1. There are some authors who call the following weaker thesis the principle of compositionality: The meaning of a complex expression is determined by the meaning of its structure and the meanings of its constituents. For example, Davis (2003) claims that the ambiguity of ‘aardvark lover’—it can mean either ‘someone who loves aardvarks’ or ‘aardvark that is a lover’ is neither lexical nor structural, but due to two different conventions associated with the single structure NV-er. (For an alternative take on ‘aardvark lover’ that complies with (C), see Szabó (2008.) Since it is not clear that structure itself is the sort of thing that can represent (and hence can have meaning) I assume that compositionality should be interpreted as (C). The difference becomes important if proponents of the weaker principle also allow that syntactic rules may have context-dependent meanings. Here is an illustration. For the sake of argument assume that meaning is truth-conditional content, that ‘every man’ has a single syntactic structure, that ‘every’ and ‘man’ each have a single determinate truth-conditional content, and that the truth-conditional content of ‘every man’ includes some contextual restriction on the domain of quantification. Given (C), this violates compositionality; cf. Stanley and Szabó (2000). Pelletier (2003) claims that the four assumptions are compatible with compositionality because the syntactic rule which combines the quantifier and the noun may be associated with a context-sensitive semantic rule. Pelletier is right given the weaker construal of compositionality. For a precise formulation of the weaker compositionality principle, see Pagin and Pelletier (2007). Section 1.4.1 introduces a weaker compositionality principle, (C\(_{\textit{coll}}\)), that is a generalization of the weak principle.

2. These constituency tests are not wholly theory-neutral. Different syntactic theories support different constituency tests. Moreover, constituency tests are not decisive. An expression may be a constituent even though it fails standard constituency tests. Indeed, some constituency tests are inappropriate to some categories of expression. Nonetheless, constituency tests impose one empirical constraint on the selection of a syntactic theory for natural language.

3. There are a number of difficult questions about the compositionality of these signs. Would all the words that appear on many US traffic signs but not on their European equivalents count as constituents? Is the size of the traffic sign a constituent? (Note that the minimum size of the No-Left-Turn sign in the US is \(24\times 24\) inches.) What exactly does it mean to compose a shape and a color pattern? How can the meaning of one traffic sign can supplement the meaning of another? Do the meanings of traffic signs depend on context indexicals—e.g., ‘No left turn here’? Do the meanings of traffic signs include the understood restrictions—e.g., ‘If you are driving a vehicle, make no left turn here’?

There is also some reason to doubt the compositionality of traffic signs. Consider the following minimal pair:

The meaning of the first is something like ‘No left turn!’; the meaning of the second is roughly ‘Left turn; recommended speed 30mph or less’. (If you didn’t know that the second sign means this you can check the Manual of Traffic Signs.) Since the shape and color pattern of these two signs indicates nothing beyond the fact that the first is a regulatory sign prohibiting something and the second is a warning sign recommending something, there is a problem for compositionality here. Whatever the contribution of the left arrow is, it is hard to accept that the meanings of both these traffic signs are determined compositionally. (As always, there are all sorts of maneuvers that could save compositionality. They involve fiddling with what the meaningful constituents of these signs might be or with what exactly they might mean.) [Sign images are from the Manual of Traffic Signs, by Richard C. Moeur.]

4. To oversimplify a bit, in Frege’s language, the universal quantifier attaches to a monadic predicates. In order to form suitable monadic predicates, Frege (1895, §30) proposes the following syntactic rule: if a sentence contains a name, then one may form a monadic predicate by removing (occurrences) the name from the sentence. For example, one may remove all occurrences of ‘John’ from the sentence ‘John loves John’ to yield the monadic predicate ‘(_) loves (_)’. This predicate will be essential to form the sentence that corresponds to ‘Everyone loves themselves’. This syntactic rule appears to take a name and a sentence to yield a predicate. If the operation satisfied local compositionality of reference, the referent of the predicate should be determined by the referent of the sentence and the referent of the name. The problem is that any two true sentences have the same referent. Yet, removing the name ‘John’ from ‘John walks’ and from ‘John talks’ seem to yield monadic predicates with different referents (‘(_) walks’ and ‘(_) talks’) even if the two sentences have the same truth-values. For contrasting views see Wehmeier (2018) and Pickel and Rabern (2023).

5. As stated, (C\(_{\textit{occ}}\)) is oversimplified: it evaluates each constituent of a complex expression within the same context. A more adequate formulation would allow for context-shift within larger expressions. To formulate such a principle adequately one must take a stand on what contexts are—a question bypassed here. See Stojnić 2021.

6. Recanati (2012) distinguishes between the content and the occasion meaning of an expression. The former is supposed to be derived from the standing meaning via a mandatory process he calls saturation, while the latter is supposed to be arrived at employing the full array of contextual processes, including optional modulation as well. (For the distinction between saturation and modulation, see Recanati 2004.) He also suggests that the content of complex expressions is not compositionally determined, although it is determined by its structure and the occasion meanings of its constituents.

7. Higginbotham (1985, 2007) argues that questions of grammaticality must be kept separate from questions of meaningfulness. If so, despite its ungrammaticality ‘John is probable to leave’ means (roughly) the same as ‘John is likely to leave’.

8. To capture global compositionality formally is somewhat complicated. Here is an attempt. Say that the expressions \(e\) and \(e'\) are local equivalents just in case they are the results of applying the same syntactic operation to lists of expressions such that corresponding members of the lists are synonymous. (More formally: for some natural number \(k\) there is a \(k\)-ary \(F\) in E, and there are some expressions \(e_1, \ldots, e_k\), \(e_1 ', \ldots, e_k '\) in \(E\), such that \(e = F(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k)\), \(e' = F(e_1 ',\ldots ,e_k ')\), and for every \(1\le i \le k\), \(m(e_i) = m(e_i ')\).) It is clear that \(m\) is locally compositional just in case locally equivalent pairs of expressions are all synonyms. Say that the expressions \(e\) and \(e'\) are global equivalents just in case they are the results of applying the same syntactic operation to lists of expressions such that corresponding members of the lists are either (i) simple and synonymous or (ii) complex and globally equivalent. (Here is the recursive definition more formally. Say that the expressions \(e\) and \(e'\) are 1-global equivalents just in case they are synonymous simple expressions. Say that the expressions \(e\) and \(e'\) are n-global equivalents just in case for some natural number \(k\) there is a \(k\)-ary \(F\) in E, and there are some expressions \(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k, e_1 ',\ldots ,e_k '\) in \(E\), such that \(e = F(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k), e' = F(e_1 ',\ldots ,e_k ')\), and for every \(1 \le i \le k\) there is a \(1 \le j \lt n\) such that \(e_i\) and \(e_i '\) are \(j\)-global equivalents. Finally, say that the expressions \(e\) and \(e'\) are global equivalents just in case for some natural number \(n\) they are \(n\)-global equivalents.) It is a bit hard to define in full generality what it is for an expression to be a constituent of another. (This problem does not arise if the syntactic algebra must be a term algebra.) Say that \(e\) is a 1-constituent of \(e'\) just in case it is in the domain of some syntactic operation whose value is \(e'\). Say that \(e\) is an \(n+1\)-constituent of \(e'\) just in case it is in the domain of some syntactic operation whose value is an \(n\)-constituent of \(e'\). Finally, say that \(e\) is a constituent of \(e'\) just in case there is a natural number \(n\) such that \(e\) is an \(n\)-constituent of \(e'.\) Assuming that every expression can be generated from simple ones through a finite number of applications of the syntactic operations, this will do. \((e\) is simple iff it is not the value of any syntactic operation.) For an alternative abstract characterization of constituency, see Hodges 2012 (251–2).

9. Collective compositionality could be formalized using the trick used to formalize global compositionality. Thus, \(m\) is collectively compositional just in case collectively equivalent pairs of expressions are all synonyms, where collective equivalence is defined exactly like global equivalence with one difference. The recursive step demands not only that \(e_i\) and \(e_i '\) be \(j\)-collective equivalents but also that the very same semantic relations should hold among \(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k\) and among \(e_1 ',\ldots ,e_k '\). This leaves space for the possibility that ‘Cicero is Cicero’ is not collectively equivalent to ‘Cicero is Tully’, even though they have the same structure and their proper constituents are all collectively equivalent.

10.The translation here is due to Szabó.

11. There are principles of intermediate strength between \((F_{\textit{all}})\) and \((F_{\textit{any}})\). These principles allow that the meaning of an expression may be fixed by the meanings of some set or sets of complex expressions in which it occurs. One class of interest are the cofinal sets. In determining the meaning of ‘conquered’, one may need to look at how this word interacts with every other expression of the language (‘Caesar’, ‘Cicero’, ‘Gaul’, ‘someone’, and so on). So the set of expressions relevant to determining the meaning of ‘conquered’ may need to include ‘Caesar conquered Gaul’. However, not every expression containing ‘conquered’ and ‘Caesar’ may be needed to determine the meaning of ‘conquered’. A cofinal set of expressions is a set such that any expression occurs as a constituent in at least one member of the set. One intermediate context principle would say that the meaning of ‘conquered’ is determined by the meanings of the expressions that occur in any set of cofinal expressions.

(F\(_{\textit{cofinal}}\)) The meaning of an expression is determined by the meanings of all expressions with any cofinal set of expressions.

(Except for very odd languages, the set of all expressions within the language in which some given expression occurs as a constituent is one of the many cofinal sets of expressions, so \((F_{\textit{all}})\)follows from (F\(_{\textit{cofinal}}\)) but not the other way around. That (F\(_{\textit{cofinal}}\) ) follows from \((F_{\textit{any}})\) but not the other way around is trivial. One interesting feature of (F\(_{\textit{cofinal}}\)) is that it appears to be in conflict with Quine’s thesis of the indeterminacy of translation (taken as a thesis that implies the indeterminacy of meaning). Assume that the set of all observation sentences is cofinal within a reasonably large fragment of a natural language and that the meaning of an observation sentence is identical to its stimulus meaning—(F\(_{\textit{cofinal}}\)) ensures then that the meanings of all the words are determined within our fragment. There has been an attempt to \(_{\textit{any}}\)show that (F\(_{\textit{cofinal}}\)) follows from less controversial claims, and perhaps even from claims that Quine himself was committed to; cf. Werning 2004. The heart of Werning’s argument is the Extension Theorem; cf. Theorem 14 in Hodges 2001. The theorem states that a meaning assignment to a cofinal set of expressions that satisfies (H) and (S\(_{\textit{singular}}\)) has a unique extension to a meaning assignment to all expressions that satisfies (H), (S\(_{\textit{singular}}\)) as well as its converse (there is a generalized result mentioned in Hodges 2012 (257). The extra assumptions needed to get from the Extension Theorem to a denial of indeterminacy remain questionable; cf. Leitgeb 2005.

12. An example from Platts (1979): ‘The horse behind Pegasus is bald’, ‘The horse behind the horse behind Pegasus is bald’, ‘The horse behind the horse behind the horse behind Pegasus is bald’, …. Martin (1994, 7) appeals to numerals in trying to illustrate the same point. This I find less convincing. One can indeed say that English contains the sentences ‘I have one kumquat’, ‘I have two kumquats’, ‘I have three kumquats’, … but perhaps this series cannot be continued ad infinitum without recourse to elaborate mathematical notation. And the mathematical notion is arguably not part of English.

13. Note that Frege’s conclusion appears to be the building principle. Whether Frege believed in compositionality is a matter of much debate among scholars. One problem is that in the published writings appeals to a substitutivity principle about reference, but no analogous principle about sense. Another problem is that in the Grundlagen (1884) Frege announces his famous context principle, which on certain interpretations contradicts certain interpretations of compositionality; cf. section 1.6.4 above. Finally, it is not even clear whether Fregean senses can be properly construed as linguistic meanings. For more on Frege and compositionality, see Janssen 2001 and Pelletier 2001. They also provide good bibliographies.

14. Fodor (1998b) does offer an empirical argument in favor of systematicity. The idea is that if complex expressions could be understood without understanding their constituents, then it is unclear how exposure to a corpus made up almost entirely of complex expressions could suffice to learn the meanings of lexical items. But, as a matter of empirical fact, children learn the meanings of words by encountering them almost exclusively within other expressions. However, as Robbins (2005) points out, this observation can at best lead one to conclude that understanding a suitably large set of complex expressions in which a given expression occurs as a constituent suffices for understanding the constituent itself. It does not show that understanding any complex expression suffices for understanding its constituents.

15. This assumes at least some level of autonomy for syntax. But it is overwhelmingly plausible that even if syntax is not fully independent of semantics, not all syntactic regularities are to be explained semantically.

16. The original meaning is uniformly recoverable in principle. There is no constraint here on how complex a calculation might be required to determine the value \(\mu(s)(s)\).

17. That compositionality in itself does not constrain lexical meaning might appear paradoxical at first, but the source of paradox is just instability in how the label ‘compositionality’ is used. Sometimes compositionality is said to be that feature in a language (or non-linguistic representational system) which best explains the productivity and systematicity of our understanding; cf. Fodor 2001: 6. (C) is but one of the features such explanations use—others include the context-invariance of most lexical meaning, the finiteness of the lexicon, the relative simplicity of syntax, and probably much else. These features together put significant constraints on what lexical meanings might be; cf. the papers collected in Fodor and Lepore (2002) and Szabó (2004).

18. Wehmeier (2024) has recently argued that combining compositionality with the requirement that the semantics be suitable to model logical consequence imposes substantive requirements on meaning assignments.

19. The facts to be explained might include the fact that speakers are able to communicate in real time makes it overwhelmingly likely that the computational complexity of the interpretation algorithm employed is relatively low. In fact, it seems reasonable to think that semantic theories with minimal complexity are, other things being equal, preferable. And there are certain results that show that, semantics theories that conform to certain strengthenings of (C) will be minimally complex; cf. Pagin 2012.

20. The algebraic notation is the standard system for describing chess games. Its essentials go back to the Arabs of the 9^th century. The example and the discussion are a slightly modified version of Szabó 2000a: 77–78.

21. Cf. Szabó 2000c. To defend compositionality along these lines it is by no means necessary to postulate a variable in the logical form of the sentence; cf. Szabó 2010.

22. The explanation may follow the path of Salmon (1986). For a more recent proposal, see Båve (2008).

23. For example, one could take the clausal complement of ‘believes’ to be an interpreted logical form—something which includes phonological information about the words employed in the clause; cf. Higginbotham (1986), Segal (1989), Larson and Ludlow (1993). Such theories violate compositionality because they maintain that the semantic value of a that-clause includes phonological information even though the semantic values of their constituents and their mode of combination do not. The fact that simple recursive semantic theories can violate compositionality should raise extra concerns about the strength of arguments from productivity and systematicity.