are known to have survived, but there are many references to his views in the extant logico-philosophical texts from the twelfth century, attesting to his great influence (De Rijk 1966; Iwakuma 2013: 27–28; Hansen, Donato, & Schuman forthcoming a). Apart from a short list reporting fourteen of Alberic’s main theses (edited in Iwakuma 2013: 30–31), these texts are mainly logical treatises and commentaries on the available works of Aristotle, Porphyry, and Boethius (we refer to these anonymous logical commentaries using alpha-numerical labels; for these labels, see Marenbon 1993; 2013b; 2018). This material forms the basis from which Alberic’s ideas have to be pieced together. It is still very much a work in progress. It is hampered by the fact that there are as yet no proper scholarly editions of most of the material transmitted in the medieval manuscripts. It is further complicated by the fact that these manuscripts transmit the material anonymously, and that it is mostly difficult to date the material with precision. We do not know, in other words, exactly when, where and by whom the texts were composed. Still, many of the texts were clearly written by followers of Alberic, and besides the explicit references to his views (and defense of them) they supply much important additional information for understanding his ideas and his disagreements with Abelard.

In what follows, we will attribute to Alberic those views that the texts explicitly attribute to him. Other distinctive views in the texts associated with his school—views not directly attributed to Alberic, but apparently held by his students—we will call Albrican, views of the Albricani. These views may have been developed by Alberic even though they are not attributed to him in the texts we have; or they may have been developed by anonymous Albricani; or, perhaps, they were developed by both. Hopefully, future research will clarify some of these problems of attribution.

2. Metaphysics

In many ways, Alberic’s metaphysical views seem to be a response to and rejection of the antirealism that pervades Abelard’s metaphysics (for Abelard’s metaphysics, see, e.g., Tweedale 1976; King 2004; Marenbon 2013a: 167–99). Be it a matter of predication, universals or time, Alberic was a realist where Abelard was not. This was certainly a clash between different metaphysical sensibilities, but also to some extent a battle over the nature of Aristotelian logic. Twelfth-century logicians were Peripatetics, heirs to and carriers of the Aristotelian tradition that, as mentioned above, had been handed down to them primarily in the logical works of Aristotle, Porphyry and Boethius; indeed, a considerable part of their philosophical output consisted in commenting on these foundational texts. Judging from his views and the writings of his followers, Alberic was a traditionalist, who sought to develop coherent theories that aligned more closely with the authoritative texts than did the views of the Nominalists, whose interpretations the Albricani often characterize as misguided or distortive (Hansen 2023; Donato 2025).

2.1 Categories and Predication

Fundamental to Alberic’s logic is the idea that logic is concerned not just with words, but also with things (Introductiones Montane Minores, 11) His logic, as a result, is deeply rooted in his metaphysics. A central role in this connection is played by the notion of predication (Donato 2025). The Albricani distinguished several types. For one, predication can be a relation between two linguistic items (names or terms); they found this notion of predication in Boethius’ On Topical Differences (1175b–c). Secondly, predication can be a relation between two items in the ontology, that is to say, between two things (res); this notion of predication they found in Aristotle’s Categories (5.2a19–27). Thirdly, on the basis of the same passage in Aristotle’s Categories, they allowed a mixed type of predication where a linguistic item is predicated of an item in the ontology. As is clear from the passage in Aristotle from which it derives, this third type follows on the second: term “P” is predicated of thing S because thing P is predicated of thing S; and it is only natural to think that the same goes for the first type, so that “P” is predicated of “S” because P is predicated of S (Hansen 2023: 587–88; see also Donato forthcoming). In other words, the second type of predication, what the Albricani call thing-predication (praedicatio rerum), is the more fundamental relation and one that is of central concern to the logician.

In line with this conception of logic, Alberic argued that Boethius’s famous claim (inherited from Porphyry) that Aristotle’s Categories is a work about “the primary words that signify the primary genera of things in so far as they signify” (in Cat. 161a) was not intended by Boethius as a fully adequate description of the scope of Aristotle’s work (something Boethius himself signals at in Cat. 160a). Certainly, the Categories is concerned with such words, but equally importantly, Alberic argued, it is concerned with predicates, and predicates, he took it, are fundamentally things rather than words. More specifically, the Categories stipulates which things are predicated of which, which things are removed from which, and which things are neither predicated of nor removed from which (C15, fol. 1ra, cited in Hansen 2024b: 285–86). Animal, to take an example, is predicated of Human, which falls under it in the Porphyrian tree; Human, by contrast, is removed from Stone, which belongs to a different branch of the tree; and Human is neither predicated of nor removed from Animal, which sits at a higher node on the same branch of the tree. As the Albricani, following Alberic, put it, the more general is predicated of the less general, opposites are removed from opposites, and the less general is neither predicated of nor removed from the more general (Hansen 2024b: 286–87). As we shall see below (§ 4.2), Alberic’s notion of thing-predication and his realist conception of Aristotle’s categories play a central role in his logic.

2.2 Universals

Alberic’s logic harbors an unmistakable commitment to real universals (Donato 2025). Predicates, as we have seen, are things. Universals are predicates par excellence. Alberic’s fundamental disagreement with Abelard on this point is clear, and the nominalists’ attempts at finding evidence for their theory of universals in Aristotle are repeatedly mocked in the writings of Alberic’s followers (Iwakuma 2013: 35; Hansen 2023: 573–74, 588–89). Curiously, however, the sources are rather reticent when it comes to information about the details of Alberic’s own view. Indeed, it has been claimed that “the Albricani’s works so far known never directly take up the question of what universals are” (Iwakuma 2013: 38). This claim, however, rests on the rejection of L. M. De Rijk’s (1966: 23–28) attribution to a follower of Alberic of a substantial commentary on Porphyry’s Isagoge (found in ms Vienna, Österreichische Nationalbibliothek 2486 and known among specialists as P20/P21); it is a commentary which discusses the matter at some length (for this commentary, see Marenbon 2018: 184–85). As argued convincingly by Donato (forthcoming), however, De Rijk’s attribution is almost certainly correct, and the commentary does give us an outline of what at least some of the Albricani took universals to be.

Again, the discussion takes its point of departure in the authoritative texts by Aristotle, Porphyry, and Boethius. Basically, the author of P20/P21 argues, after having sorted through a long list of authoritative passages, any card-carrying Peripatetic will have to accept that both names and things are universal. But, he insists, although a name or term can be universal, it cannot be a universal. The reason is that according to Aristotle’s definition (Peri hermeneias, 7.17a39–40) a universal is what is naturally apt to be predicated of many. Being linguistic items, however, names, even if apt to be predicated of many, are so by convention and not by nature. A universal, therefore, is a thing (P20/P21, edited in Donato forthcoming; cf. Grabmann 1947: 66).

In the Aristotelian tradition, the problem of universals was usually phrased as a problem about genera and species, the paradigmatic examples of universals. Committed to the view that universals are things, the anonymous Albrican thus seeks to clarify the ontological implications of his position:

We say that genera and species are located in sensible things, have their being through them, and are understood separately. That genera and species have their whole being in individuals, we understand as follows: the genus Animal has its whole being in the singular animals, that is to say, the whole nature of Animal is in each animal, but it is understood separately. For in order that this or that animal exist, it is necessary that it be a substance, that it be animated, and that it be capable of sense perception, which is the whole nature of this genus Animal and its whole being. And in this way, the whole being of the genus or of the species is located in sensible things, for universals were created with the very creation of sensible things and they have their being through them, such that Animal, say, cannot exist unless this or that animal does. But it can be understood separately. For we can understand Animal in such a way that it is neither this nor that animal, because no sensible or distinctive aspects are considered nor any individual feature. And the same holds for other secondary substances. (P20, fol. 47ra–b, cited in De Rijk 1966: 24; Donato forthcoming)

The author here is not, in other words, advocating some sort of Platonism according to which universals have extramental existence apart from individuals; it is, rather, a more moderate version of realism. Later in his text, he expands on his view by stating more precisely what he takes species and genera to be. They are, he argues, sorts of things (maneriae rerum):

We say that genera and species are sorts of things, as for example the sort of substance that is Animal is a genus. And just as we say that the sort of substance that is Animal is a genus, so we say that the sort of animal that is Human is a species, and so on. (P20/P21, edited in Donato forthcoming; cf. Grabmann 1947: 68).

His theory is thus the one of which John of Salisbury, in his dismissive review of the various theories of universals on offer in his day, mockingly says:

Then there is one who resorts to neologism, not having sufficient competence in the Latin language. For, on hearing the words “genus” or “species”, he now declares that they are indeed to be understood as things of a universal kind, and now interprets them as sorts (maneries) of things. I have no idea in which of the auctores he found this expression and this distinction, except perhaps among the foreign words or idioms of modern scholars. And even there I do not see what it could mean, unless it were a collection of things, as in Jocelin’s view, or a universal thing, though this is loath to be called a sort. For the word can refer to both, depending on its interpretation, since “sort” may denote either a sum of things or the status in which a thing of such and such a sort abides. (John of Salisbury, Metalogicon 2.17, trans. Hall, modified)

Apart from offering the author of P20/P21 a taste of his own medicine (there’s no authoritative support for saying the genera and species are “sorts” of things), John of Salisbury raises the crucial question: What exactly does it mean to say that genera and species are sorts of things (maneries rerum)?

The author of P20/P21 is rather keen to stress what it does not mean, namely that there is some thing, the genus or species, that is located in every one of its several individuals. Having claimed, as we saw above, that the whole being of animal is in each human, he seeks to dispel the worry by parsing the locution as follows:

It is the same as if one were to say: the whole being of Animal, that is to say, every property of Animal holds of each human, for it holds of each human being that it is an animate thing capable of sense perception. And we understand it in the same way when we say that the species Human is in each one of its individuals; it is to say nothing more than that every property of Human, such as being rational, mortal and able to obtain knowledge, holds of each human. (P20/21, edited in Donato forthcoming; cf. Grabmann 1947: 69)

This does not seem to give a straightforward answer to the question what sorts of things (maneriae rerum) really are and whether sense can ultimately be made of the idea. Peter King (1982: 242–47) was rather dismissive of the prospects, but Donato (forthcoming) argues on the basis of a new edition of the relevant part of the text that maneriae rerum are best construed as sets of universal properties that inhere in individuals via their individual forms. As he sees it, however, the theory thus understood merely pushes the problem of universals back a step, and as it gives no account of what it means for the universal properties it posits to hold of several things, fails to actually solve it. Ultimately, it is unclear whether the theory traces back to Alberic, but as Donato shows, many claims made by the author of P20/P21 in his presentation of the theory were commonly held by the Albricani and some are directly attributed to Alberic elsewhere (Donato forthcoming). An interesting later trace of the theory can seemingly be detected in the supposition theory of William of Sherwood, whose label for the type of simple supposition at stake in a sentence like “Human is a species” is “manerial supposition” (suppositio manerialis) (see Uckelman 2016 [2024]). It can only be hoped that further research on the writings of the Albricani will shed more light on the theory of universals found in P20/P21, its connection to Alberic and its later influence.

Whether they are things or not was not the only disagreement Alberic and Abelard had about universals. Another issue, reported in many of the texts by Alberic’s followers, was whether there can be universals with only one instance. Abelard and the nominalists denied this (see Hansen 2023: 574 for references). If there were only one human left in the universe, “Human” would not actually be predicated of many, and thus it would fail to be a universal. Alberic, by contrast, insisted that there can be universals with only a single instance (De Rijk 1966: 29). Indeed, the Albricani frequently invoke the phoenix as a stock example of a universal for which this is necessarily the case: it only ever has one instance at a time (De Rijk 1966: 27; Iwakuma 2013: 32–33; Hansen 2023: 589, 616–17). As the Albricani see it, their view accords well with Aristotle’s definition of universals. As P20/P21 puts it: “Aristotle anticipated this when he said that ‘a universal is what is naturally apt etc.’ For he wanted something to be universal even if it were not predicated actually of several things” (Donato forthcoming). As is clear from the list of theses ascribed to him, Alberic held as a corollary to this that “it is correct and true to say that ‘every phoenix is an animal’” (Iwakuma 2013: 31). Hence Alberic’s views on the nature of universals also directly impacted his account of logical syntax.

2.3 Time

Alberic’s reading of Porphyry’s Isagoge and Aristotle’s Categories put him and his followers at odds with Abelard and the Nominalists on a host of issues besides those already mentioned (see, e.g., De Rijk 1966; Marenbon 1992; Iwakuma 2013; Cameron 2015; Hansen 2024a; Donato and Hansen forthcoming). A particularly important disagreement was over the metaphysics of time. In the Categories, which was the main source on which twelfth-century philosophers built their theories of time, Aristotle claims that time is a quantity and that it has parts (Categories, 6.4b20–25; 5a6–8). In this regard, time is like a line.

Like Abelard, Alberic was an indivisibilist about lines, and is reported to have held that lines are ultimately made up of indivisible points (C17, fol. 84rb, cited in De Rijk 1966: 34; for Abelard, see King 2004: 93–95). He appears to have held a similar view about time, such that instants are to times what points are to lines; the Albricani at least were committed to this view (Hansen forthcoming), and Abelard too took instants to be what we might call temporal atoms (King 2004: 100). A problem, however, arises. For times are not quite like lines. Most importantly, as Aristotle puts it, the parts of time do not endure (Categories 6.5a27). In other words, time flows (Boethius, in Cat. 207c–d). Take, for example, the present day. It is made up of 24 hours, but only one of these hours is present. As it is just past 2pm, the first fourteen hours have passed and the last nine have yet to come. But how can something be made up of that which is no longer and that which is not yet? Abelard is clear what he thinks about the possibility of such temporal wholes:

I am not in agreement with this view and do not accept that some composite ever exists when a part of it does not endure […] Hence, the truth of the matter is that it cannot ever be truly and properly said of a day that it exists or is a whole or a quantity or even a thing or anything at all. We do, nonetheless, conceive of it as if it were a whole. (Abelard, Logica Ingredientibus, Glossae super Praedicamenta, 187–88)

On Abelard’s view, only the present instant, the currently obtaining temporal atom, exists. However, if time is essentially composite, as Aristotle seems to say, Abelard’s strict presentism would appear to do away with the reality of time altogether. Alberic, therefore, takes a different tack:

Master Alberic says that the past and future are principal parts of the present time of which the present time is made up […] They do not, however, exist, but only the present time exists, which is made up of things that do not exist, namely the past and the future. If someone then says: “If the principal part does not exist, neither does the whole”, this is to be understood as applying to those wholes which exist in virtue of the permanence of their parts, and not to those which exist through the succession of their parts, as do time, speech and an act of running. (C17, fol. 84vb; cited in Ebbesen 1992: 72)

Alberic thus wants to distinguish between two radically different types of wholes: those whose parts exist all together and those whose parts exist one after the other (the distinction was an important one in later medieval physics and metaphysics; see, e.g., Trifogli 2000: 205–19; Pasnau 2011: 374–98; for the distinction in the twelfth century, see Wciórka forthcoming). Given their nature, the latter type of wholes—one of Alberic’s followers calls them successive wholes—do not obey the standard rules for integral wholes, and so one cannot argue from the non-existence of a given part to the non-existence of the whole. The present day exists as long as some part of it exists (Hansen forthcoming). As the quoted passage shows, moreover, time is far from the only entity of this type; processes and motions are also included. As we shall see below, Abelard’s rejection of such entities was one that the Albricani would use against him in other contexts.

3. Language and Mind

Alberic developed striking and distinctive views on the relationship between thought and spoken language, largely in the course of interpreting Aristotle’s Peri Hermeneias. Because many of these views criticize Abelard’s doctrines, it will be useful to present some Abelardian positions en passant. For a more general overview of Abelard’s thought, readers are encouraged to consult King and Arlig (2018 [2023]), Marenbon (1997, 2013a), and the studies in Brower and Guilfoy (eds, 2004).

3.1 No Thought is Composite

It is controversial whether Abelard has a theory of mental language, akin to that of later thinkers like Ockham (King 2007; Panaccio 2010). But in any case, Abelard is often happy to treat the structure of language as a guide to the structure of thought. Now when we speak a sentence—say, “Socrates is a human”—we first speak the subject term (“Socrates”), before moving on to the predicate (“human”). It is likewise, says Abelard, in thought: we first direct our attention (attendere) to Socrates, then to his humanity, and so on. As in speech, this process of thinking takes time, and its output—a thought—is a composite item with multiple proper parts. (Tractatus de intellectibus, §32; see also Rosier-Catach 2004; 2017 for an analysis of attending in Abelard).

Why does Abelard make these claims? In short, they are key to the distinction he wants to make between words (dictiones), and the complex phrases (orationes) of which sentences are a species. We might be inclined to think of words as somehow simple, and sentences on the other hand as complex. But, as Abelard notices, this cannot be merely a function of their meaning: by even a simple noun like “human” we understand many things: rationality, animality, and so forth (Tractatus de intellectibus, §32). Is the thought that corresponds to the word “human” therefore a complex thought, just like the thought that corresponds to a spoken sentence? No, says Abelard: by “human” we understand many things, but all at the same time. In contrast, by a sentence like “A human is a rational animal”, we understand the meanings of the individual words in a successive way, across time. Thus, the difference between words and sentences depends on the way the two are composed in relation to time. Abelard sums this up by drawing an analogy with sight: “now I see the three stones placed before me all at once, with one glance; now I see them one after another successively, with multiple acts of looking” (Tractatus de intellectibus, §34). These successive acts of looking are analogous to successive acts of attending in the composition of a complex thought.

Against this doctrine, the Albricani mount an impressive, multi-pronged attack. Their arguments are preserved in H15 (I, §§106–111) and H17 (fols 89vb–90ra). The former text is edited but not translated, the latter is neither edited in full nor translated. Translations of the relevant sections of H15, as well as an edition and translation of the arguments in H17 are, however, to be found in Schuman (2024).

Of all these arguments, arguably the most elegant and clever is the one that catches Abelard in the trap of his own strict presentism. Recall that for Abelard, only the present moment exists (§2.3, above): the future is nothing (yet), and the past is nothing (anymore). Abelard inferred from this that there are no such things as successive wholes. But, as the Albricani point out, it then also follows that there is no such thing as thoughts—at least, not the thoughts that correspond to spoken sentences. After all, Abelard characterizes these as having their parts across time, like the separate acts of looking at a series of stones. Therefore, complex thoughts do not—cannot—exist.

Alberic’s claim, against Abelard, that no thoughts are composite, is briefly discussed by Rosier-Catach (2004), and has received stand-alone treatment by Lenz (2007) and Schuman (2024). Rosier-Catach is particularly concerned with the response to this argument in Abelard (Dialectica, 68.25–34). Following an analysis of th stance of H15, Lenz points out that it would appear from these arguments that the Albricani rejected at least a version of compositionality—that is, the view that the meaning of sentences and thoughts is just a function of their meaningful parts, and the way in which these parts are composed. Schuman observes that the arguments advanced by the Albricani pose problems for current, post-Fregean thought about the structure of thought in relation to spoken language. More broadly, the question whether compositionality entails complexity has been recently raised in current philosophy of language by Keller (2022), who quite persuasively argues that it does not. Whether the Albricani endorsed a similar position, or even recognized these implications of their view, is not currently known.

3.2 Meaning and Spoken Language

In the Peri Hermeneias, Aristotle explicitly sets aside the grammatical moods other than the declarative. Questions, commands, optatives and so forth are not of interest in logic, he says, because they are neither true nor false (1.17a3–6). Even so, twelfth-century commentators were left to deal with two complications to this picture. First, though spoken phrases like commands and requests are not signs of something true or false, Aristotle does say they are significative (1.17a1). The question then is, significative of what? Second, even though Aristotle is content to set these non-assertive phrases aside, Boethius goes ahead and provides a taxonomy of them anyway, in his longer commentary on the Peri hermeneias. In addition to assertions (“Socrates is running”), Boethius recognizes four: requests, questions, commands, and vocatives. Respectively:

  • If only Socrates would run
  • Is Socrates running?
  • Run, Socrates!
  • Hey there, Socrates, O runner thou!

Twelfth-century commentators are thus left to figure out how all these are related.

Abelard’s answer is simple: they are all signs of the same thing, namely, the thought (intellectus) of Socrates running. (In this regard, Abelard’s view looks a good deal like the familiar Fregean picture). The Albricani push back: how can they all be signs of the same thing, if only the assertion is true? Abelard’s famous development, which is supposed to head off this problem, is that they differ in what they express, i.e., their dicta. What these dicta are is controversial (see Cesalli 2012 and 2019, King & Arlig 2018 [2022]). But in any case, it is critical for Alberic that only the assertion (“Socrates is running”) expresses a thought; the others are signs of passions of the soul (passiones animae). Because passion of the soul is the genus of thought, every thought is a passion of the soul; but not every passion of the soul is a thought. Hence the foregoing examples differ from the corresponding assertion on the level not only of language but also of mind.

What evidence is there for this difference in mind? H15, an anonymous text associated with Alberic’s school, presents the argument of a child demanding bread (I, §51). A young boy shouts:

Give me bread!

But the boy, says the author of H15, lacks the reflective awareness of his own will that would underwrite the corresponding assertion, namely:

I want to have bread.

Granted, an adult who hears the boy can form the corresponding assertion (“He wants to have bread”); but this thought is what is produced (constituere) in the adult by the boy’s command, not something signified in the mind of the boy himself. Similarly, a dog’s bark is not a noun, because it does not signify the appropriate mental item—even if someone who hears the dog can be made aware of the dog’s anger, excitement, etc. It is thus a defining feature of the Albricani that they sharply distinguish semantics from pragmatics in this way: not every thought that is produced in a listener corresponds to the same thought in the mind of the speaker.

4. Logic

4.1 Embarrassing Abelard

Alberic’s most famous and significant logical finding is that Abelard’s logic is inconsistent. To see how his proof works, first consider the following argument from opposites, which we will call Embarrassing Argument 1 (EA1, following the terminology and reconstruction of Martin 1987b):

If Socrates is a man and a stone, Socrates is a man

If Socrates is a man, Socrates is not a stone

∴ If Socrates is a man and a stone, Socrates is not a stone

But If Socrates is not a stone, Socrates is not a man and a stone

∴ If Socrates is a man and a stone, Socrates is not a man and a stone

As Alberic points out, Abelard’s treatment of conditionals, plus his account of the locus from opposites, bind him to accept this argument, or some equally embarrassing version of it. (Introductiones Montane Minores, 63–64; Martin 1987b: 391; for other formulations of such embarrassing arguments, see Martin 1987a: 432; Martin 2004: 188–89; Donato 2025: 366–73). Yet although the premises of EA1 are true, the final conclusion is, on Abelard’s own lights, self-contradictory (more on this and Abelard’s commitments below).

In response to this embarrassing argument, Abelard distinguishes a broader and a narrower sense in which a conditional can be true (Dialectica, 283–84). In the broader sense, the antecedent of a true conditional cannot be true without the consequent also being true—roughly like modern Strict Implication. This sense, Abelard thinks, is too broad. But in the narrower sense, the antecedent of a conditional must also of itself require (ex se exigere) the truth of the consequent. Hence to give an example, any conditional that goes from a contingent truth (“it’s raining in Leuven”) to a necessary one (“\(2+2=4\)”) will be true in the broad sense, but not true in the narrow sense, because the antecedent does not require the truth of the consequent.

This is often glossed in the secondary literature as a notion of containment, and Abelard clearly thinks of it in this way. Note, however, that Abelard thinks of this containment more in metaphysical than semantic terms. Although being a human excludes the possibility of being a stone, nevertheless not-being-a-stone is not contained in being a human—that is to say, not-being-a-stone is not contained in a human qua substance. In contrast, Abelard tells us, “If Socrates is a human, then Socrates is an animal” is admissible in the narrower sense, because animal is contained in the human Socrates qua his substance.

With this, Abelard has expressed the guiding idea of relevance logic, past and present. He immediately puts it to work, ruling out each of the premises of EA1 as false, since being a stone does not of itself require not being a human, etc. In other words, if you ask me to define what stone is, I do not include the negative requirement “not being a human” in my (sufficient and correct) definition. So, the premises of EA1 are straightforwardly false conditionals. Therefore, the whole argument does not lead from true premises to a false conclusion. Having presented his solution, Abelard triumphantly declares that the sort of necessity he has identified is free from all embarrassment (“ab omni absoluta est inconvenienti”; Dialectica, 284).

But it was not to be so. Alberic’s next move against Abelard was decisive, and made use of precisely Abelard’s own example of a true conditional to construct another reductio out of Abelardian conditionals—conditionals, that is, that meet the containment requirement, because they use definitional terms. Thus Abelard’s stronger conditions with their appeal to a notion of relevance was not sufficient to stave off disaster.

The argument in question appears in various forms in the primary literature: it is in the Introductiones Montane Minores (65–66), and an anonymous commentary on Boethius’s On the Hypothetical Syllogism (SH1, fol. 79vb; cited in De Rijk 1966: 52–56; for the alpha-numerical label, see Iwakuma 2024: 20 n. 2). Among the primary sources, the most elegant presentation is in the latter. Here it is (call it EA2), along with its formal reconstruction of Martin (1987b: 394–395; see also Martin 1987a: 433):

  EA2 Formal
1. If Socrates is a man, he is an animal \(p \to q\)
[true conditional]
2. If Socrates is a man and is not an animal, Socrates is not an animal. \((p \land \neg q) \to \neg q\)
[simplification]
3. If Socrates is not an animal, Socrates is not a man. \(\neg q \to \neg p\)
[1 contraposition]
  1. \([(p \land \neg q) \to \neg p]\)
    [2, 3 transitivity]
4. If Socrates is not a man, it is not the case that Socrates is a man and an animal. \(p \to \neg (p \land \neg q)\)
[simplification, 3a contraposition]
5. ∴ If Socrates is a man and not an animal, it is not the case that Socrates is a man and not an animal. \(\therefore (p \land \neg q) \to \neg (p \land \neg q)\)
[3a, 4 transitivity]

Having presented this argument, the anonymous author of the Introductiones Montanae Minores reports—not without apparent glee—that Abelard was compelled to grant its necessity. It was a decisive win for Alberic and his school.

Now to a modern reader, the putative absurdity of EA1 and EA2 may not be so clear: after all, the antecedent of line 5 is false, and so the conditional should be true—at least as a material conditional. But for Abelard, it is not a material conditional, as we have seen, but rather has the stronger relevantist conditions just discussed. What’s more, Abelard inherited from Boethius—and endorsed—what is now sometimes called Boethius’s Theorem (for more on this, see the entry on connexive logic). By this theorem, no proposition can entail its opposite. For Abelard, this means that no conditional of the form \(p \to \neg p\) can be true (Martin 1987b). And, if we return to the concluding lines of EA1 and EA2, we can see that they do take this form. (Supposing, that is, that the negation in the apodosis of EA1 ranges over the conjunctive sign). Thus it is Abelard’s specific logical commitments that render him vulnerable to Alberic’s argument. And it seems that Abelard threw his hands up at this problem, as one that cut to the heart of his own system.

More broadly, EA2 marked—to use the phrase of Calvin Normore—“a watershed in the history of logic” (1987: 205). The general crisis it provoked led to a highly fruitful pursuit of various solutions in the schools. For the Albricani, EA2 is not a problem because of their realism about predication. Thus, for them, the second conjunct in the antecedent of 2 (“Socrates is not an animal”) is destructive of the whole conditional, since Socrates is indeed a human, and necessarily so; thus the conditional is false (more on this below). At least one other school besides the Albricani—the Porretani—seems to have adopted a similar approach. In contrast, the Parvipontani responded by embracing what are now sometimes called the paradoxes of strict implication: anything follows from what’s impossible, and what’s necessary follows from anything. Of course, the Nominalists could not provide a solution like that of the Albricani, given their anti-realist ontological commitments. And the commitment of the Nominalists to containment meant they could not adopt the solution of the Parvipontani.

Indeed, whereas Alberic’s Embarrassing Arguments were a coup for him in his day, it was the Parvipontani—or anyway, their approach—that was ultimately to prevail in the following centuries, culminating in the purely treatment of logical consequence in Buridan’s Tractatus de Consequentiis (1.3–4). In Buridan’s account, consequence is purely truth-functional, not a matter of relevance or containment. And it was perhaps owing to Alberic’s influence that, leading up to Buridan, the so-called Parisian tradition of thinking about logical consequence emphasized truth preservation in this way. In contrast, what is sometimes called the British tradition, removed from the crisis, stressed relevantist versions of containment. (See the entry, medieval theories of consequence).

Many of these historical developments have received considerable attention in the secondary literature in addition to the works cited above. Wilks (2008) shows how Alberic treats the problem of EA2 as a problem of predication and not—as Abelard had done—conditional inference (more on this in §4.1, below); Wilks also analyses in detail how other schools responded to this argument (2008: 142ff.). Lenzen (2021: 119–26) analyzes a more complex version of EA1, and Abelard’s response to it. And in addition to historical studies, logic with a more contemporary focus has taken an interest in Alberic’s EA2 as well; in particular, Estrada-González and Ramírez-Cámara (2020) suggest a “Nelsonian escape” from Alberic’s argument by rejecting Simplification as a straightforward deductive rule, which would rule out premise 2 of EA2. The authors grant, however, that this move apparently comes at a “higher theoretical cost” than simply rejecting Abelard’s logic for conditionals (2020: 111).

4.2 Alberic’s Own Logic

In addition to his arguments against Abelard, Alberic also expounded and developed several positive logical doctrines. As we mentioned (§1 above), it’s known that the Albricani kept a list of characteristic logico-philosophical positions. This list has been edited and discussed by Iwakuma (2013) and is translated in Hansen, Donato, and Schuman (forthcoming a). The main analysis in the secondary literature of Alberic’s overall doctrine, however, is Donato (2025). Donato argues that Alberic’s logic is (i) realist, in the sense that it deals with relations among things (res) rather than relations among linguistic items, and (ii) that it is an attempt to resuscitate a characteristically Boethian logic, in response to the heterodox views propounded by Abelard. To see all this in action, let’s return to Alberic’s account of predication, before looking at his logic of conditionals.

When we predicate P of S—for instance, by saying “S is P”—what are we talking about? According to Alberic’s Nominalist rivals, we are predicating the word “P” of the word “S”. But as we saw above (§2.1), although Alberic allows that predication is in some sense linguistic, he adds another and primary layer, what the Albricani call “thing-predication” (praedicatio rerum): thing P is predicated of thing S. Thus logic, in the final analysis, is about things.

Alberic recognized several key implications of this view, two of which are: P is only properly speaking predicated of S when the predication is

  1. true (a thing cannot be predicated of another thing if it is not so in reality); and
  2. affirmative (“No human is a stone” does not express any kind of inherence in things in the actual world).

Regarding (i), Alberic holds that a false putative predications are merely clusters of terms (appositiones terminorum). In Donato’s words, “they fail to express any nexus of predication”. Similarly, regarding (ii): negative statements do not express the predication of one thing of another, but rather the removal of it.

Importantly for his logic, Alberic’s requirements (i) and (ii) allow him to account for what is wrong with EA2, and so to avoid the trap he set for Abelard. For there is not an appropriate relation of predication in the second conjunct of premise 2 of EA2, since “…is not a human” cannot be predicated of Socrates. This is because there is an incompatibility or opposition (repugnantia) between Socrates and not-being-a-human. (Likewise, also, for EA1, since being-a-human and being-a-stone are incompatible). Since this relation is lacking in the things themselves, there cannot be a conditional relation, either.

For further analysis of this relationship between predication and conditionals in Alberic, his arguments for thinking logic primarily deals with things (res), and his qualification of the logical law of transitivity, see Donato (2025).

5. Future Contingents and Divine Foreknowledge

The future is contingent: maybe there will be a sea battle tomorrow, maybe there won’t. But as Aristotle claims in an influential passage (Peri Hermeneias 9, 19a23–19a39), it is at present neither true nor false that it will.

On its own, the contingency of the future introduces plenty of complications. But it gets worse when we consider God’s omniscience. If God knows the future, it must turn out the way He knows, and therefore it cannot be contingent. If it is truly contingent, then it falls outside divine knowledge, and so poses a counterexample to divine omniscience. These problems were set out and discussed by Boethius in another highly influential passage, On the Consolation of Philosophy 5.3–6.

Alberic’s solution is clear and direct: God’s knowledge undergoes change. That is, as things unfold, so also does God’s knowledge of them. But defending this solution involves key difficulties: it falls to Alberic and his school to show that such changes in knowledge do not entail a change in God. This is something they largely handle in quantitative terms: just because God knows different things today than He did yesterday, it does not follow that He knows more or less. We know of two ways that these claims were defended in Alberic’s school.

The first way is apparently to say that God knows all things, but that when something changes, the new knowledge gets swapped out with the old in an apparently instantaneous way. So, for example, God knows that you are sitting; when you stand up, the knowledge that you are sitting is straightaway swapped out with the knowledge that you are standing. God’s knowledge is, presumably, being constantly updated in this way. But from this, it does not follow that God is gaining or losing knowledge, at least in terms of overall quantity. As the author of H17 (fol. 95rb; see the analysis in Schuman forthcoming) puts it, just because Socrates has different coins in his pocket today from the ones he had yesterday, it does not follow that he must have more or fewer coins overall. (Indeed, Socrates could even increase his wealth without increasing his total number of coins, for instance trading a dozen silver coins for a dozen gold ones). But again, in order to work the way the author wants it to, the substitutions in either case—coins or knowledge—must be simultaneous.

The second way is a good deal more sophisticated: God’s knowledge is infinite. It follows that any additions to it do not change the overall quantity, since what is infinite cannot be increased or reduced by addition or subtraction. This is the position of H10 (fols 174ra–va): new items are constantly added to God’s infinite knowledge, but this is not enough to change how much knowledge God has at any given time.

As Schuman (forthcoming) points out, this account bears an interesting likeness to the much later example in Hilbert (1924/1925 [2013]). Imagine, says Hilbert, a hotel with an infinite number of rooms, each containing one guest. If someone new were to arrive at the hotel, finding a place for the newcomer would be as simple as asking everyone to move one door down. So guest 1 would move to room 2, guest 2 to room 3, and so on ad infinitum. And just like that, we free up room 1. Similarly, the arrival of new knowledge does nothing to alter the quantity of God’s (infinite) knowledge. As set out in H10, it is an interesting moment in the historical development of thought about infinities.

In any case, for the Albricani these changes in divine knowledge do not produce a change in God. If there is any change at all, it is something like a mere Cambridge change of the sort first discussed by Geach (1969: 71–72). Here is an example of a mere Cambridge change, due to Parfit (1984: 494): suppose that, while shaving, I cut myself. This produces a Cambridge change—but a merely Cambridge change—in Confucius (Kongzi; 551–479 BC). This is because it changes the things that can be truly said of Confucius: that he lived on a planet in which one more person has cut a cheek while shaving. If changing knowledge produces any kind of change in God, for the Albricani it must be something like that.

It is noteworthy that this doctrine is one of the most discussed—if not the most discussed—of Alberic’s positions, just in terms of text alone. The relevant texts in H10 and H17 have been edited, translated, and analyzed by Schuman (forthcoming). It is also noteworthy that the view that God’s foreknowledge can undergo change comes up later in the fourteenth century, in a debate between Robert Holcot (ca. 1290–1349) and William Ockham (ca. 1287–1347). Holcot holds a position quite similar to the Albricani (see the discussion of Holcot in Nuchelmans 1973; and Brower-Toland 2013). This need not mean that Holcot had read Alberic; indeed, it seems unlikely that he did. In any case, the scope of Alberic’s influence in later centuries—if indeed there was such influence—is not currently known.

6. Conclusion

Given that contemporary study of Alberic’s philosophy is still in its infancy, there are a number of questions which call not only for answers but also for proper contextualization—questions we have undertaken to highlight in the foregoing exposition. A systematic attempt to address any one of these would constitute a stand-alone contribution in its own right, worthy of publication.

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Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the authors with suggestions.]

Acknowledgments

We would like to thank Enrico Donato for sharing his forthcoming papers with us. We would also like to thank Yukio Iwakuma for generously giving us access to his many transcriptions of twelfth-century logical texts. Also, during the writing of this entry, Schuman was (and currently is) an FWO-funded postdoc at KU Leuven (ref. no. 12AAT25N). Finally, we would like to thank the Independent Research Fund Denmark, for funding our research on Alberic through the project Exploring Twelfth-Century Philosophy: Alberic of Paris and his School, under grant number 1024-00214B.

Copyright © 2025 by
Heine Hansen <hhansen@hum.ku.dk>
Boaz Faraday Schuman <boazfs@gmail.com>

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