Translating and Interpreting Chinese Philosophy

First published Tue Oct 27, 2015; substantive revision Tue Oct 28, 2025

A correct translation of a philosophical text should reflect the original’s meaning. Interpretations are theories of meaning, so translation and interpretation intertwine. Philosophy of language, especially philosophical semantics, deals with meaning and methodology of interpretation. ‘Meaning’ is a normative term with different norms of application in diverse contexts. Thus, despite their connection, the criteria for good translation and interpretation can differ in different contexts.

In philosophy, meaning matters differently than it does in translating poetry. A good poetic translation may prioritize rhythm, rhyme, and emotion over philosophical insight and clarity. Philosophy values a coherent, comprehensive, and clear understanding. A philosophical poem like Laozi’s Daodejing can have many “best” translations and interpretations.

Translations work on words, phrases, and sentences, while meanings address a wider range of inference related systems. To understand a word is to know how to draw inferences from sentences containing that word to sentences containing related words. To understand ‘uncle’ is to be able to draw inferences to sentences containing ‘male.’ We draw such inferences in arguments, discussions and dialectical traditions. Difficulties arise when reasoning from a translation rather than the original. European concepts also come in inferentially articulated wholes. Reasoning using the translated European concepts tempts the reader to treat the Chinese masters as thinking in some European language.

Reasoning in the European conceptual scheme, we may not notice how inference patterns may differ between Classical Chinese and European languages. These errors undermine the coherence and clarity of translated philosophy. This kind of error has fueled philosophical skepticism about Chinese thought. It looks religious because projecting European philosophical reasoning into texts imports our conceptual background, with its key role for supernaturally pure reason, into the masters’ discussions. A “translation first” policy starts this process by assuming authoritative European equivalents to Chinese characters, as in a Chinese-English dictionary. The entries, however, are not synonyms. For 天 tiān, the dictionary entries are God, nature, sky, day, and weather. The translator hides behind the shibboleth “Chinese terms have more meanings than English.” That community treats interpretation as choosing one of the different English terms to fit each context.

Widely accepted translators’ equivalents become social norms. Translators’ conventional wisdom in the above case is to choose “Heaven” (with a capital!). Similarly, 道 dào (paths, ways) becomes “The Way” (also with capitals). 義 yì (morality) becomes “righteousness”. This obscures the moral dialectic of ancient China. The postures of different schools, 禮義 lǐyì (ritual morality), 利義 lìyì (benefit morality, utilitarianism) and 仁義 rényì (benevolence morality) are translated as two separate things rather than as modifier followed by modified things so their disagreement about morality becomes another example of the same word having different meanings for different schools, and the interpreter reads the vibrant philosophical dialectic as a massive fallacy of equivocation. Confucians, Daoists and Mohists speak separate philosophical languages. The interpretation translates a moral debate as a failure to communicate.

This is an issue almost unique to classical Chinese. In this entry, we explore how better understanding this language can help us appreciate the difficulty of philosophical translation and the role of comparative philosophy. It explains how philosophy’s focus on theories of language, mind, epistemology, metaphysics, normativity, and nature play out in the different conceptual environment of ancient China.

Knowledge of classical philosophical issues is vital for understanding later Chinese philosophy. Their classical systems impacted subsequent philosophical history more than Greek classics did our own, even granted Whitehead’s quip that European philosophy is a series of footnotes to Plato. Textual-historical issues further complicate our project since early Chinese texts had distinct and complicated compositional, editorial, and commentarial histories. Almost none were authored by their titled 子 zǐ masters. They were compiled in different versions, copied or memorized and edited by communities of student scholars. The versions that have come down to us are widely regarded as still controversial “good guesses”, so even before interpretation begins, we must resolve textual issues. This problem of textual corruption adds to the problem of relating different conceptual schemes, translating traditions and the disparate disciplines studying the texts.

Such complexities make this entry unique in this space—there are no similar entries for translating Greek philosophy, German Idealism, French Postmodernism etc. Thinking about our words and concepts can help illustrate our point. We can count words by types and tokens. Word types have historical patterns of use as word tokens. The previous sentence has two tokens of the word word that conform to English norms of use and link inferentially to words like concept, meaning and reference. Concepts are cognitive or mental items common to meaning-linked words (synonyms) including those of related languages.

Think of Chinese characters as socially rather than mentally constructed concepts. In many spoken Chinese languages, they resemble European cognates. With phonemic writing, we view these as different word types, e.g. enough and genug. We say they express the same mental concepts, ideas and thus are correct translations. Characters metaphorically stand-above Chinese languages as concepts do above European translated terms. However, they are social, historical linguistic rather than mental items. Characters are constructed of parts whose position and written stroke order follow historically evolved social norms. They bring a shared history to Chinese spoken languages the way derivation from Greek or Latin do in Europe. Spoken and written tokens of Chinese concepts play similar inferential roles in reasoning, as Wahrheit and truth do in Europe. That is, they connect in similar ways to words for fact, believe, valid, and proof. These inferential roles in Chinese are embodied in Classical Chinese texts. This insight is one way of understanding the claim that Chinese and Europeans operate with different conceptual schemes.

Words further divide into those we can expect in any human language to contain, such as sun, moon, tree, mother, and eat, and those only found in cultures with certain theories—“theory-laden” terms like atom, germ, genus, and brain. Western theology uses the theoretical terms God, soul, and sin. We can look for synonyms in European languages because we share that theology. Interpreters who assumed religion is universal and philosophy a (possibly unique) Western theoretical development tended to treat the theory-laden terms of Western theology as belonging in the former word class, as linguistic universals. Similarly, others may treat conventional linguistic wisdom--the shared European theory of language, mind, thought, ideas and reason as likely to have counterparts in Chinese just as they do in Spanish.

These facts highlight how classical Chinese written language, Wenyan, differs from the languages derived from the family of languages written in alphabetic scripts. Key Western philosophical concepts flow from reflections in Plato and Aristotle about language, including the distinction of mind, ideas, thought from body, matter, feelings. China’s philosophical history, however, includes a long period of exchange with Buddhism starting some 500 years after the classical period. It introduced a version of Idealism including other key concepts like thoughts, beliefs, laws/principles and truths. It shared with the Greeks an attitude that disvalued the many, sensible, changing appearances in favor of the one, permanent, reality.

As noted above, the core issues concern the classical Chinese scheme of philosophical concepts. Western understanding of Indian thought is also problematic, but both its status as philosophy and its conception of language, mind and the universe are considerably more familiar, accessible and less interpretively controversial. The mix of classical Chinese and Buddhist concepts in Chinese Buddhism did influence subsequent medieval Neo-Confucianism, but didn’t markedly divert the mainstream of historical Chinese philosophy. Here, accordingly, we will focus on translation of texts from the pre-Buddhist period in China which extends from roughly the 7^th century bce to the 2^nd century ce.

China’s stereotype as the ultimate “Other” for Europeans stems partly from its differences, but more from its comparably rich classical and commentarial philosophical tradition. The diversity of Chinese spoken languages and the pivotal role of Chinese classics, written in Wenyan, make it unsurprising that Leibniz would conclude that China resembled an “Oriental Europe” (Leibniz Writings on China: 12 [1708]).

Below, we delve into the problems classical Chinese language has posed for translators and interpreters. We examine methodological, metaphysical, and comparative issues relating to the reading of these foundational classical texts. We address some illustrative exegetical and translation concerns. Our primary focus will be on philosophical issues in intradisciplinary scholarly dispute. We attempt accounts of the disputes and the implications that clarify how philosophical interpretation should inform translation of these philosophical texts.

1. The Classical Chinese Language: Structure and Function

1.1 Chinese Characters

Instead of alphabet characters, the structure of a Chinese character starts with the brushstroke, vertical, corner, dot etc. These are shared with techniques in watercolor painting, linking writing to artistic representation. The next level of structure is the radical, usually a pictogram like human (人 ren), tree/wood (木 mù), sun/day (日 rì) and moon/month (月yuè). The dào of writing includes both the stroke order of the parts and the order of writing such parts in writing the composite character. The radical usually is on left or top or bottom of the character.

Traditional dictionaries arranged characters by these radicals which typically pick out a semantic type. Chinese accounts described three other major types of character structure. Some were indicatives, like 一二三 (ancient Chinese used a decimal system), above (上 shàng), below (下 xià) and center (中 zhōng). Others were ideograms, metaphorical arrangements of inferentially linked character parts. A paradigm was bright (明 míng enlightened, understand) made up of sun/day and moon. A fun example for political science students is state (國 guó), a bounded territory with a monopoly of coercion (a pictogram of a halberd 戈) over a population (of mouths 口). These mnemonics for teaching and learning characters are not always etymologically accurate, but they shape Chinese conceptions of how words (名 míng names) and language (言 yán) work.

The structure with most dictionary entries pairs the radical part with a phonetic homonym or cognate in some of the spoken languages of China. This structure effectively writes all counterparts, roughly cognates and shared concepts in the different Chinese spoken languages. These words/names have scope; they “pick out” or draw attention to some part of the natural world (有yǒu existence, reality). Language is a tool for coordinating our behavior by sharing information. A phonetic compound structure’s scope is a part of the scope of the semantic radical: “the kind of X that sounds like Y.” Almost 7000 out of the 9350+ graphs recorded in the ancient Shuowen fall in this category.

There were over a thousand phonetic elements used; modern Mandarin has only about 400 distinct syllables, Cantonese has 1,500, so in composing this type, one could see the phonetic element both as (a) a homophone in some of the other 40 languages and also as (b) one of the other roleplayers: ideograph, indicative or pictograph.

European scholars, from late 16^th-century Jesuit missionaries on, have been fascinated by this written language. Andreas Muller described this phonetic “key” for Chinese in the 1670s. His writings excited the young, China-curious, Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (Writings on China: 11 [1668]) and various other theorists, like Jacob Gohl and John Webb (1669) who treated it as a kind of universal language (Duyvendak 1936). Leibniz eventually abandoned this line of thought for work on logic (Writings on China: 38 [1679]).

For the next 150 years philosophical amateurs, missionaries, merchants, and diplomats to the “Middle Kingdom” mixed their impressionistic view with Western “folk theory” of language and mind. A signature early focus was whether Chinese could express the truths of Western religion. The Jesuits first, and Protestants a few centuries later, translated ‘God’ in different ways and tried to “logic” Chinese intellectuals into believing in a “landlord of the sky” or the “great ancestor” of ancestor worship—the emperor of the afterlife society above. Both failed (Kurtz, 2011 Ch. 1, pp 58–63).

Another more recent fascination is a dispute about relation of Chinese characters to Plato’s forms (eidê) and Locke’s ideas. How do they do the work of familiar Western “mind and idea theories” of meaning and belief? Among Sinologists, it became a quarrel about whether to allow the use of ideograph to describe Chinese characters (see Creel 1936, 1938; Peter Boodberg 1937, 1940; DeFrancis 1984; Hannas 1977: 6; Hansen 1993; Unger 1993). Alternatives proposed include lexigraphs, phonograms, phonic indicators, phonoideographs, logographs, morphographs, sinographs, syllabograms, and syllabo-phonograms (DeFrancis 1984: 73; the list is incomplete).

On the surface, this is an empty verbal dispute. “Chinese characters” is a perfectly good term for 字zì (characters). The 26 characters of English play segmental phonemic roles that change with the surrounding characters and spaces to form the written word. Chinese characters have role-playing parts but they play a variety of different roles. The relation of the whole character to spoken languages differs as well. The philosophical upshot is that differences in role and structure remove key ways ancient Greek masters motivated their theory of mind, of ideas, and of the inner world of subjective thought (e.g. Aristotle, De interpretatione, 1, 16a3–8). The above verbal dispute arose from illicitly mixing the two ontologies of language and importing an unmotivated dualist metaphysics of language as “representing intellectual items” that mediate the relation of language to the world. The Chinese conventional-historical theory leaves out that elusive mediator. The condemnation of ‘ideograph’ assumes its meaning must be framed in terms of European idea (mental image) theory. It projects Lockean abstract ideas into the Chinese account of two of their character types. Chinese theory of semantics is more like Saul Kripke’s (1980) theory of rigid designators. It is a version of the causal-historical theory of reference.

Chinese people have taught their theory of the roles of characters to successive generations in the process of training them in how to use their written language. The theory foregrounds sociology and culture as shared human practices. Their mental roles are the more non-linguistic ones of planning (simulating), imagining (empathizing), and remembering, accompanied by feelings and moods, e.g. happiness, anger, sorrow, and joy. One kind of philosophical interest in studying Chinese philosophy is seeing how the metaphysical linguistic roles they saw characters playing cohered with Chinese theory of mind (心xīn heart-mind) and nature. It gives us a way to conceive of an alternative to Western semantic psychology. The details of this Chinese theory of language rest on their deep insights into human social nature, their view of their cultural history and their shared interaction with the natural world.

Twentieth-century Western philosophy, especially since Wittgenstein, has reflected on how to improve these “folk” philosophies of language which inform so much of the philosophical enterprise. Chinese theory of their language equally clearly shaped theirs in a similar way. It is a different theory of a different language, and it informs and inspires a different philosophy.

It is best to sidestep this verbal dispute, use “characters” and “graphs” interchangeably, proceed to try and appreciate the traditional Chinese conception of their own written language.

Many differences in the ontology of language flow from this writing system. Chinese is a branch of a language family with as rich and varied a map of languages as Europe’s. To say, “I speak Chinese” is like saying “I speak European”. Wenyan is analogous to a written form of the language branch. It evolved separately from the spoken languages. We can trace its evolution up to the 20^th century when a northern dialect, Mandarin, was chosen to replace it in China. For most of Chinese history the grammar of Wenyan had been a slowly evolving version of the language in the Master Texts of China’s classical period.

Wenyan thus plays a cultural role partly analogous to that of classical Greek and Latin. It preserves the broad conceptual structure through a historical dialectic. The different Chinese spoken languages have their own ways of pronouncing the characters—their cognates and synonyms. When Japanese, Korean and Vietnamese speakers borrowed written Chinese, they imported a whole coherent conceptual structure. None viewed writing as representing sounds of their speech, but all assumed there was a correct way of reading aloud the classical text in their spoken language.

The grammar and vocabulary of each spoken language in China was different and none of them is or (probably) ever was the grammar of the classical texts. Reading philosophical classics aloud would seldom yield grammatically intelligible speech in any of the languages of East Asia. When the text was pronounced in a local language, the words were recognizable and the syntax was generic, in the form: topic-comment. The written language should not be seen as a transcription of speech (Graham 1987: 390; DeFrancis 1984: 126). There are, in effect, no “native speakers” of classical Chinese.

This way of dividing the linguistic world into a written language (文wén decoration) and many different spoken languages (語 yǔ, 話 huà) contributed greatly to the cohesiveness of East Asian culture and to making the classics more accessible to successive generations. The classical written language (文言wényán writing language) keyed the civilizing process (文化wénhuà changed by wén, civilized, educated). The spoken linguistic diversity of China was probably always like that of Europe, but they were able to communicate in a semi-artificial language of great economy and elegance, with poetic power, and access to rich allusions to a robust, shared literary, religious and philosophical tradition.

What follows “so-and-so said” in any classical text is hardly ever a strict transcription of something a speaker actually said. It expressed the core dào of the speech in Wenyan. Adding a syntactic/stylistic note in this context, one scholarly wit has said of the classical language, “Its telegraphic terseness could reflect ordinary speech only if every Chinese speaker were far more laconic than any Gary Cooper character” (Hansen 1992: 34).

Although the grammar of Wenyan differs from any language spoken then or now, one shouldn’t think it was consciously put together as an artificial construction for that purpose (see Jacob Gohl in Duyvendak 1936: 6). Rather, it almost surely evolved from the divination inscriptions found on the oracle bones of the Shang Dynasty (Keightley 1978). The written and spoken languages evolved separately over centuries and writing had understandingly less impact on unifying pronunciations but more immediate access to classical conceptual philosophical structure.

As the spoken words underwent phonetic evolution the practice of reading the texts could continue seamlessly and we can count the concepts as pervading the various pronunciations. Classical philosophizing began when the Mohists elaborated a theory of terms (名 míng names) as linked to distinctions (辯 bìan discriminations) between parts of the world and, along with the figures of the “School of Names”, began to analyze the emerging practice of writing two-character compounds. The issue was finding a stable way the compounds picked out a scope of reality based on the scopes of the separate characters. Modern dictionaries of vernaculars treat two types of compounds as counterparts of individual words of European. But there were other types of compounds which are more like what we would call predicates or sentences.

The literary written syntax, e.g., the emergence of these different kinds of compounds, may either have reflected changes in some of the spoken languages or ignited them. Factors such as these helped lead the sinologist Hurlee Creel to claim that “The Chinese characters made Chinese civilization the culture of the book and not the orator” (Creel 1997: 447).

1.2 On the Syntax of Classical Chinese

Classical Chinese is an isolating language, meaning that each graph in isolation is a word. They are not marked for “part of speech” (i.e., inflected like -ity, -ly, or -ing) nor for case, number (singular/plural), gender, or tense. It has an “SVO” (subject verb object) syntax and a first-person pronoun can be I, me, we, or us. Go (去 qù) may follow today, yesterday, and tomorrow without change. Wenyan has a grammar. Several empty particles help fix the grammatical roles characters play but the grammatical sentence is not further highlighted by part-of-speech inflections for the characters. Hence, language users need learn no sentence-bound rules of agreement in number, tense, case or gender. We may describe it as a topic-comment structure since the SVO structure is technically (S)VO. The subject term is frequently omitted, e.g., when previously introduced, presupposed, or unnecessary (e.g. the “it” in “It is raining.”)

Not infrequently the identity of the omitted subject is not clear, and equally competent readers may disagree about whether we are reading an indicative or imperative sentence. This is particularly the case with brief, stylized stanzas of poetry. Consequently, writers have relied on parallel constructions, implicitly inviting the reader to parse them the same way. This helps us interpret otherwise ambiguous sentences. This style may have originated from the practice of using parallelism and poetry to aid memorization of passages for oral transmission.

Thus, style and syntax are intertwined in classical Chinese. The parsing of many sentences is controversial. This is exacerbated by the lack of punctuation in early Wenyan: no periods, quotation marks, commas, question marks, exclamations inserted into the original texts. This prompted some copyists to insert the particles that impose a parsing. So, the recently discovered Han version of the Laozi has both the assertion marker (也 yě) and comma-like slashes to yield the student’s desired parsing. This indeterminism in structure means interpretation has both a lexical and grammatical component. We hypothesize both a parsing of the syntax and meanings of the characters to form the interpretation that justifies a translation (Fuller 1999: 2; Karlgren 1962).

Wenyan has several “function words.” Traditional accounts call these ‘empty names’ (虛名 xūmíng) in contrast to the ‘solid names’ (實名 shímíng) which pick out (draw attention to) concrete parts of reality. The empty names are characters that help us parse sentences and arguments, such as the above assertion marker 也 yě and question marker 乎 hū. Other particles with grammatical roles include with/using (以yǐ) which precedes the main verb, and in/on/at/to (於 yú) which follows the verb. Particles like that-which (者 zhě) nominalizes verbs and adjectives. Logical connectives include and/but (而 ér) and if-then (則 zé) and several negators. So, although classical thinkers did not develop a theory of argument forms, it could express all basic logical relations. Using a modern phrase structure (Chomsky) grammar, we can show how to generate an unlimited number of sentences of classical language from a very few rewrite rules to express anything that can be expressed in symbolic logical form.

Obviously, the ancient masters did not formulate these rules. The classical readers and writers just “caught on” to the structure. The evidence suggests they learned by imitating the style of their masters and copying sections for themselves.

While the rules allow us to generate infinitely many propositions in this written language, working backwards from the written text often yields several possible derivations from the rules and lexicon. The upshot is texts are ambiguous without context, e.g., the presupposed topic. Indeed, it has been argued that while the focus of language in English is the sentence, in classical Chinese it is context (DeFrancis 1984: 52; Hansen 1992: 34).

There is much more to say about the syntax of classical Chinese, e.g. the absence of a linking verb (is/was/were), different versions of which we seem to find in spoken Cantonese and Mandarin, but there were different negative linking words, one for noun-phrase predicates and another for verbal predicates. These turn out to be important for the analytical philosophers of the classical period. In summary, for the purpose of understanding issues of translation in Chinese philosophy, we might let the author of a contemporary textbook of classical Chinese have the last word:

[T]here may be several perfectly grammatical ways to explain the syntax of a [classical Chinese] sentence. Skill in reading lies in deciding which alternative is most likely… Such judgments of meaning cannot be based on grammar alone. They rely not only on a knowledge of grammar, but also on a sense of the larger arguments of the sentence, the paragraph, and the composition as a whole. (Fuller 1999: 2)

1.3 On the Semantics of Chinese Characters

Let us see how these syntax, semantics, text, discipline and tradition contribute to generating a plethora of interpretations. We shall look at perhaps the most famous passage of the most translated text of Chinese thought, Laozi’s Daodejing. A translation aims for a meta-language expression with the same meaning as the target language. (Here, respectively, English and classical Chinese.) The different conceptions of meaning are formulated as interpretive principles of charity and humanity. The principle of charity says interpret so the target comes out true. The principle of humanity assumes an interpreter’s ability to follow the argument, understand the way of getting to and from the target sentence. So, we interpret in a way that helps us understand what leads to asserting it and what follows from it.

The text has been translated to English over 500 times, as a religious, political, poetic, and philosophical text. The religious perspective interprets it using the model of Western “supreme being” mysticism, the poetic as a poem, and the political as a platform. How should we read it philosophically? The philosophical upshot of the religious reading is quietism. For a peek at the Chinese philosophical universe, let us take a closer look.

The opening line of Chapter I reads:

道可道非常道
Dào kě dào fēi cháng dào. (Dào can-be dào-ed is-not constant dào)

道dào way, road: (in first, third, and sixth positions here) in modern vernacular is used to name major roads. Paths and lanes are the central metaphors for understanding both the natural and the normative course for all things. Semantically, dào is the metaphorical counterpart of English “way” but has more metaphorical gravity. Chinese thought pivots around dào as Western does around reason and law. Europeans theorized about “natural and moral law.” China theorizes about possible and permissible dàos.
可 kě can-be/may-be: A modal operator that makes the following verb passive—here “can/may be dào-ed.” The underlying active phrase structure is “_____ can dào dào, and the parallel in the second line is ”_____ can name names.“ We can coin, use, and mention terms. We can construct, point to, and follow ways.
非 fēi (it) is-not: One of two negators. It negates a nominal predicate. The other not (不 bù) negates verb phrases. ”___ is not constant dào“
常 cháng constant: ‘unvarying’, ‘constant’, ‘enduring’, ‘unchanging’, ‘reliable’.

Literally, then, we have something like ”dao can be dao-ed; (It) is not inevitable dao.“

The second line illustrates the role of parallelism:

名可名非常名
Míng kě míng fēi cháng míng (name can/may-be named is-not constant name)

Everything is the same except the metaphorical dào is replaced by the overtly linguistic name (名 míng term, word). So, ”Names can be named. They are not inevitable names.“

Here are six translations of this passage.

The way that can be spoken of is not the constant way. (Lau 1963: 57)
The Way that can be told of is not an Unvarying Way. (Waley 1934: 141)
The Tao that can be trodden is not the enduring and unchanging Tao. (Legge 1891 [1959]: 95)
A Way that can be followed is not a constant Way. (Ivanhoe 2002: 1)
Way-making (dao) that can be put into words is not really way-making. (Ames and Hall 2003: 77)
As to a Dao—If it can be specified as a Dao, it is not a permanent Dao. (Moeller 2007: 3)

The best philosophical translation will be the best philosophy permissible by the best lexical and syntactic theory. Lexically, the greatest variation in these translations is how they understand the verbal use of dào. The majority (1, 2, 5 & 6) make dào (v) a speech act or linguistic behavior. The others (3 & 4) reflect the metaphor’s logic, and make dàoing walking or following a way. The second line’s verbal use of ‘name’ is less puzzling because English treats naming as a speech act. Zhuangzi’s quip ”Dàos are made by walking them“ supports this lexical choice.

Next, a bit of syntax. Wenyan nouns can be a noun subject or object phrase without any articles or demonstratives. English requires one of these (a, some, the or this/that) or to pluralize the noun. Translations 1–3 inject English’s the, 4 and 6 inject a, and 5 makes the initial dào a process verb (think of constructing a road). So, 5 has chosen an interpretation that suggests social constructivism in norm theory, on the model of constructing new terms. None of the translations opt to pluralize their translation of dào. An advantage of doing so is that it would a) yield clear grammatical English without adding articles and b) produce a true sentence iff the alternatives were true. Notice how implicitly we pluralize the subject term in the parallel second line about names.

Syntactically, Wenyan is a ”left-branching“ language, i.e., does not use restrictive that-clauses. To get it to restrict the scope of the first dáo, the modifier (can be dào-ed) should precede it. Traditional commentary on the passage begins with Wang Bi (226–249 CE), roughly half a century after the classical period. His commentary rewrote the first sentence to yield that result: can-be dào-ed dào (可道之道). All the above translations except 6 technically translate Wang Bi’s commentary, not his Wenyan text

So, the above translations differ lexically, syntactically, semantically and philosophically. Number 5 is both philosophically viable and relevant to the Confucian-Mohist and later Daoist (Zhuangzi’s) discourse on the shared causal-historical theory of rectifying names. The text commits to two axioms of Daoist social-construction theory. The universe of discourse includes structures called dào that can be constructed. They are not universal constants. However, 5 is syntactically a reach in the same way as all but 6—translating Wang Bi’s rewrite instead of Laozi.

Wang Bi and these translators would argue that they are trying to formulate Laozi’s beliefs. Paul Grice (1913–1988) distinguished between speaker meaning and language meaning. The philosopher is interested in the language meaning of the text. Philosophy, at this point, is distinguished by being anti-authoritarian, not worshipping the author’s beliefs. They would not take refuge in a principle of charity that maximized the truth of the text under translation. The Chinese philosophical community was engaged in a discourse geared to communal intellectual progress. Ethical constructivism is a viable theory, albeit controversial. Whether it’s the best philosophical translation is tied up with whether we can defend the moral posture in a philosophical dialectic. In China it appears not to have been a point of contention among the rival schools.

The translations above trace a slow philosophical evolution of interpreters’ views of this passage. Philosophical translation of the text is itself a philosophical activity. It is doing philosophy in a Wenyan dialectic with Confucian and Mohist philosophers. The important differences are in our theories (dàos) of language which we teach and learn as students. One option open to modern philosophical interpreters is to recognize some uses of characters to be mentioning bits of language themselves—names can be named (mentioned) as well as used. At this point we have adequate material for a naturalistic theory of the norms of use for both words and language.

The different priorities of philosophers and religious interpreters clearly come to the fore here. Philosophers seek clarity and coherence while dealing with gradual understanding of features of the language like parallelism. Coherence, thus, plays a different role in philosophical interpretation. It is not about being charitable to the writer but to the community. We try to read this and the 80 other chapters as a philosophical contribution to a philosophical discussion going on during the classical period among the schools reflecting on shared themes: terms, language, social practices, norms and the natural world. Philosophers have no a priori commitment to making the passage into a transcendent truth, but do to making it a serious philosophical contribution to a developing discussion of a community point of view. To translate a philosophical text, we must think philosophically using the Chinese conceptual scheme and immersing ourselves in the philosophical issues of the time.

Justifying a philosophical translation does not rule out religious interpretations. Religious interpretation remains the better anthropological choice, it informs us about how the bulk of religious Daoists since Wang Bi have read the text. There may be no adequate philosophical translation, no way to understand it in the context (Confucian, Mohist, etc.) in which it emerged—a vibrant philosophical discourse about language, social norms, and constant nature. Nothing guarantees that if philosophers try, they must succeed. The case for trying to find good philosophy was strongly confirmed by the rediscovery of the Later Mohist texts dealing with theory of language. The case that Laozi’s text deals with language is plain from the 2^nd line. It also discusses historical processes, nature, being and non-being, desire and mysteries. These are philosophical themes and several are viable modern philosophical projects—process philosophy, part-whole metaphysics, anti-fatalism and moral constructivism.

The six examples above show that translations can vary in lexical and syntactic justification, and interpretations can come to have better philosophical justifications. There is no reason to believe this evolution cannot continue. The principle of humanity requires philosophical thinking using classical concepts. Philosophy can give us more and better ways to deal with Wenyan’s syntactic-semantic structure—e.g., a part-whole semantics (Banka 2023; Banka 2018). Banka draws on an earlier theory about the Mohist philosophy of language (Hansen 1983). One of the Mohists’ key insights is that claiming all language is defective is self-defeating: ”If all language is defective, saying so is defective“ (Mozi Book 10, Canon II #172). Thus, if the religious translation were correct, the philosophers of the time already knew it was incoherent. The Zhuangzi rejects Tian Pian’s anti-teaching quietism on similar grounds—”it could not avoid being wrong (非 fēi not-that)“ (Zhuangzi 33).

If the student new to the study of Chinese philosophy takes away one idea from this brief summarization of a complex set of interconnected linguistic issues focusing on texts, perhaps the most fruitful one would be that philosophizing in classical Chinese is unlike transcribed speech. It is a discussion in written form among a writing community engaged in philosophical dialectic around social norms, physical nature and human know-how.

A second useful idea to retain would be that relatively few issues of translation of early Chinese texts can be resolved without engaging in philosophical reflection. Even judging better from worse readings must draw on a way of sorting them. Philosophers’ ways of sorting are the principles of charity and humanity (仁 rén). Below, we will begin with some issues that are of import both in contemporary Western philosophy and for the student of Chinese thought, following which we will concentrate directly on the latter.

One long-time student of early Daoism summed up the matter succinctly: ”Reading [it] is an act of creation“ (Welch 1971: 11). We will return to the theme of ambiguity—both syntactic and semantic—in §4.2.

2. Metaphysical Issues

2.1 On the Very Idea of Different Conceptual Schemes

In 1973, Donald Davidson challenged semantic views that postulated different conceptual schemes. His argument started from the principle of charity: to understand the speakers of any actual human language, we must ”count them right in most matters.. The beliefs of the speakers must be caused by the actual world. Different linguistic communities conduct their cooperative navigation of the same natural world that we do. Quine (1960 [2013]) drew a distinction between terms we would expect to be in any language (mother, up, tree) and those that work along with others in a theory, i.e., theory laden terms like law, duty, gravity. We would be surprised if any language had no way of translating what we say truly about the former. The latter, however, are likely to overlap only when we have reason to assume we share substantially similar theories. Sellars (1956 [2002]) added that when we master concepts, we learn how they work in inferences using other theory laden (“inferentially articulated”) terms.

Davidson deals mainly with the relation of truth and translation. His argument hinges on his rejection of what he calls “the third dogma of empiricism”, namely, that we can conceive of an uninterpreted reality—taken as “a neutral ground” or “coordinate system”—by means of which we could compare and contrast differing conceptual schemes. He says:

In giving up dependence on the concept of an uninterpreted reality …we do not relinquish the concept of objective truth—quite the contrary. Given the dogma of a dualism of scheme and reality, we get conceptual relativity, and truth relative to a scheme. Without the dogma, this kind of relativity goes by the board. Of course truth of sentences remains relative to language, but that is as objective as can be. (Davidson 1973: 20)

Angus Graham rejected Davidson’s claim. He held that the idea of a different conceptual scheme was indispensable for scholars of the language and thought of other cultures (Graham 1992: 59). Graham argued that languages without a common ancestor may have fewer synonymous terms in their lexicons, and consequently more sentences in such languages (i.e., English and Chinese) will need guarded and heavily qualified translations (Graham 1992: 65).

The major problem with Davidson’s argument is his reliance on truth. This makes his account of meaning applicable to propositions (sentence-sized abstract objects). Those three concepts are pivots in traditional Western philosophy of language and clearly fall in Quine’s “theory laden” category. If we understand them, we know how to draw inference relations among them, e.g. “whether or not this sentence is true depends on what it means.” As we’ve seen, the Chinese philosophy of their own language has no commitment to mental concepts as components of mental sentences (beliefs). So, the only relativity presumed here is that of truth to language, which, as Davidson acknowledges, is “as objective as can be.”.

Hansen and Graham argue that in translating classical philosophy, it is usually misleading to translate 真 (zhēn real, natural, authentic) as true for Western audiences. It could, however, be correct after the introduction of Buddhism (Post-Han C, 200 ce). In Pre-Han Chinese, they argue, the concept was not linked to propositions (beliefs, thoughts, sentences, statements etc.). Zhēn was classically used for the nature side of the dialectic of nature vs nurture, natural reality vs. social constructs and practices that human societies use in navigating nature. Graham liked ‘authentic’ as a less misleading translation.

Hansen noted that in philosophy of language contexts, philosophers tended to use the normative modal discussed above, ‘can be’ (可kě permissible/possible) not zhēn. Note the above translation of Mozi 10:172 uses “is defective” rather than “is false”. Mozi’s term is defined as not-kě (可permissible). Hansen doesn’t deny that for millennia Chinese have “used language cooperatively in navigating the natural world”. However, their theory of how their language relates to the world is a causal historical one expressed in simple character terms, not via a proposition and truth-linked concept of meaning. “… language is a social practice. Its basic function is guiding action” (Hansen 1992: 3).

Consider one particular doctrine that Hansen studied, the Mohist formulation 牛馬非馬可 (níu ox mǎ horse fēi is not mǎ horse kě can/may!) (Hansen 1983). Davidson would argue that if Hansen can understand that, he must be able to translate it. Hansen doesn’t disagree and translates it as “ox-horse not horse: acceptable/possible.” Hansen contends both that the Mohist formulation is true (in Wenyan) and that the correct English translation is true. He also argues “white-horse not horse” is false in both its Wenyan and correct English translation form. He is committed to Davidson’s truth in L, objective truth. He is not, however, committed to the claim that the Mohists are using semantic truth or committing themselves to propositions or meanings. The mentioned string of characters is permissible given the historical norms (dào) of use.

Hansen translates the modal normative as may be rather than Aristotle-to-Tarski’s truth. However, following Quine’s insight (1960 [2013]), Hansen also understands and translates the Mohist talk of oxen and horses using a conceptual structure of parts and wholes, mereology, rather than sets and members or particulars with properties and relations. The fusion of the oxen and horses in a field may not include any horse parts. Hansen notes that the Mohists acknowledge immediately that it also may include horses and no oxen but neither is assertible when neither oxen nor horses are in the field. The Mohists’ inferences tell us more about their use of their language terms. So, the Mohists’ formulations are both translatable and true—but the conceptual scheme in which they are expressed and argued is alien in the sense of unfamiliar, but clearly philosophically sound and intelligible as a natural way to describe a natural situation (Lewis 1991: 75).

Davidson’s argument, however, is not that conceptual schemes cannot be alien, but that they cannot be so radically different that they are uninterpretable and untranslatable. That needn’t concern Graham or Hansen—both of whom agree philosophical translation is possible, so it is

… possible to use one to criticize something in another, as Fingarette uses Confucius to undermine our inner/outer dichotomy, Rosemont the problematic of moral choice, Hall and Ames the concept of transcendence. (Graham 1992: 78)

According to Graham (1992: 68), conceptual schemes are not systems of propositions but of language, “a pre-logical pattern of names … as the product of the classifying act of naming”. Their role is not merely to describe true and false states of affairs, but to motivate insights and reasoning. So, especially in philosophy, the inferential network of concepts used in a reflective discussion is crucial to understanding the evolution of its philosophical perspective. And this is a proper area of study for linguists, sinologists and philosophers; indeed, for Graham and many others it is an area necessary to study for discussing similarities and differences cross-culturally with precision and clarity (Graham 1992: 69).

2.2 The Hypothesis of the Relativity of Linguistics

Another objection to our talk of an alternate concept scheme of the classical texts is a version of the (presumably discredited) “Sapir-Whorf” hypothesis of linguistic relativity. Benjamin Lee Whorf and his teacher Edward Sapir say that language determines our experience of the world: the way human beings perceive the world in which they live is a function of the structure of the native language(s) they acquire to describe and interact with it. In Whorf’s words,

…[T]he grammar of each language is not merely a reproducing instrument for voicing ideas but rather is itself the shaper of ideas, the program and guide for the individual’s mental…development. (Whorf 1956: 212)

Notice that this claim differs from the above in being strongly psychological, focused on the individual’s mental development. The assumptions above concern a philosophical community working out how their language works. It is their theory of their language that motivates a philosophical dialectic. Their reasoning together in their language leads to theories of human social practices, linguistic behavior in the natural world. By contrast, Whorf’s “strong” mental hypothesis suggests that language structures more directly determine experiential or mental content. This suggests he accepts Aristotle’s account of how alphabetic languages link to the world, not the more naturalistic Chinese historical-conventional account that links characters to parts of the natural world by conventional practice learned by successive generations after some “sage” coined the symbol. Nothing in the Chinese account requires them to have different experiences or memories of mountains and horses.

Whorf’s view is almost certainly correct if we are physicalists about mental and cognitive content. We already can prove that learning to play the violin or milk a cow produces changes in the brain. It is hard to think that learning to read and write Chinese does not. His wording, however, seems to assume mind-body dualism and, as a result, become unverifiable since no one can directly observe the subjective conscious content postulated by that dualism. The neuro-physiological version of the hypothesis is naturalistic enough, but we are barely beginning to understand the science of the brain, certainly not relying on it in this entry.

Our assumptions about philosophical matters in this interpretation project are not unorthodox. We assume logic is a good tool for making the meanings of texts more explicit, especially for tracking the syntactic meanings that map out the conceptual-inferential field. We assume science is the best available account of the shape of natural reality. We are capable of learning others’ languages. Wenyan is a language.

It is only that final claim that is mildly controversial. We acknowledge a possible quibble about whether written Wenyan is a natural language, as well as doubts that it ever was a spoken language or that there were ever children who acquired the native-speaker authority in Wenyan we routinely grant native speakers of living languages. Our position in these controversies is like Zhuangzi’s: Wenyan is a natural language but not a natural spoken language.

A more complicated if not mysterious situation obtains, however, when we shift from simple naming to matters more syntactic. Examples are Aristotelian conceptions of being (the verb “to be”) and event causation (efficient and final), familiar to students of Western philosophy. We share this heritage with Europe and the Middle East, and it is easy to think of the conceptual commitments as natural human starting points for philosophical reflection. Both the reasoning motivating them and that flowing from them, however, may not have any likely parallels in ancient China. Although we can inter-translate talk of to be and of being (有 yǒu to have) and not being (無 wú to lack), we cannot formulate in Wenyan any approximation of the ontological argument for God without exposing the fallacy in it (Kurtz 2011: 84–88).

This is the point made by Wittgenstein, not Whorf. Wittgenstein’s hypothesis concerned philosophy, not the “private language” of mentalist psychology, the unfolding of an undominated discourse, not the dance of supposed objects in one’s mind. He said, “Philosophy is a battle against the bewitchment of our intelligence by means of language.” His point wasn’t that language itself was the source of philosophical confusion, but that our theories of language, like Aristotle’s, convey pictures that are confusing. And because over centuries dualism becomes a “folk ideology” of language processing that our teachers convey to us as they train us in our language use, Europeans are launched on a confusing system of metaphysics and epistemology that is taken for granted in talking about language and meaning. Wittgenstein targeted particularly some of Aristotle’s assumptions. We have already visited a downstream result of this—the idea theory (see §1.1) of mentalese—an inner psychological version of Chinese writing. Aristotle further initiates a theory of meaning as expressed in definitions. (Aristotle Topics Book I Part 4). These fix the reference of words, and determine the truth value of assertions, and ground our concepts of meanings, thoughts and beliefs (propositional entities).

The moral here is an extension of Davidson’s point. However different our language schemes may be, there are ways of expressing facts about nature that use measurement with instruments that, with increasing accuracy, ground descriptions on which humans with any natural language that includes arithmetic can and do agree. Further, as we saw, classical Chinese had the full range of logical connectives and operators and valid reasoning with these and the measurement-derived facts should still preserve truth. Different languages, grammars and conceptual schemes may tempt users into different philosophical conundrums, but logic and science should still work for all cultures.

Science was arguably a Western discovery, but as we have discovered in recent decades, Chinese intellectuals are perfectly capable of learning and deploying it while still inheriting the philosophical tradition and language they have. We have not seen any barriers to making the two languages fully intertranslatable when philosophical and scientific confusions are resolved. No true statement in one can turn out to be false in its correct translation into the other.

3. Why Interrogate Chinese Philosophical Texts?

3.1 Introduction

There are almost as many answers to this question as there are comparative philosophers working in the field of Chinese thought. Herein we may cover only a few of them as illustrative of more general trends and tendencies. Moreover, the reader must bear in mind that a great many translations and accounts of Chinese philosophy have been and still are made by non-philosophers, adding more answers to the question of why the texts are deemed worthy of interrogation than can be taken up herein.

Despite the multiplicity of appropriate responses to the question, however, the reasons for asking it basically reduce to two, and they hold not only for Chinese writings, but all foreign philosophical texts. We translate and interpret them in order to (1) learn more about the people in the culture whence the text came; and/or (2) to learn more about ourselves and our own culture. That is to say, most texts worthy of translation and exegesis are both windows on the culture that produced them and mirrors of our own.

There are numerous ways these goals can be achieved individually, and together, depending on the nature of the approach to the texts. First we will examine briefly the interrogation of Chinese texts against the background of the problems, patterns of argument and standards of rational justification in the Western philosophical tradition; its “grammar”, so to speak (Makeham 2012: xii). The governing idea is that although surely different, Chinese thinkers have enough in common with their Western counterparts to make associative and contrastive comparisons between them and/or their ideas a useful method of engagement with the text.

Then, in §3.3 the texts are interrogated a little differently, with the governing idea being something like a “hermeneutics of suspicion” in reverse. With this approach the “grammar” of the Western philosophical tradition is downplayed as far as possible, the exegetes and translators believing that it distorts the Chinese materials by overwriting them with distinctly Western concerns; we should not look for theodicean writings in a culture without a concept of an all-good creator God. Instead of asking “To what extent do these texts suggest answers to philosophical questions that vex us?” they tend to ask, “To what extent do these texts suggest we might ask different philosophical questions?” Finally, in §3.4 we will sketch quickly the problematik of Chinese philosophers in China, and how and why it overlaps only slightly at present with the Western approaches.

3.2 The Comparative Approach

For the great majority of Anglophone and European comparative philosophers of China the Western philosophical heritage is the basis for the comparisons. This may or may not be regrettable, but is in some measure unavoidable because it is obviously the more familiar tradition and the ground of the comparativist’s views. It is hard to imagine any scholar essaying a translation of a text without some knowledge of what it’s about, and its importance, and for philosophers that “aboutness” and importance stem from conceptions drawn from the translator’s own philosophical training, which is the kernel from which the interpretation will grow. Obviously close and careful readings of the text can alter—perhaps significantly—the original interpretation given to it, but an interpretation of some kind we tend to have at all times when working with a Chinese classical text (or any other).

Some texts wear their interpretations pretty much on their sleeves; it is hard to interpret the “Legalist” Hanfeizi text as a Confucian treatise because of the extent to which it is a criticism thereof, championing a system of regulations and laws that was an anathema to the Master. Most Chinese classical texts are not, however, of this kind, as we should already expect from our earlier discussion about the classical language. They require a good deal of interpretive analysis and evaluation. Almost none of them are pure, the work of a single author and unaffected by the vagaries of history or the ravages of time. They are composites, with fragments of several texts often strung together by we-know-not-who, then burned in large quantities during the bibliographic holocaust of 213 BCE and the destruction of the libraries during the civil war that followed soon afterward; with remaining copies re-assembled—again by unknown hands—and that is generally the way they have come down to us. Greater understanding of several texts has come from unearthing very old copies of them written on bamboo or silk at recently excavated archaeological sites, particularly those at Mawangdui in Hunan and Guodian in Hubei; but it remains that virtually every work we have today is more or less corrupt.

The composite nature of most texts also means there can be no tidy classification system for them either, nor even for their parts at times: labelling this chapter of a text Daoist, or Mohist, and that one more or less Confucian, ignores the fact that there were a large number of ideas current in the classical period, with different thinkers adopting and adapting them in different ways. We may speak of lineages—the followers of a particularly gifted teacher—but few scholars any longer think of clear and distinct philosophical “schools”.

One highly composite text—both ideologically and temporally—is the Analects of Confucius, a long string of abbreviated statements by or about Confucius and his students, not put into its present form until at least two centuries after he died in 479 BCE (Kim and Csikszentmilhalyi 2014). Most translations and exegeses of the text place great emphasis on his ethics, and those of his successors, especially Mencius. They have been interpreted against the background of consequentialism (Im 2011); Christianity (Legge 1871 [1960]); and Kantianism (many mainland scholars ever since Liang Qichao and his student Mou Zongsan a century ago); as virtue ethics, Aristotelian and otherwise (most comparativists working in the field today; see Tiwald 2010); as character ethics (Kupperman 2004); as one among several “natural moralities”, the functions of which are to facilitate and regulate social cooperation and to foster a reasonable degree of coherence among the individual’s potentially conflicting motivations (Wong 2006); or their views have been addressed against the background of differing strands of feminist ethics (Raphals 1998; Li 2000; Wang 2003; Rosenlee 2007).

It would be a mistake to ask which of these readings of the Analects or the early Confucians in general is the correct one. In the first place, we must note that all of the ethical theories save one are Western, and the questions focus on which one best fits with early Confucian writings. Even more basically, the concept of ethics as a delimitable field of philosophy is itself Western, not Chinese, which problematizes even more the question of “correctness”. Consequently, the translator/exegete must constantly guard against reading out of the text simply what he or she has read into it. Rather obviously Confucius and his successors could not hold all these ethical positions, and perhaps they didn’t hold any of them, or any ethical theory at all. These interpretations can’t possibly all be right, and more probably they are all of them wrong in at least some respects.

Indeed, perhaps even to suggest right and wrong is wrong here. If the reader wants only to know what the statements in the Analects originally meant to those who first heard them then all these philosophical readings must be suspect in some degree. A more purely narrative and less analytic/evaluative approach is called for. Asking how much like Aristotle the sayings of Mencius may be is different from ascertaining how King Liang heard them when Mencius supposedly first spoke to him.

Answering the latter question is more often done by sinologists with disciplinary training other than philosophy, in which the issues are more philological, etymological and historical (see Brooks and Brooks 2001), but a number of philosophers have well served the profession by focusing heavily on the translation rather than exegetical side of comparative work, saving their exegetical remarks, if any, for introductions or notes. An older example is D.C. Lau’s Tao Te Ching (1963), and newer ones include Eric Hutton’s Xunzi (2014) and Brook Ziporyn’s Zhuangzi (2020). Again, textual problems arising from this kind of activity tend to be more philological and historical than exegetical or philosophical, even though the texts are basically philosophical.

Both questions, however, are important ones with respect to translation and textual exegesis, for both can generate significant insights. Asking whether Confucius may be legitimately construed as a closet consequentialist, or feminist, can enlarge the reader’s view of these ethical orientations, as well as illuminate a number of dimensions of the Master’s views. On the other hand, striving to give an account of a thinker or group of thinkers at the time they lived allows readers more conceptual room to form their own judgements about the value of the views in the translation and/or exegesis.

We may see the same points with another type of comparative textual scholarship done philosophically, examining similarities and differences between a specific Chinese and a specific Western thinker. One might take two intellectual giants from their cultures and juxtapose them, like Aristotle and Confucius (Sim 2007; Yu 2007; Ivanhoe 2014). Or investigate how much like Kierkegaard’s anti-rationalist reaction to Hegel is Zhuangzi’s skepticism about reason (Carr and Ivanhoe 2000). Or choose two disparate thinkers and employ new comparative practices to elucidate some ostensibly similar concepts in differing cultural contexts (Yearley 1990).

What can be learned from such studies? Taking the Aristotle/Confucius comparisons, we learn just how much weight Confucius gave to rituals, family, customs and traditions as prerequisite for flourishing personal lives and social harmony, for example. The weight grows even heavier when we reflect that Aristotle said almost nothing about rituals, family, customs and traditions, though he dealt in great detail with great sensitivity in virtually all aspects of human life personal and social. By his silence on ritual matters he obliges us to look at Confucius’s insistence on those dimensions of human life again. He was deeply concerned with ritual performance; why? In the same way we may obtain new insights into Aristotelianism: there are libraries full of commentaries on the writings of Aristotle gathered over the past two millennia, but it is doubtful that any of them commented on the significance of the absence of any concern with ritual matters in those writings. By placing Confucius alongside him the lacuna quickly becomes obvious, and invites our contemplation.

We might look upon Aristotle’s relatively laconic remarks on the nature of habituation (in Nicomachean Ethics II)—that we become virtuous by performing virtuous actions—as a potential bridge to Confucius’s deep concern for ritual. The bridge is a focus on how virtue must be cultivated and embodied through action. In the case of Confucius, the action is affectively expressive: serving one’s parents cannot be mere material support but express respect (Analects 2.7–8). Some interpreters of Aristotle have filled in his lack of specificity on habituation by discussing how virtuous action might afford the learner certain kinds of affective experience and by pointing out that intensified affective experience can sharpen the perception and cognition that goes into the intensional object of that experience.

For example, Sherman (1991) in articulating this line of thought for Aristotle points out that compassionate experience can help the learner discriminate aspects of a situation that call for specific forms of compassionate response according to the nature of the misfortune suffered by the other. One learns greater discernment not through mechanical repetition but through practice and watching and being tutored by the more experienced who come closer to getting it right—both the situation and the response to it. At the same time, swinging back to Confucius, one might also see how practiced performance of ritual might encourage greater discernment of aspects of the situation that call for adjustment of how one performs a ritual on a given occasion. One serves one’s parents according to ritual, but when in Analects 2.6 Confucius says that one should give one’s parents nothing to worry about beyond one’s physical well-being, one is obviously called upon to exercise judgment about what aspects of one’s conduct and attitude would be causes for worry.

One might observe these kinds of resonance and yet note that there must be something quite different about a philosophical tradition that weds practice and perceiving and responding in the right ways through ritual, family, social customs and traditions, and a philosophical tradition that calls for such practice without comparable emphasis on any of these things. The former views development of the individual as always taking place within a social matrix. It holds that understanding what makes development go well requires attention to the ongoing viability of the matrix itself. It requires attention, for example, to the rituals that make sense of and give structure to the interactions of everyday life, such as greeting others and taking meals with them, and others that mark life passages such as birth, coming of age, marriage, and death. It means attention to whether these rituals embody and help participants to be aware of and express the underlying affective and cognitive attitudes that bring individuals into fruitful relationship with each other, to more fully realize the values of their common life. The Confucius of the Analects shows grave concern that the rituals of his time had badly deteriorated and had come to express self-aggrandizement and dominance by the powerful rather than respect and concern (hence the stress in 13.3 on the need to rectify the names or míng of social roles). This is often at least part of what is meant by saying that a much more relational conception of the person comes through in many Confucian texts.

To the extent that the interpreter becomes sympathetic to the Confucian emphasis on the social matrix, the conclusion may be that there is something important missing from the Western perspective that supposedly anchors the comparison. It intersects with another interpretive approach outlined in the next section, the contrastive approach, which might take a relatively distinctive feature of Chinese philosophy and interrogate the Western tradition for what might now be arguably perceived as a lack. It is important to stress arguably because emphasis on the role of the social matrix embedded within a society’s traditions may be subject to normative critique as being insufficiently self-critical. In fact, this critique may be present within the larger Chinese philosophical tradition, as exemplified by the Mohist critique of Confucians for valuing tradition for tradition’s sake (see Hansen 1992: 107–108). Whether the Mohist critique is fully fair to Confucians, or at least to some Confucians, is subject to debate, which will cover issues such as the extent to which it is possible to transcend the normative presuppositions of a tradition or whether one must in the end resort to critiquing some aspects of a tradition from the standpoint of other aspects of the tradition. Notice, however, that the center of gravity of the debate has now shifted over to the Chinese side, a not-unwelcome development for those who have noted that cross-traditional comparisons tend to asymmetrically be centered on the Western side.

Another dimension of the comparative approach involves focusing on a specific audience for the comparativist’s translation work and commentary. If we believe the Mozi resembles Utilitarianism in many respects for instance, the writings of Bentham and Mill can serve well as the interpretive framework for our efforts. The specific syntactic patterns and lexical items we employ, however, plus notes and commentary, will be somewhat different if we are basically writing for a general audience of undergraduates or the general reader than if we are trying to engage other philosophers of a Utilitarian persuasion in dialogue about the contribution(s) the Mohist views can make to more sophisticated development of the views of Bentham and Mill (Angle 2014: 229). And with only minor caveats, the same may be said for exegeses of the text in comparative contexts. It may be pointed out that Mohists developed a sophisticated form of indirect consequentialism that is not to be found in Western utilitarianism until well after Bentham and Mill (Fraser 2016: 19).

Many comparative philosophers also do strict exegeses no less than comparative ones, focusing on simply explicating, against a philosophical background, the dominant views of a person, “school”, text or concept. Examples of each are Leo Chang’s The Philosophical Foundations of Han Fei’s Political Theory (1986), Hans-Georg Moeller’s Daoism Explained (2011), Moeller and Paul D’Ambrosio’s Genuine Pretending: On the Philosophy of the Zhuangzi (2017), Hellmut Wilhelm’s Heaven, Earth and Man in the Book of Changes (1977), Brook Ziporyn’s Ironies of Oneness and Difference: Coherence in Early Chinese Thought (2013), and Kim-Chong Chong’s Zhuangzi’s Critique of the Confucians: Blinded by the Human (2016).

3.3 The Contrastive Approach

The comparative approach to exegesis in Chinese philosophy obviously leaves much room for consideration of differences as well, which are often as illuminating as the similarities, and at times even more so. This approach also tends to enrich philosophy overall by increasing its scope, reach, and capacity for self-correction; there is no better cure for culture-boundedness than steeping oneself in another culture. And in that way—as well as many others—comparative philosophers of China may hope to engage in fruitful dialogue with other philosophers ignorant of non-Western cultures in general, Chinese in particular.

All of these laudable consequences of the comparative approach notwithstanding, there is another way to interrogate Chinese texts which merits attention because it is equally capable of illuminating them. This latter approach places the Western tradition more in the background while engaged in research, interpretive and translation efforts. That is to say, the translating philosopher must be open to the text as it is, not within the contexts determined by the nature of the questions addressed to it in the vocabulary of Western philosophy. This critical stance is not urging philosophers to approach a text as a tabula rasa, for such cannot be done. It is to urge that philosophers attend very carefully to the lexicon for translating Chinese into English, for that lexicon may be construed as a theory of sorts, and an increasingly poor one; it is a theory that Chinese philosophy is pretty much like Western philosophy, and consequently the vocabulary of the one can be carried over to the other without undue distortion (Hansen 1992: 17).

But no translation is innocent, nor any interpretation. The form of our questions determines the range of the possible answers we can obtain. Thus, if we ask what view of the inner life Confucius held, we almost certainly will not be able to see that perhaps he didn’t hold any such view, or even think about having an “inner life,” if such a life is taken to be dichotomous with or exclusive of, an outer, “objective and material life”, as Herbert Fingarette argued in his famous book on the Master (Fingarette 1972). Asking which theory of propositional truth early Daoists held makes it difficult to see, as Hansen argued, that the early Daoists (and all other early Chinese thinkers) had little interest in propositional truth, but were interested rather in language as praxis-guiding behavior, as we noted earlier (§2.1, and will take up again in §4.3 ). There are multiple cosmologies in Western philosophy, beginning with the several put forth by the Greeks, all of them conforming to a logical order. But we shouldn’t ask which one of them early Chinese cosmology most nearly resembles, if Hall and Ames are right in claiming that Chinese cosmology is best described as an aesthetic order not a logical one (Hall & Ames 1987: 16). It might be that the early Confucians didn’t have any ethical theory, but based their descriptions, analyses and evaluations of human activity on the basis of their roles (Rosemont and Ames 2009; Ames 2011; Rosemont 2015). Even those who argue that roles do not exhaust Confucian conceptions of the person might agree that, per the discussion in the previous section, roles as part of the social matrix play a much more prominent role in those conceptions both of what persons are and how they develop. Both the comparative and contrastive approaches can lay the groundwork for new interpretations of concepts such as virtue. Whereas complaints against interpreting Confucian ethics as a virtue ethics rest at least partly on the assumption that virtues are qualities of individuals conceived in separation from others who are in relationship to them or from the social roles they occupy, an appreciation of the social matrix in how individuals conceive of their own identities as crucially involving (if not reducible to) relationship and social role can lead to an appreciation of at least some virtues as being relational in nature. That is, the virtues cannot be specified except in the context of a particular kind of relationship, e.g., friendship, parent-child (Um 2020).

These suggestions clearly do not fit well with the standard “grammar” and presuppositions of the Western philosophical tradition. It makes no sense to ask what contribution Chinese thought can make to the mind-body problem if the dichotomy is altogether absent from their writings, nor to seek light on the nature of propositional truth if its propositional content was not a factor in their thinking about language. Such absences have been debated. At the very least, debates over the absence from Chinese thought of a concept of truth that applies to propositions, or of any kind of distinction between mind and body, can lead to finer distinctions regarding these matters. See Fraser 2012 on the primacy of concern in Chinese thought for the pragmatic guidance of discourse if not the complete absence of truth-like utterances. See Goldin 2003 and Slingerland 2013 for arguments that there was a distinction between mind and body in Chinese thought, and Mind (Heart-Mind) in Chinese Philosophy for the possibility that mind and body may be distinguished according to their different functions within the person even if they are composed of the same psycho-physical qi or “breath-energy.” Such debates should also remind us that the Western thought is not of one voice on such fundamental distinctions and that there are strains within this diverse and contentious tradition that resonate with such proposed interpretations of Chinese thought.

These possibilities for more complicated resonances between the traditions may constitute an answer to a worry about the contrastive approach to the effect that it reduces the opportunities for comparative philosophers to engage in genuine dialogue with their Western-oriented brethren, and makes it easier to continue using the shibboleth that Chinese thought “isn’t really philosophy”. On the other hand, the contrasters will insist that the comparative approach robs the Chinese of their own voice, forcing them into a philosophical milieu that is not theirs. This can be seen in the frequency with which the comparisons tend to be asymmetrical: when something is lacking, or an argument missing, or some other deficit is seen, the Chinese side is at fault. But the plausibility of the charge rests almost solely on assuming the Western definition of the problem and approach to it. And in the end, just how plausible is it to think that all the real problems of philosophy, and all the methods for dealing with them, have been advanced in a single civilization? Seeing how the relationship between language and world or between mind and body have been dealt with in the Chinese tradition may invigorate both traditions.

These sketches of the comparative and contrastive approaches to the exegesis of Chinese philosophical texts have been just that: sketches; there are many more examples of each kind, and a number of comparative philosophers combine the two. And it must be remembered that much work has been done by scholars not trained in philosophy, increasing the number of ways of approaching the texts. Good exemplars of the variety of approaches to the field are introductory works on Chinese philosophy, which tend to combine both some comparative and contrastive elements and differ in thrust as their authors foreground the Chinese elements, or emphasize philosophy (especially analytic) in their narratives. Two examples of the former are Lai 2017 and Wen 2012; coming down more firmly on the philosophy side are Van Norden 2011 and Liu 2006. The field is thus fairly fluid as it continues to come into its own, which readers should celebrate and not bemoan because of the variety of perspectives on the Chinese tradition on offer, all based on solid scholarly work from one discipline or another. We shall return briefly to these issues in §4.3.

Sometimes an interpretive work can straddle the comparative and contrastive approaches. Fingarette’s 1972 book is best-known for its introduction of ritual to contemporary Western philosophy, and for articulating the ethically salient reasons for its importance. These issues are pertinent to the issue discussed in section 3.2 above as to the social matrix that might be missing from the Aristotelian concept of habituation.

3.4 The Chinese Approach

Chinese scholars working in the field of Chinese philosophy have much in common with their Western peers, but the differences are even greater, at least at present. In the first place, with few exceptions the Chinese would not see themselves as comparativists. They will read closely comparative works on Aristotle and Confucius, but basically for what they can learn about the latter, not the former. This is not chauvinism. To be concerned with how Confucius might illuminate the thought of Aristotle is to do philosophy, but not Chinese philosophy, and that is what they are engaged upon.

Confucianism looms large in their work. Some scholars are working with Daoist and other texts unearthed from Mawangdui and elsewhere (Cao Feng), and a few are essaying Chinese themes against a Western model (Yang Guorong). But Confucianism is still seen as the embodiment and expression of Chinese culture and is enjoying a renaissance of interest and scholarship—and general popularity—not seen since the May 4^th Movement of 1919. A few Chinese philosophers are asking what contribution Confucianism might make to philosophy in a global context, but most of them are concentrating on its relevance to China today—and tomorrow.

A second difference between Chinese philosophers and Western comparativists is that the Chinese do their work in accordance with their own “grammar”, their own questions, definitions of problems, methodology, patterns of argument and standards of justification. They, too, have inherited a tradition over two millennia old, with a monumental amount of material—there are over 8000 commentaries on the Analects alone—but the questions and problems are seldom those of the West, except in those sections of university philosophy departments that specialize in Western philosophy. and there are not inconsequential differences in methodology, patterns of arguments and styles of justification as well.

Among the questions contemporary Chinese scholars are asking is the extent to which Confucianism might legitimately be considered a religion. Are there resources in the texts to suggest making it a state religion? (Kang Xiaoguang.) Shouldn’t the focus be on spiritual practice, not theory? (Pang Fei.) What kind of constitution best reflects Confucianism in today’s world? (Jiang Qing 2012; Tongdong Bai 2019.) Is Confucianism better studied today against the background of Western philosophy? (Zhang Longxi.) Or must it be studied in its own cultural context? (Zhang Xianglong.)

This is important work, which clearly has much of political as well as philosophical import, although the politics do not seem to be inspired by nationalism of any sort (recapturing cultural pride is clearly in evidence, however). Some of it will appear conservative to Western eyes, as when the editor of an anthology on The Renaissance of Confucianism in Contemporary China says that “One finds in these essays … only sparse attention to the Western notion of human rights” (Fan 2011: 2). Others envisage a “progressive” Confucianism (Angle 2012: 1), which, unsurprisingly, includes more Western elements. The bulk of contemporary philosophical scholarship in China is not, however, of much direct interest to Western philosophers (or the general public), which is why there is such a disparity between translations of work done by the comparativists into Chinese (a lot) and Chinese scholarship rendered into English (comparatively little). The Chinese can and do study the work of their Western counterparts fairly closely, largely for the insights that work provides on their own tradition. Coming the other way we have significantly less work in English: the political text of Jiang Qing (2012), works on aesthetics and in the history of Chinese thought that brings it into relation to Kant and Marx by Li Zehou (2006, 2009, 2018, 2019, 2023, 2025), and development of Confucian concept of Tianxia (All Under Heaven) in application to the contemporary phenomena of globalization and the normative discourse of cosmopolitanism by Zhao Tingyang (2020). Other important forms in which those based in Western traditions can receive input from the Chinese are articles in specialized anthologies (Fan 2011) or journals of translation (Contemporary Chinese Thought, The Journal of Chinese Humanities). In sum, textual exegesis and translation in Chinese philosophy is a cultural practice, but it is usually practiced differently in different cultures. The situation is changing slowly, with more work coming from Chinese philosophers appearing in English.

Finally, a signal development is the work of those whose approaches are fully within neither the Chinese nor the Western tradition but a hybrid of these traditions. Joseph Chan, born and raised in Hong Kong, earned a D.Phil. at Oxford. Sungmoon Kim, born and raised in South Korea, earned his Ph.D. in political science at the University of Maryland at College Park. Both have proposed blends of Confucianism and democracy that have attracted significant attention. Daniel A. Bell, by contrast, a Canadian who was educated at McGill and Oxford but taught and held administrative roles in Chinese universities, defends (2014) a contemporary Chinese meritocratic model of governance with democracy at the local levels that clearly has its roots in Confucianism. Aaron Stalnaker (2006, 2019) and Michael Ing (2012, 2017) have utilized “bridge concepts”, such as human nature, spiritual exercises, vulnerability, and integrity, as a tool for comparative and contrastive work, meant to facilitate organization of disparate themes within traditions and to create dialogues across traditions. They draw from contemporary Chinese scholars and Western scholars in these dialogues.

4. Methodological Issues

4.1 On Generalizations Cultural and Philosophical

Deciding whether to be basically narrative or dialogical is probably the first issue facing the exegete. Another issue interpreters of Chinese texts must take into consideration in advancing their positions is the extent to which one may make generalizations about Chinese civilization and culture writ large.

This question arises because the conceptual categories within which Chinese authors thought and wrote differ sufficiently from contemporary English-readers’ that the former will be very difficult to understand, at least at first perusal, without being placed in a larger cultural and philosophical conceptual framework. If Western scholars are inclined to shudder when they hear sweeping generalizations about the history of Western culture and philosophy, knowing how diverse they really have been and are, we should perhaps want to embrace the Golden Rule, and do unto other cultures what we would have done with our own. The generalizations can be highly misleading, as a number of sinologists have been arguing recently.

This is a perplexing problem. If we do not generalize to the larger milieu in which a particular text is placed it is difficult to appreciate either what it says or the significance it has in the culture that grew it. But if the best we can do—like a number of late 19^th-century German scholars—is characterize China as a land of ewigen Stillstand (‘eternal standstill’) we are surely better off with no generalizations whatsoever; making vague or erroneous generalizations tends to stereotypes, and there are already a superfluity of these for China, from Charlie Chan to Fu Manchu.

Thus the historian Michael Puett warns us that

All of these interpretive strategies—reading in terms of schools, essentialized definitions of culture, evolutionary frameworks—have the consequence of erasing the unique power that particular claims had at the time,

and recommends that

we dispense with … frameworks… [and] … should instead work on a more nuanced approach…. (Puett 2004: 23–25)

On the other side is the Shang Dynasty historian David Keightley, who believes it important to essay major generalizations and who addressed the issue by asking “What made China Chinese?” (Keightley 2014). The reader of that paper will see that in addressing the grand question Keightley throws light on another, closer to home: what makes us “us?”

Yet Puett was not simply crying “wolf”. A disturbingly large number of scholars have made generalizations that were not simply misleading in their consequences, but have had racist, or “orientalist” undertones, or, more commonly, have just been plain flat-out wrong. To take only a few more egregious examples, although not a trained sinologist, Kant studied China and lectured on Chinese thought in his geography classes, including statements that Confucius taught nothing but manners for the elite, and referred to the views of the Daodejing as “the monster system of Laotse”; generalizing his remarks to claim that “a concept of virtue and morality never entered the heads of the Chinese” (Ching 1978: 168–169). These examples could be multiplied many times over, and are not relics from the past:

It can be argued that almost every change China has ever undergone originated from abroad or because of some foreign stimulus. (Deeker 2013: 70)

Here is an additional reason for eschewing generalizations:

If there is one valid generalization about China, it is that China defies generalization. Chinese civilization is simply to huge, too diverse and too old for neat maxims. (Goldin 2008: 21)

Undercutting the image of a multimillennia, monolithic static culture is certainly a good thing, politically as well as intellectually. Arguably more nonsense and worse has been written about China than any other non-Western culture, and it is ongoing, as above. But perhaps we should not eschew generalizations about China altogether. Shifting the angle of vision only very slightly Roger Ames gave an important rejoinder to the anti-generalizers:

I would maintain that the only thing more dangerous than striving to make responsible cultural generalizations is failing to make them… Philosophical interpreters must sensitize the student of Chinese philosophy to the ambient uncommon assumptions that have made the Chinese philosophical narrative so different from our own. (Ames 2011: 21)

Perhaps Keightley should have the last word on this issue. As justification for his asking “What makes the Chinese Chinese?” he said:

The Chinese, after all, have probably fed more people more successfully than any or other culture in world history. How they developed the social capital to do this is well worth our study. (Keightley 2014: 83)

Given that it is nigh unto impossible to give an interpretation of a text without making generalizations that go considerably beyond it, we should give the nod to the pros rather than the cons in this particular debate, but the latter perform the salutary function of warning students to take the generalizations lightly at all times, and abandon them for others in the light of further study.

4.2 Translating the Truth

Davidson’s focus on propositional truth (§2.1 above) is altogether in keeping with the concern of most 20^th-century Anglophone philosophers to analyze language as the main means of communicating facts about the world to our fellow human beings. When the facts are indeed as communicated, we say the statements expressing them are “true”. The precise nature of the relation between the facts and the statements of them has generated different theories of truth—correspondence, coherence, pragmatic, semantic, even “deflationary”—with the question remaining an open one today, although fewer philosophers are pursuing an answer to it.

No matter which theory one adopts, elaborating this concept of “truth” involves a cluster of related concepts: sentence, proposition, statement, fact, semantics, reference, connotation, denotation, plus a few others. There is another conception of “truth”, however, where the direct conveying of information is not central to the definition, and consequently “knowledge” is also conceived somewhat differently. Other uses of language might be equally or more important for some philosophers. Remember Chad Hansen’s claim (§2.1) that all of the early Chinese philosophers held that “language is a social practice. Its basic function is guiding discourse” (Hansen 1992: 3). If so, then the standard translation of the graph zhi as “knowledge” becomes problematic, if it is identified with “justified true belief”. Rosemont argues that “We are inclined to focus on the informative uses of language, that is, the transmission of knowledge that.” On his account readers will profit more if zhi is translated as “realize” instead of “knowledge”, following Hall and Ames (1987). “If ‘to personalize’ means ‘to make personal’, then ‘to realize’ is ‘to make real’ in the sense of knowing how, knowing about, knowing to” (Rosemont 2012: 47). Much the same thing has been noted by Stephen Angle and Justin Tiwald in their book on Neo-Confucianism, in which they say they will focus on “knowledge as an activity rather than knowledge as a set of truths” (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 5, 1).

This, too, may be construed as “truth”, even though not propositional, and with a different concept-cluster around it: authenticity, engagement, trustworthy, integrity, honesty, upright, and more. In 2014 a symposium celebrating the inauguration of a new online journal of cross-cultural philosophy (Confluence, 1.1) was devoted to the question of whether the concept of truth was useful in the pursuit of cross-cultural philosophical research. The four symposiasts represented Japanese philosophy, Confucianism, Aztec philosophy and Tibetan Buddhism. None of them found close approximations for “truth” in the propositional sense in the cultures they studied, but all four said there were analogues for the terms associated with truth as “truthfulness” in the lexicons of the thinkers and traditions they worked with. This non-propositional sense of truth is of course not unknown in the West; everyone understands what Václav Havel meant when he entitled an anthology of his essays Living in Truth (1990). But it has not been a major concern among English-speaking philosophers since the analytic movement got under way a little over a century ago.

Helping people to hold true beliefs is a very worthwhile endeavor and so is helping them transform themselves to lead meaningful lives. The translator/interpreter must be aware of which approach is reflected in the text under examination. If we believe the author(s) were concerned with the way things are in the world, we will employ interpretive methods to ascertain the truth of the claims made, namely, those methods concerned with propositional truth: logical and linguistic analysis, especially in the Anglophone tradition, and/or hermeneutics or phenomenology among continental philosophers.

If we understand the ancient Chinese philosophers as having another basic aim, however, we might pause at using Western interpretive strategies adopted for propositional truth-seeking to study the praxis-guiding normative statements of the Chinese. In praxis-guiding discourse(s) human flourishing for oneself and others was the basic concern. Put another way, the standard style of Western philosophical writings tends to be explanatory and justificatory, whereas the Chinese style tends to be narrative (of experience) and normative. There are exceptions in both cases of course; normativity is no more unknown in the West than explanations are in China. But in general truth is associated with facts and propositions in modern Western philosophical texts, and with values and the conduct of one’s life in China’s classical texts. If so, it is by no means clear that the methodologies developed for philosophical critiques and exegeses in the modern Western tradition are suitable for application mutatis mutandis to Chinese classical writings; attempting to uncover and explicate one kind of truth may well hinder acquiring insights about the other.

4.3 Translating the Sounds of Silence

These two different senses of “truth” bespeak two different orientations toward philosophy and its purposes; we might loosely refer to them as truth-seeking and way-making. The truth-seeking approach is familiar to us, being at the heart of the Western intellectual tradition, in science no less than philosophy. And philosophical analysis, hermeneutics and phenomenology are all tried and true methods for teasing the (propositional) truth from texts. The model for writing in this philosophical tradition is clarity and precision of expression (at least in the analytic school).

It is not at all clear, however, that those methods are equally appropriate for working with Chinese texts much of the time. There are two reasons for this, the first of which is the Chinese model of writing. Hark back to the discussion of classical Chinese earlier (§1–1.4) while reading the following two quotes. First, from some computer scientists working on natural language processing:

Classical Chinese poetry … is particularly concise, finely rich, highly rhetorical and thus linguistically complex, requiring a high degree of creativity in writing it, sophisticated interpretation in reading it, and difficulty in understanding it. (Fang et al. 2009)

The comment is specifically about poetry but the point is fairly general, especially for the canonical texts of the early period. For the next quote, readers should keep in mind the Western philosophical model of writing, with clarity and precision the most valued narrative qualities:

Polysemy eminently suits the serious classical turn. For where words have more than one meaning, their appearance is apt to induce an initial state of confusion. This confusion proves useful if it makes readers aware that it is context and context alone that determines the values and valences that words assume in any piece of writing, binding author to reader in the construction and reconstruction of meaning (Nylan 2011: 66).

If analytic and hermeneutic methods do not get us to the “truths” found in the classical texts, what other methods might be employed? Leigh Jenco (2007) has argued that while the non-Western orientation in comparative philosophy is clear from the texts studied, the possibilities for using non-western methodologies for philosophical inquiry into those texts are not, and hence the adequacy of Eurocentric approaches to the discipline can be maintained, as well as the “not really philosophy” charge frequently levelled against Chinese texts because they do not contain arguments, are ambiguous, have little empirical or logical content, etc. Put another way, while Chinese texts can become objects of study for the ideas contained in them, their methods of scholarly inquiry never enter the picture, continuing thereby to legitimate a Eurocentric approach to scholarly methodologies.

Leah Kalmanson (2017) picks up on Jenco’s themes, describing Chinese methods for gaining insights from Chinese texts such as ritual preparation before reading them, meditation, memorization and recitation. At first blush it might seem bizarre to suggest that the performance of rituals, memorization and recitation should be called “methods” for interrogating philosophical texts. But the bizarreness can lessen if we can get away from propositional truth, knowing-that, and expository models of clarity and precision. The bizarreness lessens some more if we acknowledge that many Chinese texts are meant to introduce us to or prompt us to search after “transformative experiences” (Paul 2014) that radically change the experiencer in epistemic and personal ways that cannot possibly be known before having these experiences. Meditation, ritual preparation, and recitation of texts (which itself may be an exercise in meditation) may themselves be such experiences, and it is a point of convergence between Chinese and Western thought that no matter how much clarity and precision is achieved in philosophical writing, much of what is most valuable to which that writing seeks to point also remains elusive and may at first only be experienced and then wholly or inadequately articulated.

The classical Chinese texts are composites more or less, are neither clear nor precise, are extremely terse, appeal to the eye and the ear equally, and are replete with ambiguities. Yet the Chinese have long held that those texts, composed and/or edited by the sages, contain all the truths needed to lead an exemplary life, a belief firmly held by many for over 2000 years—and still held by more than a few today. Is it possible that we may gain more insight into the “truths” of the Daodejing by memorizing and then reciting it than by subjecting it to logical and linguistic analysis? The famous scholar-philosopher Zhu Xi of the 13^th century suggested how we should read, and his advice is perhaps an appropriate coda to this entry on issues in translating and interpreting Chinese philosophy:

There is layer upon layer [of meaning] in the words of the sages. In your reading of them, penetrate deeply. If you simply read what is on the surface you will misunderstand. Steep yourself in the words; only then will you grasp their meaning. (Gardner 1990: 128)

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Acknowledgments

As of the 2025 update to this entry, Chad Hansen and David Wong have taken over responsibility for updating and maintaining it.

The original author Henry Rosemont Jr. (1934–2017) acknowledged good friends Roger Ames and Michael Nylan, who made many helpful comments and suggestions on an earlier draft of this entry. He also thanked his daughters Samantha Healy and Constance Rosemont, and his wife JoAnn Rosemont, for essential assistance in the preparation of the manuscript for publication.

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