Notes to Causation in Physics

1. The labels “Humean” and “non-Humean” have become customary for this division. To what extent David Hume himself was a “Humean” is a subject of active philosophical debate.

2. See Sider (2011: 19, fn.7) for a similar comment about the causation literature more generally.

3. See also the essays collected in (Price and Corry (2007). Russell himself, it is often forgotten, changed his mind about causation. For example, in The Analysis of Matter, he writes that “all science rests upon induction and causality” (1927 [1992: 398]).

4. Formulating the temporal asymmetry this way allows for the possibility of effects occurring simultaneously with their causes.

5. Einstein in 1909 appears on both sides of the debate. For a discussion of Einstein’s views and his debate with the physicist Walther Ritz concerning the arrow of radiation, see (Frisch and Pietsch 2016).

Copyright © 2020 by
Mathias Frisch <mathias.frisch@philos.uni-hannover.de>

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