Notes to Feminist Perspectives on Argumentation

1. I use the term “Euro-American” in regard to philosophy instead of “Western” which is a vestige of the Cold War or even the more contemporary “Northern” which addresses economic relationships. Noting the origin of philosophical traditions in Europe and their growth in the Americas (perhaps especially North America or even just Canada and the US) is maximally specific and descriptively accurate while it also distinguishes these traditions from the Indigenous philosophies of the Americas. Occasionally, I use the term “Western” when the concern is with modern industrialized democracies because it’s the best term available for that, pace Australia, New Zealand, and others.

2. Feminine associations of rhetoric come from its connection with narrative, persuasion, and emotion and its contrast with logic.

3. Retaining Moulton’s capitalization helps to distinguish her model of the Adversary Method from many other forms of contest and opposition involved in arguing that may be ordinarily described as “adversarial” or involving “adversaries”.

4. The relationship of argument to various forms of interpersonal conflicts plays out in Monty Python’s sketch, “The Argument Clinic” (John Cleese and Graham Chapman, 1989, in The Secret Policemen’s Other Balls, Monty Python official YouTube channel. Originally Broadcast on the BBC in 1972. [The Argument Clinic available on-line]

5. Nye anticipates such criticism of her own work by pronouncing herself guilty of fallacies according to the traditional standards of logic (1990: 174).

6. “Intersectionality” describes how forms of oppression combine and reinforce each other, and intersectional identity recognizes how identities involving forms of oppression such as racism, classism, and sexism influence each other.

7. Willard van Orman Quine develops the notion that a person’s beliefs are interconnected with some being more central to the “web” in The Web of Belief (1970), written with Joseph S. Ullian. This textbook presentation builds on Quine’s Word and Object (1960).

Copyright © 2021 by
Catherine E. Hundleby

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