C. Physical Causal Closure, Nomic Generalizations, and the Cause-Law Principle

In his classic presentation of Anomalous Monism (Davidson 1970), Davidson relied on two ideas that initially appear to be benign: the causal closure of the physical domain, which holds that every physical event has a physical explanation, and a distinction between homonomic generalizations, which hold out the promise of strict laws, and heteronomic laws, which do not. On closer inspection, each idea in fact ends up threatening Davidson’s two main claims: monism and mental anomalism. In this supplement, we look closely at each of these ideas, how they adversely affect Anomalous Monism, and the extent to which Anomalous Monism can stand independently of them. We also explain in more detail Davidson’s argument for the cause-law principle, focusing on the notions of change and lawful predicate.

C.1 Causal Closure of the Physical in the Argument for Monism

Davidson’s argument for monism is supposed to be based upon assumptions – the interaction, cause-law and anomalism principles – each of which, on its own, is consistent with some version of dualism. Otherwise, the question of monism or dualism will have been begged at the outset. And the respective version of dualism must be one the ruling out of which would be a substantive philosophical achievement. Otherwise, the interest of Anomalous Monism will have been compromised. As we shall now see, these two constraints appear to be violated by Davidson’s rather innocuous-appearing invocation of a thesis of the causal closure of the physical:

Causal Closure of the Physical: every physical event has a physical explanation

In this section we look at this thesis and its bearing both on the argument for monism and, more broadly, the structure of Anomalous Monism.

Davidson assumes a version of this thesis when he writes “It is a feature of physical reality that physical change can be explained by laws that connect it with other changes and conditions physically described.” (Davidson 1970, 222). Davidson is claiming that it is part of the very nature of the physical realm that every physical event has a purely physical explanation – this is constitutive of the physical domain, a synthetic a priori principle (Davidson 1970, 221). (Given Davidson’s openness to the possibility of strict indeterministic laws (§3.1), a more refined formulation of the closure principle would read ‘every physical event that has an explanation has a physical explanation’. For simplicity, we will work with the deterministic version stated above.) With this assumption in place, Davidson’s subsequent denial of strict laws incorporating mental predicates amounts to denying that there can be more than one fully adequate and complete (i.e., strict) explanation of any physical event. Only physical explanations can constitute such explanations of physical phenomena. This assumption, however, is quite problematic given Davidson’s wider aims of establishing monism. (This has been pointed out in different ways by McLaughlin 1985, Yalowitz 1998a, Hancock 2001, Antony 2003.)

This can be seen by considering the following dilemma: assuming the interaction principle, to hold that all causally explainable events have a physical causal explanation entails either that those mental events which cause physical events are also physical – token-identity – or else that these physical effects are overdetermined by both physical and mental events. Only these two mutually exclusive options would square the interaction principle with causal closure (Antony (2003, 5), arguing in a similar vein, fails to notice the second option). Davidson cannot directly embrace the first horn of this dilemma, since this would eliminate the need for independent argument, appealing to mental anomalism, to establish the token-identity of those mental events with physical events. He must, then, acknowledge the ‘overdetermining’ dualism of the second horn as an open question. However, this is the only position available that neither begs the question about monism nor conflicts with the assumptions of closure and the interaction principle. It is therefore the only position that the subsequent argument for monism, appealing to mental anomalism (and assuming causal closure), would actually rule out. There would thus be no argument against other forms of dualism (such as Descartes’ classic formulation) which denied causal closure of the physical domain.

Now, perhaps such dualistic conceptions of mind and nature have lost some credibility in the present philosophical and scientific climates (however, are they really any less credible than ‘overdetermining’ dualism, which on this view would be Davidson’s central opponent?). However, it would be both self-defeating and wasteful to give up a general argument for monism that would ground their rejection by simply assuming closure, which then rules them out by stipulation. It is also very difficult to believe that Davidson’s only opponent is ‘overdetermining’ dualism. It is far more ambitious and interesting to limit oneself to premises that many forms of dualism might share (such as the cause-law, interaction and anomalism principles) and then show that they inexorably lead to monism without reliance on the more controversial assumption of closure. That is true of Davidson’s argument for monism shorn of any commitment to causal closure: someone who espouses dualism along with the cause-law, interaction, and anomalism principles but eschews causal closure is nevertheless shown by that argument that dualism is inconsistent with her other commitments.

It would seem, then, that causal closure should not simply be assumed in Davidson’s setup. Is it entailed by anything necessary to that setup – the interaction, cause-law or anomalism principles? Davidson’s talk of the ‘open’ nature of the mental domain (§2.3) – the fact, expressed in the interaction principle, that some mental events have physical causes – may have led him to think that the ‘closed’ nature of the physical domain followed directly, especially given the cause-law principle. But this is false. Notice first that to hold, as Davidson does, that the mental is an ‘open’ system – that mental events causally interact with physical events – does not by itself entail that the physical is ‘closed’ in the sense that every causally explainable physical event has a physical cause. More importantly, even with the cause-law principle in place, the openness of the mental does not entail that the physical domain (or any other domain, for that matter) is closed. Closure also depends partly upon whether mental anomalism is true. The latter’s falsity – the existence of strict psychophysical laws of succession – together with the cause-law and interaction principles is compatible with there not being a physical cause for every causally explainable physical event.

Furthermore, even if the interaction, cause-law and anomalism principles are all true, that still does not entail physical causal closure. There are events other than mental ones that are picked out in a non-physical vocabulary (e.g., biological events) and that cause physical events. Mental anomalism and monism do not entail anything about biology’s nomic or ontological status, and so it is consistent with Anomalous Monism that not all physical events have physical causes (Crane 1995 fails to see this point). Therefore, neither the interaction nor the cause-law principles (even together with the anomalism principle) entails causal closure. If causal closure is to figure in the arguments for anomalism or monism, it can do so only as a primitive assumption relative to these other premises.

We now need to ask about the motivation for assuming causal closure. What work does it do that might be worth the price of letting go of the more general argument against dualism? Now, the clearest appearance of the causal closure thesis comes when Davidson is offering the official argument for the anomalism principle (Davidson 1970, 222). Rationality is there cited as the constitutive feature of the mental, while closure is cited as the constitutive feature of the physical. And it is then claimed that these disparate commitments ground the anomalism principle (see §4.1). Clearly the structure of this sort of argument requires some characterization of the essence of the physical, in contrast to the mental, and Davidson’s strong commitment to causal closure may have led to its invocation here, due to a lack of alternatives. (He nonetheless insists that it does not provide a criterion of the physical (Davidson 1970, 211)). But in any case, since an assumption of closure conflicts with the aims of establishing monism, and otherwise would appear question begging, it is probably best left as a conclusion to be derived rather than as playing any supporting role in establishing Anomalous Monism.

Without the assumption, however, the question arises as to how to demarcate the mental and physical vocabularies. Without such a demarcation in hand, it can appear difficult to state what exactly is at issue when it is asked whether there can be strict psychophysical laws in particular. How can we recognize such a purported law without knowing what makes something a physical (or mental) predicate? As noted above (§2.1), Davidson despairs of the possibility of an intuitively adequate definition of the mental. However, he allows, for his purposes of establishing monism, a criterion in terms of intentionality – having a propositional content. And this criterion of the mental then allows us to pick out the ‘physical’ by exclusion, without need of a positive criterion like causal closure (Davidson 1970, 211). So the vocabulary-individuation problem does not appear significant enough, even by Davidson’s own lights, to motivate the assumption of physical causal closure.

The assumption of causal closure thus conflicts with many of Davidson’s aims and procedures in arguing for Anomalous Monism. And, as we have seen, the assumption is not required in order to establish mental anomalism (§4). However, we have also seen that causal closure does appear to play a role in Davidson’s actual derivation of token-identity – it allows him to identify the further property that causally interacting mental events must instantiate as ‘physical’ (§5.1). On some readings of the anomalism principle, however, this role can be eliminated (see §4.2, and Yalowitz 1998a). Thus, although there is ample reason for setting the causal closure thesis aside from the general framework within which the argument for Anomalous Monism takes place, its ultimate status is unclear. (For discussion of how causal closure may itself be deduced from Davidson’s framework once Anomalous Monism is in place, see Yalowitz 1998a, 225.)

C.2 Homonomic and Heteronomic Generalizations

Davidson organizes his discussion of Anomalous Monism around what he portrays as an exhaustive distinction between ‘homonomic’ and ‘heteronomic’ generalizations (Davidson 1970, 219). As we shall see in this section, it is extremely problematic for the wider purposes of establishing Anomalous Monism. Ultimately it is best to set it aside and instead focus simply on the related (but by no means identical) distinction between strict and ceteris paribus laws.

With regard to the distinction, Davidson writes:

[o]n the one hand, there are generalizations whose positive instances give us reason to believe the generalization itself could be improved upon by adding further provisos and conditions stated in the same general vocabulary as the original generalization. Such a generalization points to the form and vocabulary of the finished law: we may say that it is a homonomic generalization. On the other hand, there are generalizations which when instantiated may give us reason to believe there is a precise law at work, but one that can be stated only by shifting to a different vocabulary. We may call such generalizations heteronomic. (Davidson 1970, 219)

Davidson’s claim is that generalizations in which mental properties figure can only be heteronomic, not homonomic, and that therefore there can be no strict psychological or psychophysical laws. In the passage above, Davidson maintains that the finished (i.e., strict) laws towards which both homonomic and heteronomic generalizations (both of which are ceteris paribus – see further below) point must be stated in a homogeneous vocabulary. (This reading of the passage is supported by Davidson’s subsequent remark (Davidson 1970, 222) explaining the heteronomic character of psychophysical generalizations by appeal to various reasons for mental anomalism. This remark would not make sense if heteronomic statements could be made strict while incorporating both vocabularies.) It is important to see that this is equivalent to ruling out, by sheer definition, the possibility of heterogeneously formulated strict laws. This is extremely problematic, however, because it amounts to defining away the possibility of strict psychophysical laws – strict laws formulated in heterogeneous vocabulary. And that appears to beg one of the central questions that Davidson is investigating.

To see this, notice first that, according to Davidson’s actual formulation, neither homonomic nor heteronomic generalizations are strict. Each of these generalizations is a ceteris paribus generalization at the time when its status is under consideration, and each points in the direction of a different sort of strict law relative to the original vocabulary in which it is formulated. The sort of strict law pointed to depends upon whether a change in vocabulary is required in articulating the conditions gestured at in the ceteris paribus clause. Davidson is quite clear on this: the homonomic/heteronomic distinction is made “within the category of the rude rule of thumb” (Davidson 1970, 219; emphasis added). Since homonomic ceteris paribus generalizations are thus possible, the distinctions between homonomic/heteronomic generalizations, on the one hand, and strict/ ceteris paribus laws, on the other, are not the same; not all ceteris paribus generalizations are heteronomic. (Most commentators have failed to see this point; for examples, see Fodor 1989, McLaughlin 1985, and Hancock 2001. For extended discussion, see Yalowitz 1998a.)

The central question now concerns the status of heterogeneously formulated strict laws. It would seem that Davidson’s attack on the possibility of strict psychophysical laws is an attack on the possibility of (one form of) strict laws formulated in a heterogeneous vocabulary. But we have already observed that Davidson’s own formulation of the homonomic/heteronomic distinction as exhaustive makes it difficult to see how the possibility of heterogeneously formulated strict laws could even be at issue, since they appear to be ruled out by definition. But there are a number of reasons against proceeding in this way. If we assumed the exhaustive nature of the homonomic/heteronomic distinction, then the interaction principle would guarantee the heteronomicity of generalizations that include psychological predicates, and thus mental anomalism. As a result, no independent argument for mental anomalism would be required; this holds for monism as well.

After all, as we have already seen, the interaction principle tells us that mental events causally interact with physical events, and this means that homonomicity is already ruled out – something other than just psychological vocabulary is needed in explicating psychological generalizations of the form ‘ceteris paribus, M₁ & M₂ → M₃’. With heteronomicity the only remaining option, we could then directly draw the conclusion that the only strict laws that can cover mental event-tokens must be stated in an entirely different vocabulary. This is equivalent to mental anomalism. Furthermore, monism follows as well, since causally interacting mental events must be covered by some strict law (the cause-law principle), and the only candidate laws remaining contain no mental vocabulary – therefore, mental events must instantiate whatever properties are capable of formulating such laws. Now, as we have seen (§2.3), it is quite uncontroversial that there can be no strict, purely psychological laws, and the interaction principle expresses this. However, Davidson’s homonomic/ heteronomic framework would allow us to draw directly from this uncontroversial point the far more controversial and interesting doctrines of psychophysical anomalism and monism, with no required route through the anomalism principle. That is too quick, and anyway inconsistent with Davidson’s own explicit attempt at independent arguments for this principle. Indeed, on this way of thinking one cannot even formulate the question about the possibility of strict psychophysical laws. The only available formulation that is coherent and somewhat relevant is: ‘are generalizations in which psychological predicates figure homonomic or heteronomic?’ But this does not succeed in raising a question about strict psychophysical laws. It asks only whether there can be strict, purely psychological laws, or (barring that) concludes that there are no strict generalizations in which psychological predicates can figure at all. Clearly something has gone wrong, and the purported exhaustiveness of the homonomic/heteronomic distinction is the culprit.

What this suggests is that an argument is needed to rule out the possibility of heterogeneously formulated strict laws, otherwise the question of the possibility of strict psychophysical laws has simply been begged. And this means that we cannot assume the exhaustiveness of the homonomic/ heteronomic distinction at the start. In the main text, then, we set aside Davidson’s use of this distinction in our discussion of Anomalous Monism, and instead simply focus on the distinction between strict and ceteris paribus laws, which is at the very core of Davidson’s discussion.

C.3 Causes, Changes, and Laws

Davidson argues for the cause-law principle – that singular causal relations require strict covering laws – on the basis of a conceptual interconnection between the concepts of physical object, event, change, and law. As he says, “our concept of a physical object is the concept of an object whose changes are governed by laws” (Davidson 1995a, 274). The interconnections are established partly in response to C.J. Ducasse’s attempt, in reaction to Hume’s regularity theory of causation, to define singular causal relations without appeal to covering laws (Ducasse 1926). Davidson rejects Ducasse’s conclusion in the course of examining the concept of ‘change’ that Dcasse emphasizes.

Ducasse offered the following definition of causation: some particular event c is the cause of some effect e if and only if c was the only change occurring in the immediate environment of e just prior to e. The striking of the match is the cause of the flaming match just insofar as the striking is the only change occurring in the immediate vicinity of the flaming match just prior to the flaming of the match. Ducasse intended this definition to rebut Hume’s claim that singular causal relations between particular events must be analyzed in terms of regularities between types of events (and thus laws). Indeed, Ducasse claimed that Hume was wrong to deny that we have the ability to perceive singular causal relations – this denial being the basis for Hume’s subsequent regularity account (see §3.3). For, according to Ducasse, we can perceive that some event is the only change in the immediate environment of some subsequent event just prior to that event’s occurrence. We can, of course, be wrong in thinking that this is what we have in fact perceived. But as Ducasse points out, the same problem plagues Hume’s own account – we can be wrong that what we have perceived are instances of types which bear a regular relation to each other. But this does not lead Hume to hold that since we can’t infallibly perceive that some succession is an instance of a regularity, we cannot form the concept of causality in terms of regularity. The same thus applies to Ducasse’s own account.

Davidson notes the heavy dependence, in Ducasse’s account, on the notion of a ‘change’. And he asks whether we really have a purchase on this concept absent appeal to laws. The notion of ‘change’ is short for ‘change of predicate’ – a change occurs when a predicate true of some object (or not true of that object) ceases to be true (or comes to be true) of that object. And this leads directly to questions about how predicates are individuated and their relationship to laws.

Davidson claims that “it is just the predicates which are projectible, the predicates that enter into valid inductions, that determine what counts as a change” (Davidson 1995a, 272). We know from Nelson Goodman’s ‘new riddle of induction’ (Goodman 1983) that we can invent predicates, such as ‘grue’ and ‘bleen’ (where an object is grue if it is green and examined before 2020 or otherwise blue, and an object is bleen if it is blue and examined before 2020 or otherwise green) so that a green object goes from being grue to bleen over the course of time without having changed in any intuitive sense. It will continue to be green, though it will also be true that it ceases to be grue and comes to be bleen. Contrary to much discussion of Goodman’s riddle, Davidson holds that such unusual predicates can be projectible, and thus figure in laws, but only when appropriately paired with other such predicates ( “All emeralds are grue” is not lawlike, but “All emerires are grue” is (where “emerire” is true of emeralds examined before 2020 or otherwise sapphires ) (Davidson 1966, 225–26). What is crucial for Davidson is that to understand the notion of change, which is so closely tied to the notion of causation, one must understand the notion of a projectible predicate – one appropriate for use in science – and this notion inevitably brings in the notion of law. Changes are described by predicates suitable for inclusion within laws. But how does this relate to the cause-law principle? It is unclear why Davidson would think that it is the notion of a strict as opposed to ceteris paribus law that this line of argument motivates.