Feminist Philosophy of Biology

First published Wed Jun 22, 2011; substantive revision Sat Apr 6, 2024

Feminist philosophers of biology bring the tools of feminist theory, and in particular the tools of feminist philosophy of science, to investigations of the life sciences. While the critical examination of the categories of sex and gender (which will be explained below) takes a central place, the methods, ontological assumptions, and foundational concepts of biology more generally have also enjoyed considerable feminist scrutiny. Through such investigations, feminist philosophers of biology reveal the extent to which the theory and practice of particular scientific disciplines and research programs (and, indeed, their philosophical study) are intertwined with both value judgments and social hierarchies.

This entry is divided into five sections. The introductory section (a) discusses some of the challenges of defining feminist philosophy of biology, (b) puts it in context and in conversation with non-feminist philosophy of biology, and (c) defines the pivotal concepts of sex and gender. The second section explores the variety of motivations and epistemic perspectives found within feminist philosophy of biology. In section three we discuss feminist analyses of some foundational concepts within philosophy of biology and philosophy of science more generally, such as biological determinism, reductionism, and essentialism. The fourth section considers, in some depth, two central examples of feminist analysis of biological research: (a) sexual selection and (b) sociobiology/evolutionary psychology. The entry concludes with a discussion of opportunities for further research.

1. Introduction

Feminist philosophy of biology bears much in common with non-feminist philosophy of biology, which is highly interdisciplinary and has unclear boundaries. Major contributors include scientists as well as philosophers. There are two general and often closely related approaches to the practice of philosophy of biology. First, philosophers of biology use philosophical methods to analyze topics of central importance in the biological sciences, such as natural selection, fitness, adaptation, and the nature of genes. Second, philosophy of biology addresses central topics in the philosophy of science, such as reductionism, laws of nature, and theory change, from the perspective of the biological sciences instead of physics as is more traditional in philosophy of science. Philosophy of biology is often informed by a naturalistic approach, meaning that the work is closely tied to the actual history and practice of the science in question. It is not uncommon for philosophers of biology, at least at some point during their careers, to become significantly involved with the science itself, either in terms of conducting biological research or collaborating with biologists on research or pedagogical projects.

The boundaries of feminist philosophy of biology are similarly fuzzy. It is not clear whether many of the authors cited in this entry would primarily consider themselves philosophers of biology, science studies scholars, or scientists. Moreover, biologists and philosophers with other distinct but related progressive political commitments (e.g., Richard Lewontin and Stephen Jay Gould) have offered critiques of various mainstream projects that share much with feminist criticisms and some philosophers might be identified with either camp (e.g., John Dupré and Helen Longino). This blurring of the line between feminist and nonfeminist philosophy of biology is increasingly the case, as many critiques of biology and philosophy of science by feminists are increasingly accepted by the mainstream. Not surprisingly, the two general approaches to philosophy of biology are also advanced in feminist philosophy of biology.

First, many feminist philosophers of biology are concerned with biological concepts and knowledge claims, particularly regarding sex and gender (see the entry on feminist perspectives on sex and gender), as well as the influence of gender ideology on biological research. Due to the importance of these concepts to what follows and the frequent confusions and controversies associated with them, it is worth clarifying what exactly we mean by them. In no small part informed by queer theorists like Judith Butler (1990), the categories of sex and gender themselves, as well as their relationship with sexuality, have become increasingly contentious. Here, we adopt Sari van Anders’ definitions of gender, sex, and gender/sex (2015).

As a self-identified feminist neuroendocrinologist, van Anders’ approach starts from a commitment to both anti-oppression goals and scientific rigor. Dissatisfied with simplistic measures of sexual orientation, like the Kinsey scale, she specifies a series of distinct measures that comprise an individual’s sexual configuration. Among these are sex, gender, and gender/sex. Sex roughly captures biological, bodily features that are related to evolved reproductive role. Importantly, this is not a binary category but admits of considerable variation (including trans people) even as male and female define the conceptual starting point (2015, Table 2; 1190). Gender captures “[a]spects of masculinity, femininity, and gender-diversity that are situated as socialized, learned, and cultural” (2015, Table 2).

To these standard definitions and in deference to both the developmental interactions between the biological and the social and the experiential realities of our own bodies, van Anders adds gender/sex, which captures,

[w]hole people/identities and/or aspects of women, men, and people that relate to identity and/or cannot really be sourced specifically to sex or gender. (2015, Table 2)

Clearly, the first measure, sex, can be applied to all sexual organisms (though van Anders’ focus is strictly on the human). Whether the concepts of gender and gender/sex admit of nonhuman applications is considerably more controversial, though Meynell and Lopez have argued that they may (2021). The matter of the sex (or, indeed, gender) of desired or actual partners in sexual activity is a separate axis of sexual configuration from the individual’s sex, gender, or gender/sex. Van Anders’ work exemplifies the kind of novelty, subtlety, and rigor, that a careful development of biological concepts driven by the insights and anti-oppression commitments of feminist theory can produce, as well as shoring up contentious terms by delineating their scope and adding a third category for the many ambiguous cases that confront us. Importantly, and consistent with her commitment to inclusivity and justice, the operational definitions of gender/sex and sex both include trans categories (as, of course, does gender) (2015, Table 2).

Though not all feminist philosophers of biology adopt van Anders’ approach, the vast majority are alive to the impossibility of sharply demarcating sex and gender for biologically cultural animals like humans. With sophisticated accounts of sexual diversity in hand, feminist analysis is often performed as a control (in a sense to be explained below) to test for the unrecognized influence of traditional or pernicious gender politics and ideology on the production of knowledge, in existing knowledge claims, and in the choices of research projects. These gender values can include sexism (devaluation, in practice primarily of women, based on traditional stereotypes of gender roles) and androcentrism (a focus on men or males and the neglect or exclusion of women, females, or other non-men/males), but extend to the imposition of a sex binary on sexual organisms or the disappearance of those sexual phenomena that do not neatly fit the binary.

As we will explain in more detail below, feminist investigations of the relationships between gender values, and the practices and products of the biological sciences can take place in a range of epistemological projects. Some projects focus on removing gender bias; others focus on developing an understanding of the role of social values, including gender values, in biological research; and others, like van Anders’, attempt to reconfigure basic concepts and change how science is done. Many of these projects engage specific cases or research programs in the life sciences and there is a degree of overlap between feminist philosophy of biology and various feminist critiques of medicine, psychology, and the social sciences.

Similarly, the second central project in non-feminist philosophy of biology—consideration of foundational topics in biology, philosophy of biology and philosophy of science—is also addressed by feminists, albeit typically with a focus on whether these topics are gendered or otherwise incompatible with or unfriendly to feminist insights. Discussions that contextualize the complex relation between sex and gender in terms of nature and nurture more generally (e.g., Keller 2010) exemplify this research as do feminist critiques of reductionism, determinism, essentialism (see section 3.1) and the nature of objectivity (see the entry on feminist epistemology and philosophy of science). As we will discuss below, some feminist philosophers of biology contend that gendered (and other) values are not only historically intertwined with particular theories or knowledge claims, but, epistemically also support and are supported by them (Fehr 2004; Longino 1990). When feminists first tackled these issues in the 1970s, 1980s, and 1990s, their arguments and approaches were often rejected, ignored, or derided, but a number of these views are now widely accepted in the mainstream of philosophy of biology. There is also significant feminist work regarding scientific objectivity that is at least partially motivated by the presence and power of unacknowledged gendered assumptions, including androcentrism and sexism, in biological sciences ranging from genetics and cell biology, to sociobiology (for example Keller 1985; Longino 1990, 2002; Haraway 1989; Harding 1986). This has grounded a larger discussion of the role of values in the sciences, which were, traditionally, lauded as “value-free”.

2. Motivations, Epistemic Perspectives, and Methods

2.1 Motivations

Work in feminist philosophy of biology can be motivated by a number of, often interrelated, goals. These include countering biological arguments supporting women’s (and others’) oppression, correcting essentialist approaches in the life sciences that elide the true diversity that exists within a given species, especially with respect to gender, sex, and gender/sex and facilitating the production of maximally accurate and ethically responsible accounts of female biology and gendered topics of study in the biological sciences. Feminist philosophers of biology also engage parallel and intersecting issues related to axes of oppression beyond sex and gender (see, e.g., Gannett 2004).

2.1.1 Anti-oppression motivations

The science of biology is of importance to many feminists because women’s biology has been used to rationalize women’s oppression. There is a wide range of biological arguments supporting the oppression of women. Take for example Edward H. Clarke’s nineteenth century argument that intensive study would physically harm women by diverting energy from their uteruses to their brains. He claimed that higher education would result in women with “monstrous brains and puny bodies … [and] abnormally weak digestion” (Clarke 1874: 41). Of course, the development of biological theories to explain and tacitly justify the subjection of women long precedes this (see Schiebinger 1989, esp. Ch. 10) and can, indeed, be traced back to Aristotle (Deslauriers 2022). Unsurprisingly, this kind of argument regarding women’s “natural” inferiority has been a focus of feminist philosophy of biology (see for example Hubbard 1990). Similarly, evolutionary arguments that can provide foundational support for sexist or oppressive practices, for example, arguments for the adaptive nature of violence against women (see Thornhill & Palmer 2000 for a readable account of this research program), have drawn intense feminist scrutiny (for example see papers in Travis 2003a). Harvard past-president Lawrence Summers was not the first person to use biological arguments about the different distributions of intelligence among men and women to justify the absence of women from positions of social power and from higher powered careers (Wilson 1978; Summers 2005). Here also, there is a significant feminist response (Bleier 1984; Fausto-Sterling 1985 [1992]; Fehr 2008).

2.1.2 Against dimorphism

Feminists have pointed out that much of the political power of these sorts of biological arguments arises from problematic assumptions about dimorphism grounded in essentialism and determinism (see section 3.1). Two distinct (even “opposite” or complementary) sexes are simply assumed and any apparent continuity between them, such as people with various intersex conditions, is either denied or treated as an exception that proves the rule (Fausto-Sterling 2000b; Jordan-Young 2010). A close connection between female biology—in terms of genes, hormones, and physiology—and women’s psychological attributes and social positions are also assumed, effectively collapsing traits best understood as gender/sex or even gender traits (such as toy preference, see Meynell 2012) into biologically determined sex traits. The general notion is that biology, as opposed to culture, is monolithic, admitting of no real variation, and fixed. As a result some contend that any political activity designed to change or improve women’s condition is trying to create an “unnatural” system that is doomed to fail. This position, while common in nineteenth and early twentieth century biology, can still be found in the work of some more contemporary biologists, including some early and influential work in sociobiology (Wilson 1978) and much contemporary evolutionary psychology (see section 4.2, below). As a result, feminists have been strongly motivated to analyze particular claims about female biology, to interrogate the assumption that genetic or biological nature implies fixity, and to reveal the wide range of interacting biological and social causes of women’s (and others’) phenotypes, including their psychological attributes and social positions. In section 3 we will discuss biological determinism and essentialism in more detail.

2.1.3 Getting the biology right

Finally, much feminist philosophy of biology is also very concerned with getting the biology right. Many feminist philosophers of biology were initially trained as scientists and are interested not just in critiquing, but also in improving the practice of science, especially as it relates to sex, gender, and gender/sex. Feminist philosophers have documented the impact of feminism on improving the practices of the biological sciences. For example, Donna Haraway’s book Primate Visions (1989) documents the influence that the incorporation of feminist women in primatology had on the study of primate behavior and animal behavior more generally. Haraway shows that feminist primatologist Jeanne Altmann, instigated a quiet but powerful methodological revolution. In one of the most cited papers in the study of animal behavior, “Observational study of behavior: Sampling methods” (1974), Altmann evaluated a range of sampling methods and in doing so developed a method, focal-animal sampling, that undermined previous research generating sexist accounts of leadership and control, and enabled research on female primates and on novel topics such as mothering. Altmann, troubled by the androcentrism and less than rigorous methodologies that she found in primatology, brought her perspectives as a woman, a feminist, a mother, and a mathematically trained scientist to bear on improving research methods. Focal animal sampling provides an effective method for studying the social behavior of female primates and has become an important approach in animal behavior research in general. Haraway’s description of Altmann’s contributions to primatology and animal behavior provides an example of the positive impact of feminism and feminist scientists on the practices and products of scientific research (see also Strum & Fedigan 2000).

In sum, motivations for conducting research in feminist philosophy of biology include the drive to challenge biological justifications of women’s oppression, including the dimorphic assumptions upon which they rest, and improve the practices and products of biological research, particularly on sex, gender, and gender/sex.

2.2 Epistemological Perspectives

Getting the biology “right” can mean different things and there is a range of epistemological positions and objectives held by feminist philosophers of biology. Objectives include revealing gender bias in biological accounts of sex and gender, analyzing science as a social, value-laden practice, and exploring how the social and material situation of biologists affects knowledge production. Importantly, this includes challenging pervasive traditional ontological assumptions about dimorphism and the inevitability of women’s inferior social status as well as providing ontological frameworks, research questions, and methods that produce more accurate, more rigorous, and less politically pernicious science. Since early work on feminism and science tended to focus on the life sciences, much of the feminist philosophy of biology produced in the 1980s and 1990s helped to shape and inform both feminist philosophy of science and feminist epistemology (see entry on feminist epistemology and philosophy of science).

2.2.1 Bias

The largest body of work in feminist philosophy of biology concerns revealing sexist and androcentric bias with the goal of eliminating it. Central and early work in the field documented the presence of assumptions of female passivity and male activity in a wide range of biological accounts of sex and gender. Examples include critique of research on sex determination (Birke 1986; Bleier 1984), fertilization (Martin 1991), human evolution (Bleier 1984; Fausto-Sterling 1985 [1992]; Hubbard 1990) and the discipline of primatology (Hrdy 1986, 1997, and Haraway 1989). (The ubiquity of this trope might owe something to its Aristotelian origins [Deslauriers 2022]). Feminist research on sexist bias in biology focuses on eliminating myths of female biology that are colored by contemporary social values and facilitating the production of biological research that more accurately reveals the facts about sex, gender, and gender/sex. In this sense a feminist perspective is seen as a sort of control, with the goal of removing bias—specifically sexist and androcentric social values—from scientific research. For example, the Biology and Gender Study Group (1988: 61–62) write that,

We have come to look at feminist critique as we would any other experimental control. Whenever one performs an experiment, one sets up all the controls one can think of in order to make as certain as possible that the result obtained does not come from any other source. One asks oneself what assumptions one is making. Have I assumed the temperature to be constant? Have I assumed that the pH doesn’t change over the time of the reaction? Feminist critique asks if there may be some assumptions that we haven’t checked concerning gender bias. In this way feminist critique should be part of normative science. Like any control, it seeks to provide critical rigor, and to ignore this critique is to ignore a possible source of error.

The Biology and Gender Study Group (BGSG) point out that old models of sex determination simply assumed that female developmental patterns were neutral and passive, while male developmental patterns required some sort of active switch to initiate their development (1988). They refer with approval to the 1980s work of Eva Eicher and Linda Washburn, who created a developmental model that did not make the sexist assumption of female passivity and was based on genetic evidence. In this model both male and female development had passive and active components. Further, Eicher and Washburn demonstrate that although there had been significant research on testes determination, there had been practically no work on ovary determination. As a result of this androcentrism, claims about the passivity of female sexual development were made in the absence of evidence. The BGSG sees Eicher and Washburn as an example of a feminist-influenced critique of cell and molecular biology because they controlled for gender bias. This allowed them to be “open to different interpretations of one’s data” and gave them “the ability to ask questions that would not have occurred within the traditional context” (1988: 68). This focus on bias more or less conforms to Sandra Harding’s notion of spontaneous feminist empiricism (1986); it leaves traditional scientific epistemology more or less intact, merely adding a new control and urging scientists to do better by their own standards.

This approach is considered insufficient by many feminist philosophers (see the entry on feminist epistemology and philosophy of science). Sarah Richardson (2010), for one, is critical of tendencies to focus solely on revealing and removing bias, while acknowledging the value of case studies of gender bias. She points out that there is institutional pressure to work on bias. Because it has been customary in the philosophy of science to see good science as value neutral, analyses of bias fall clearly within a traditional philosophical approach. However, even in the face of these professional incentives, she argues that a primary or sole focus on bias is a limiting epistemic position. It fails to take into account feminist work, in epistemology and philosophy of science, that considers how values, including gender values, not only limit but also facilitate knowledge production. Such an account complicates the traditional view that values should be identified solely in order to guard against their impact and leads to a second epistemic perspective, analyses of science as a social value-laden practice.

2.2.2 Science as a social value-laden practice

Helen Longino has developed an influential social account of scientific knowledge production, critical contextual empiricism (1990, 2002). This view is informed by her early work with Ruth Doell (Longino & Doell 1983) on a case study of biological models of the role of hormones in the development of sexual behavior. Longino points out that there is an inferential gap between a theory and the evidence researchers use to assess that theory. She argues that researchers close the gap between evidence and theories with background assumptions of which they may not be aware. Background assumptions include both epistemic and contextual values, and contextual values can include gendered social values (and, of course, those associated with other axes of oppression). She argues that scientific communities maximize objectivity and justification when they include members who differ from one another in terms of the background assumptions they hold and take dissenting views seriously. This diversity of critical perspectives facilitates awareness and critical evaluation of the background assumptions (including those that are sexist and androcentric) that inform research practices. Communities can then decide whether or not those assumptions are acceptable given their research goals. Using examples including the evolution of human sex differences, behavioral endocrinology, and neurobiology, Longino demonstrates that gendered assumptions structure a range of research programs in biology. She writes

The long standing devaluation of women’s voices and those of members of racial minorities means that such [racist and sexist] assumptions have been protected from critical scrutiny. (1990: 78–79)

The implication is that these racist and sexist assumptions, had they received critical scrutiny, would have been deemed unacceptable. The importance of non-epistemic values in science has, increasingly, been embraced by non-feminist philosophers of biology (e.g., Kitcher 2001; Reydon & Ereshefsky 2022), though there have long been politicized progressive voices in philosophy of biology interested in tackling the role of these values in the biological sciences (e.g., Gould 1981; Hull 1986; Lewontin 1992; Dupré 1993).

Treating science as a value-laden practice also prompts us to question whose interests are served by our scientific projects and practices and how science would be different in more just social relations. These kinds of considerations take many different forms, depending on the research in question, and work in this area often further blurs the boundaries of philosophy of biology, reaching towards other sciences, such as archaeology and medicine. For instance, Alison Wylie has shown how collaborative research with Indigenous communities can enrich both the evidential base and critical standards of various research projects involving Indigenous research subjects, while better serving the goals of Indigenous people (2015). As another example, Kristen Intemann and Inmaculada de Melo-Martín use the case of HPV vaccine research to show how the aims of research influence the definition of the research problem, evidentiary standards, and methodology (2010). As yet another example, Françoise Baylis has argued that, given the implications for the future evolution of our species, human gene editing that may affect the germ-line should be limited and guided by values and policies reflecting a broad societal consensus (2019).

2.2.3 Situated knowledge

Donna Haraway introduced the concept of “situated knowledge”, an idea that has become very influential in academic feminism, including feminist epistemology (1988). In her book Primate Visions (1989) she explores the ways that primatology constructs political narratives about the categories of nature, gender, and race, and the ways that those categories are integrated with particular perspectives situated in social and material locations. She also reveals the ways that feminist primatologists have turned primatology into what some call a feminist science (see also Fedigan 1997).

Treating knowledge as situated undermines the idea of a generic epistemic subject who, through using scientific methods, can inhabit an impartial view from nowhere. The knowing subject, including the biologist, is recognized as culturally located and embodied, meaning that one has a particular material, historical, and social location (for example one’s location can include being a woman, feminist, scientist, Anglo American, heterosexual,…). This means the perspectives from which we know and the knowledge we produce are partial, both in the sense of being incomplete and in the sense of being infused with one’s own peculiar interests and preferences. One’s perspective does not just influence one’s interests, the questions one asks and the methods, theories and strategies that one uses to answer those questions; it also influences one’s ontology, in terms of the objects and kinds of things that one investigates.

The point here is not just that feminist perspectives are partial but that non-feminist perspectives are partial too. Indeed, even a generally accepted and well-evidenced theory may turn out to be profoundly flawed, resting on politically pernicious or empirically dubious assumptions, if these assumptions are shared by all rival hypotheses. Kathleen Okruhlik’s “Gender and the Biological Sciences” (1994) neatly demonstrates the inadequacy of the widely held view that empirical methods, carefully applied, can protect scientific results from being infected by biases. This view implies that feminist scruples can be disregarded, so long as one carefully attends to the observed facts and ensures that the theory one adopts best accounts for the observations. To illustrate the point, Okruhlik suggests we consider the possibility that, within a patriarchal society, all proposed theories of female behavior might be infused by sexism. In such a society,

[n]on-sexist [rival hypotheses] will never even be generated. Hence the theory which is selected by the canons of scientific appraisal will simply be the best of the sexist rivals; and the very content of science will be sexist, no matter how rigorously we apply objective standards of assessment in the context of justification. In fact, the best of the sexist theories will emerge more and more highly confirmed after successive tests. (1994 [1998: 202])

Whereas traditional non-feminist views of objectivity position such partiality as a flaw to be overcome to the greatest degree possible, feminists view situatedness as an unavoidable epistemic reality that can be pernicious or productive, but can only do mischief when it is ignored or denied. We can see a productive kind of situated knowledge in Jeanne Altmann’s working from the perspective of a woman, a mother, and a feminist to develop methodologies that allowed for the systematic study of the often low-drama interactions among female primates and between mothers and their offspring. Another example from Primate Visions (Haraway 1989) is Adrienne Zihlman’s critique of associations of sexual dimorphism with, usually male, dominance. Zihlman, who is best known for her development, with Nancy Tanner, of Woman the Gatherer theory of early human evolution, consciously developed a feminist stance toward gender and science. Zihlman argued that sexual dimorphism was not a unitary phenomenon. Different species can be sexually dimorphic not only to different degrees, but in different ways, including bone length and structure, tendencies to build muscle or fat tissue, and/or canine size. These different kinds of sexual dimorphism can be related to differences in aggressive capacities and differences in foraging strategies, both of which had been associated with evolutionary accounts of gender differences. Zihlman’s stance as a feminist scientist allowed her to focus on heterogeneity and complexity of sexual dimorphism and undermined associations of general sexual dimorphism with male dominance.

The appreciation of the inescapable partiality and situatedness of knowledge grounds a widespread epistemic pluralism among feminist philosophers of biology. This arises not only out the recognition of the different social and epistemic contexts in which research is conducted, but also the complexity, contingency, and heterogeneity of biological phenomena themselves (discussed in the next section). Feminist philosophers of biology are often willing to countenance multiple explanations for the same phenomena and may see this as a virtue that arises from attending to these ontological and/or epistemic possibilities (assuming, of course, that the explanations are well-formulated and well-evidenced) (Longino 2002; Fehr 2004). For example, feminists have critiqued “man-the-hunter” theories of human evolution because they focus on a single cause, hunting, of a complex and varied evolutionary history (Bleier 1984). They point out that while hunting played a role, gathering was likely the primary source of nutrition, and that the reciprocal interaction of many factors, such as the development of language and culture, likely played important roles in the evolution of human beings.

As discussed in this section, epistemic perspectives in feminist philosophy of biology range across work on gender bias, considerations of biology a social and value-laden practice, and the idea of situated knowledge.

3. Conceptual Themes in Feminist Philosophy of Biology

3.1 Determinism, Reductionism, and Essentialism

Although determinism, reductionism, and essentialism are conceptually distinct, they often work together as ontological assumptions grounding methodological and interpretative approaches in the biological research programs that inspire and deserve feminist critique. Determinism can be broadly construed simply to mean that every event is determined by some prior set of causes, rather than, say, being the result of mere chance. However, the cases that typically interest feminist philosophers of biology are those in which a single causal factor (or a small set of well-circumscribed factors) is treated as the only relevant or interesting cause of a given effect. This tends to go along with the implication that the causal factor and its inevitable effect are, in some sense, essential to the organism—so much so that, in some cases, even when the effect is not present, it along with its putative cause are nonetheless taken to determine the true essence of the organism and the absent effect is asserted to be in some sense present, albeit in a suppressed or distorted form. These essential causal determinants are almost always thought to be internal to the organism and are thus treated reductively. Genes, chromosomes, hormones, and brains are taken to determine our sexually dimorphic human nature, and, indeed, nonhuman natures too. Environmental influences such as local ecology, learning, and social structures are undervalued or treated as noise obscuring the “real” or “important” causes.

Regarding genetics and molecular biology, researchers such as Evelyn Fox Keller (2000), Bonnie Spanier (1995) Ruth Hubbard (1990) and Anne Fausto-Sterling (1985 [1992]) have pointed out the logical and empirical distance between an organism having a particular genotype and expressing a particular phenotype, including behaviors. Non-feminist philosophers of biology have also developed criticisms of biological determinism (an influential example is Richard Lewontin’s book Biology as Ideology [1992]) and this rejection of reductive determinism has become increasingly mainstream through the developmental turn of biological research programs like developmental systems theory and evo-devo (see entries on evolution and development; philosophy of biology; reductionism in biology; and theories of biological development).

At the heart of this critique is a rejection of a deterministic view of the causal relationship between genes and the particular proteins that result in phenotypes, called the Central Dogma. According to common descriptions of the Central Dogma, information flows from DNA to RNA to protein, and not in the other direction. DNA specifies messenger RNA in a process called transcription. Messenger RNA plays a role in specifying the amino acid sequence of a protein. Feminist and non-feminist philosophers of biology, along with many biologists, have pointed out that this causal chain is extremely complicated and that a particular genotype can result in different phenotypes in different contexts. There are gene regulation mechanisms that turn genes on and off, and control the rate of transcription. There are hereditary mechanisms whereby once a portion of DNA is rendered inactive in a cell it remains inactive in all of that cell’s descendants. The cellular environment affects what DNA is transcribed and the fate of particular DNA transcripts. A sequence of DNA does not uniquely specify a particular protein. The machinery of the cell processes the RNA transcript. During this processing different portions of an RNA strand can be spliced out resulting in different end products, which means that the same DNA sequence can result in different proteins and different phenotypic traits. The nature of the relationship between a sequence of DNA and the traits of an organism is complicated. Although genes make a difference in an organism’s phenotype, they are not the sole causes determining that phenotype. Simple pictures of genetic determinism are not supported by molecular biology.

These insights about the contingency of genetic expression are often passed over in evolutionary explanations. However, it is clear that even if a trait is the result of evolution by natural selection, or in other words is an adaptation, it does not follow that the trait is uniformly expressed in a population or static in an individual over time. In addition to this, some adaptive traits are almost always present and others require very specific environmental conditions in order to develop. One could have the genetic correlate of a trait and that trait could be the result of natural selection, and yet changing the environment could eliminate the expression of that trait. Moreover, many traits admit of a range of different possible expressions depending on the developmental context. Some, including feminists, have pointed to the importance of these “norms of reaction” for understanding the diversity found within populations and appreciating their contingency (Fausto-Sterling 1997; Meynell 2008; Jordan-Young 2010).

The diversity of populations is not only driven by developmental contingencies but evolutionary processes also. This may seem paradoxical given that natural selection explanations, though stochastic from generation to generation, are often treated deterministically over evolutionary time, producing the adaptations that are considered characteristic of a particular species. However, some traits have adapted to past environmental conditions and don’t enhance the fitness of their bearers in current conditions. Under non-selective conditions, traits tend to diversify, as random mutations that are adaptively neutral multiply over generations. Some traits give their bearers a fitness advantage, but are not the result of natural selection and hence are not adaptations. Some of these may be by-products of other selection processes. Elisabeth Lloyd has made a compelling argument that the (human) female orgasm is one such case—a “fantastic bonus” of the selection pressures on male orgasm and the developmental homology of the penis and clitoris (2005). In her book, The Case of the Female Orgasm, Lloyd takes on multiple natural selection accounts, claiming they are androcentric—assuming, contra the evidence, that female sexual response mirrors that of males—and adaptationist—rejecting out of hand the possibility that an interesting trait, like the female orgasm, could be anything other than the result of natural selection. Simple, reductive, deterministic stories of the “function” of the female orgasm belie the complexity, contingency and diversity of this trait in the human species. Finally, it is worth remembering that natural selection itself can only work on a population that is diverse enough to have traits that are sufficiently distinct that there is a fitness difference between them. Reductionist, determinist, and essentialist explanations are thus not supported by evolutionary biology, developmental biology, or genetics. Any apparent gap between nature and nurture can justly be considered a “mirage” (Keller 2010) and any accounts of a static and universal “nature” of a given species (or sex) should be considered suspect until proven otherwise.

Similar reductionist, determinist research programs can be found in sex difference research, which reaches from chromosomes to hormones to brains and behavior. This research typically assumes sex dimorphism and then seeks data to confirm it. Often, despite the existence of multiple members of the population who defy easy classification as either male or female (however these are being defined in the particular study at hand) and despite the data revealing considerable overlap between the sexes in whatever is being measured, the results are interpreted as revealing two essentially different kinds: the male chromosome and the female chromosome; male hormones and female hormones; the male brain and the female brain.

Sarah Richardson in Sex Itself: The Search for Male and Female in the Human Genome (2013), reveals the way that “gender valences” have informed the discovery and study of sex chromosomes. Episodes in this history include the rise and fall of the XYY “supermale” (2013: 81–102) and the mosaicism of those with two X chromosomes (one of which must be “turned off” in each cell) being charged with creating beings who are “mysterious, contradictory, complicated, emotional and changeable” (2013: 109).

The story of sex chromosomes is intimately linked with sex hormones, brains, and behavior (Birke 1986; Longino & Doell 1983; Longino 1990). In an early model of the role of hormones in rat development, which Longino and Doell called the linear-hormonal model, prenatal and perinatal hormone levels are assumed to be the basis for behavioral sex differences. The assumption is that a gene on the Y chromosome triggers the development of testes, and that the hormones released by these brand new testes affect the structure of the rodent brain during a critical developmental period. The presence of testes and the hormones that they produce were assumed to cause the male brain to develop such that the male performs “stereotypical” male sexual behavior; in the absence of testes and the hormones that they produce the female brain develops in such a way as to cause the female to perform “stereotypical” female behavior. Longino points out that in this explanatory model it is assumed that there is a “unidirectional and irreversible sequence of (biochemical) events” (Longino 1990: 135) and, as we will see, it continues to shape brain organization theory (discussed below).

Rejecting the linear-hormonal model, Birke was an early defender of an interactionist model. She points out that research is beginning to embrace a much more complex picture of the causes of sexual behavior, a picture that involves interactions among the mother, the fetus, the physiological and social environment as well as the genes, the internal anatomy and the brain structure of the developing fetus. Rat fetuses are influenced by factors such as the sex of other members of the litter, the mother’s environment, and the mother’s hormonal states. Birke writes,

Even before birth… it is difficult to separate the individual pup and its hormones from a network of complex processes. (Birke 1986: 97)

After birth, factors such as the pup’s own hormones, maternal care (which is differential depending on the sex of the pup), the physical environment and the other pups influence adult sexual behavior. When the pup becomes an adult, factors in its physical and social environment as well as its hormonal states and its own behavior influence its sexual behavior. The interactionist model does not ignore low level causes, such as genes or hormones, it simply refuses to privilege them over what may be thought of as higher level environmental and social causes of behavior.

More recently, Sari van Anders, Jeffrey Steiger, and Katherine Goldey have put interactionist views to the test, investigating “gender→testosterone pathways, highlighting the…effects of socialization on human biology” (2015: 13805). Measuring changes in testosterone levels in men and women after “wielding power” in “gender-stereotypical ways”, they found that “wielding power significantly increased testosterone regardless of how it was done” (2015: 13807), at least in women. These results suggest that the linear-hormonal model is inadequate as sex-typical behaviors acquired through gender socialization (like competition and wielding power) “can contribute to variation in human testosterone levels” (2015: 13808).

Uniting many sex difference research programs is an assumption that gendered behavior is caused by differences between male and female brains. There is a long history of feminist engagement with biology that has been used to support determinist arguments involving differences in male and female brains, and the effects of sex hormones on the expression of behavioral traits. Much recent work in this area has come to be known as neurofeminism (though not everyone employs this moniker), which includes the feminist practice of neuroscience and feminist scholarship on neuroscience (Fine 2010; Bluhm et al. 2012; Schmitz & Höppner 2014; Rippon 2019). Neurofeminism, like other areas of feminist philosophy of biology, has both critical and constructive elements and includes research on the influence of gendered social values on neuroscience and ways that neuroscientific research reifies harmful gendered social values and structures.

Feminist interventions in brain science involve careful analysis of studies used to support determinist arguments. Bleier (1984), in classic work in this area, demonstrates the futility of separating nature from nurture, or in other words the structural and hormonal aspects of brain development from social learning and environmental influences on brain development. She points out that the fetal and postnatal development of the brain is highly influenced by environmental inputs, that humans are very good at learning, and that the human brain exhibits high levels of developmental plasticity. Plasticity remains an important area of neurofeminist research (Schmitz & Höppner 2014). Responding to the increasing number of studies since the 1980s and 90s showing the biology of the brain responding to cultural and social forces over the course of a person’s life, neurofeminists argue that notions of genetic or evolutionary neuroscientific determinism are untenable. For example, DesAutels (2015) argues that observed sex differences in judgments, behaviors, and traits are better explained by differences in the psychologies of people who are in oppressed or oppressing groups, rather than sex-based brain differences.

Feminist philosophers of biology, such as Bleier (1984) and Fausto-Sterling (1985 [1992]), reveal a series of problems with studies that purport to find sex differences in brain anatomy, brain lateralization, and hormones that are correlated with gender differences in behavioral traits and abilities. These critiques include pointing out that (1) for most of the behavioral traits in question there is more overlap than difference among populations of men and women, (2) these studies are often based on limited data and insufficient sample sizes, (3) these studies often involve unwarranted extrapolation from rodent models to humans, (4) there are complexities to the biological conversion of androgens to estrogens in the body that make it difficult to interpret in vivo experiments, and finally (5) there is a tendency to discount social causes of putative differences between the sexes (see also Fehr 2004). More recently Robyn Bluhm’s (2013a, 2013b) careful analysis of fMRI research on sex differences in the expression and control of human emotion reveals problematic methods, data, and evidential inferences in a research program strongly influenced by gender stereotypes.

The reductive, determinist, essentialist tendencies of sex difference research are nowhere more pronounced than in brain organization theory, which repeats the linear-hormonal model. Its central assumption is that the hormonal cascade, triggered by chromosome differences, that shape genitals into two distinct forms in utero also produces two types of brains—male and female—that produce distinct behaviors. In her book Brain Storm: The Flaws in the Science of Sex Difference (2010), Rebecca Jordan-Young examines the many shortcomings of this research program (see also Roy 2016 for critical analysis of the role of difference in neurofeminist research). Despite the sheer volume of studies purporting to find correlating sex differences at each of these levels, Jordan-Young’s careful and exhaustive analysis shows fundamental methodological and interpretive errors. For instance, a lack of consistency in the definition and operationalization of central concepts, such as sex-typical desire, means that results that initially appear to be mutually enforcing simply because they find some correlation between an atypical female hormonal profile and non-feminine sexual behavior (2010: 109–43) are clearly contradictory on closer examination.

Sexual minorities, especially those engaging in same-sex sexual behavior, are of particular interest in brain organization theory because their behaviors are assumed to be atypical for their sex, thus some genetic or hormonal factor is assumed to be the cause. Because intersex folks have atypical genitalia or atypical chromosomal and hormonal profiles affecting their development (see Fausto-Sterling 2000b for a useful overview of intersex conditions), they are also of particular interest. Catherine Clune-Taylor has shown how brain organization theory now shapes the standard treatments of people with intersex conditions (2019). She argues, “contemporary intersex management both reifies the normalcy of cisgendered life and materially constitutes it as such” (2019: 691).

Feminists are concerned with reductionism, determinism and essentialism, particularly in their application to the sex binary, because they have been used to deny and suppress human diversity, particularly sexual and gender diversity. Within our society, those types that are deemed to truly exist are frequently placed in a value hierarchy and their members are (at best) expected or (at worst) coerced to perform specific social roles and behave in certain ways, curtailing their freedom. Furthermore, treating sex and sexuality differences as determined by simple binary genetic mechanisms that determine simple binary hormonal mechanisms that determine brain function and ultimately behavior is taken to imply that many traits—from competitiveness, to sexual precocity, to color preferences—that might reasonably be assumed to be entirely culturally driven gender traits are biologically given sex traits. This seems to preclude the possibility of more just and equitable social arrangements on anything quicker than an evolutionary timescale, and probably not even then. Of course, it is not simply the fact that these reductionist, determinist, and essentialist assumptions are politically noxious that inspires feminist critique. They are also generally false. As John Dupré notes “The biological determinism associated with [sex and gender essentialism] is no longer scientifically defensible” (2021: 57). This is why they are also widely criticized by nonfeminist philosophers of biology, as exemplified by David Hull’s critique of reductionism (1972, 1974) (see the entry on reductionism in biology for a thorough review) or Paul Griffith’s critique of innateness and folk essentialism (2002).

3.2 Metaphor

There is significant feminist work on the role of gender-laden language, and in particular of metaphor, in biology. Evelyn Fox Keller has done significant work on “Master Molecule” characterizations of DNA (1983, 1985). She has also argued that cultural norms enter into evolutionary biology, particularly mathematical ecology, due to a slippage between technical and colloquial uses of the word “competition”, and that the language of reproductive autonomy supports a bias towards individualism in biology (Keller 1992b). Emily Martin (1991) and the Biology and Gender Study Group (1988) both have shown that romantic metaphors play a confounding role in biological descriptions of fertilization. In some cases, supporting false assumptions of female passivity, the egg is cast in the role of Sleeping Beauty that is awakened by the valiant sperm, which struggled to beat out its rivals and awaken the egg. In stories that acknowledge the activity of the egg, it is cast in the role of femme fatale, snagging the hapless sperm and dragging it into its clutches. Both sets of stories cohere with female stereotypes and neither of them clearly describes the reciprocal interactions between the egg and the sperm during reproduction.

4. Feminist Analyses of Particular Areas of Biological Research

This section focuses on two areas of biological research that have received extensive feminist analysis, sexual selection theory, and sociobiology/evolutionary psychology. These topics are of central importance in feminist philosophy of biology and illustrate many of the concepts discussed above.

4.1 Sexual Selection

Feminist interventions regarding evolutionary models of sexual selection are important for at least two reasons. First, the role of female organisms in evolution was generally neglected or misrepresented by biologists until the late twentieth century. Second, these models provide theoretical foundations for many biological accounts of human nature that support sexist and androcentric stereotypes, in particular accounts that portray women as passive and coy, and men as active and promiscuous.

4.1.1 What is sexual selection?

Evolution by natural selection happens when there are heritable differences among types of organisms in a population and, as a result of these differences, some types leave more offspring than others. This leads to changes in the frequencies of those different types of organisms in a population. Darwin described sexual selection in terms of “the advantage which certain individuals have over other individuals of the same sex and species, in exclusive relation to reproduction” (1871: vol. 1 256).

In other words, this advantage need not be one of physiological or mechanical efficiency or longevity, but rather concerns increasing reproductive potential. Darwin notes two kinds of sexual selection: male-male competition and female choice. This twofold characterization of sexual selection remains standard in current biological literature ranging from academic publications to textbooks to the popular press. Darwin writes that “the male is generally eager to pair with any female” whereas females tend to choose the most attractive partner (1874: 226). Darwin considered the competition among males “for the possession of the other sex” to result in the improvement of sensory and locomotory features and the development of strong passions (1872: 69).

This theme is carried through in his discussion in Sexual Selection in Relation to Man, in which hunting, defense of self and community, and competition for mates result in the development of men’s “observation, reason, invention or imagination” (1874: 564). Women obtain these traits because they inherit them from their fathers. Darwin writes that

It is, indeed, fortunate that the law of the equal transmission of characters to both sexes prevails with mammals; otherwise it is probable that man would have become as superior in mental endowment to women, as the peacock is in ornamental plumage to the peahen. (Darwin 1874: 565)

Whereas Darwin believed that male-male competition was generally thought to improve the species, female choice resulted in the development of beauty without utility:

a great number of male animals… have been rendered beautiful for beauty’s sake. (Darwin 1872: 161)

the most refined beauty may serve as a charm for the female, and for no other purpose. (Darwin 1871: vol. 2 92)

In this view, the expensive and dangerous displays of the peacock are the result of the preference of females for males with the most beautiful display. It is worth noting that Darwin developed his notions of female choice to account for traits that seemed to be maladaptive from the perspective of natural selection alone.

Several feminist scholars, most especially Ruth Hubbard (1990), have clearly pointed out the close parallels of Darwin’s account of eager males competing with one another for access to reticent and choosy females with Victorian gender values (see also, Fausto-Sterling 1985 [1992]). It is also noted that the activity of choice Darwin ascribed to females is caused by a female preoccupation with beauty and as such often has negative consequences for both male survival and the species itself. Nonetheless, feminists have revealed that Darwin was exceptional for theorizing that female choice in animals had any evolutionary consequences at all. For example, as Helena Cronin (1991) points out, Darwin’s contemporaries, especially Alfred Russell Wallace,

  1. were skeptical that females (with the exception of humans, Fichman 2004: 268–9) had an aesthetic sense,
  2. believed that if they did have one, it was unlikely to be stable enough to result in evolutionary change,
  3. believed that female choice, if it did exist, would be swamped out by natural selection, and finally
  4. believed that the excessive male displays were likely the result of the excess vigor possessed by male animals and not female choice.

Darwin’s theories of sexual selection and especially of female choice languished for nearly a century.

Contemporary thought regarding sexual selection is heavily influenced by the work of biologists Angus Bateman and Robert Trivers. Bateman (1948) hypothesized that variance in reproductive success would be greater among males than among females. Female reproduction is limited by the number of eggs a female produces and during a single reproductive cycle a female uses the sperm from one or a small number of copulations. According to Bateman’s view, once the female has garnered the sperm needed to fertilize her eggs, she does not benefit from further mating. As a result a female ought to be picky about who she mates with and since, according to the theory, sperm is never in short supply, all females are assumed to produce about the same number of offspring. Male reproduction, on the other hand, is limited by the number of females that a male can inseminate. A male becomes reproductively fit by inseminating as many females as possible. This results in competition among males for access to females, with some males mating with many females and some males mating with few or no females. Bateman conducted an experiment with fruit flies in which he found higher variance in male reproductive success than female reproductive success. (It should be noted that recently a failure to replicate Bateman’s findings and the identification of various methodological problems with the study have cast doubt on these findings [Tang-Martinez 2012].)

Trivers (1972) added considerations of parental care to Bateman’s argument. Trivers argues that females generally invest more than males in reproduction, not only in terms of creating large eggs, but also in the development and care of offspring. As a result, females ought to be even choosier regarding mates and become an even more limited resource for males. Again, it follows that males are motivated to mate with as many females as possible and females are motivated to resist male advances in the hope of choosing the best mate possible. This is correlated with and reinforces stereotypes of males as active, promiscuous, and competitive, and females as passive, coy, and nurturing. The rhetoric of the coy female and the promiscuous male is decreasing but is still common among many accounts of sexual selection.

Feminist philosophers of biology are deeply concerned about the wholesale application of this model of sexual selection without empirically testing its underlying assumptions and investigating the relationship between the underlying foundations of the model and cultural assumptions regarding gender. Whether or not it is intended to do so by researchers in the field, this model can offer support to current gender inequities. As Hubbard (1990: 110) points out,

from the seemingly innocent asymmetries between eggs and sperm flow such major social consequences as female fidelity, male promiscuity, women’s disproportional contribution to the care of children, and the unequal distribution of labour by sex.

This model also provides a basis for arguments that rape is an evolved reproductive strategy among human males (Thornhill & Palmer 2000). And E. O. Wilson (1978: 103) proposes that because of arguments based on this model even with identical education for men and women and equal access to all professions, men are likely to maintain disproportionate representation in political life, business, and science.

4.1.2 Feminist interventions

The traditional theoretical perspective on sexual selection described above is an elegant model. However, it relies on several assumptions in order to be applicable to actual cases. Hrdy (1986) has described three broad categories of assumptions needed to successfully apply this model to real situations. The first assumption is that male investment in the production of offspring is small relative to female investment. Ruth Hubbard (1990) points out that the challenge here is determining the appropriate way to characterize and measure investment. Eggs are larger than sperm. So, if one simply considers gamete size, male investment is smaller. However, males do not use a microscopic eyedropper to dispense one sperm at a time. Hubbard questions whether investment ought to be measured at the level of the individual gamete. When one includes the total amount of energy and resources that are need to produce sperm and semen, the energy required to develop and maintain secondary sexual characteristics (differences between the sexes that are not directly linked to the reproductive system), the costs of male-male competition, the costs that males of many species invest in defending a territory, and the effort that the males of some species put into parental care, male costs may turn out to be higher than researchers have historically expected. These male costs may be further increased if one measures them over an individual’s lifetime as opposed to a single reproductive event. It is important for researchers to justify their characterization of what counts as investment.

The second assumption is that there is greater variance in male than female reproductive success. While this is the case for many species, it is an empirical matter whether or not this applies to other species. In some species, variance in female reproductive success is higher than has been assumed and in some species, variance in male reproductive success is lower than is often assumed. Hrdy (1981 [1999], 1986) points out that there has been a lack of attention to ways that a female can end investment in a particular reproductive attempt, for example, female birds abandoning nests or spontaneous abortion among some species of mammals. Attention also needs to be paid to the effects of a female’s physiological condition and social status on her reproductive output. Hrdy demonstrates that female primates have an impressive array of active strategies that they employ to control their own reproduction. For example, competition and systems of social alliances among female primates can lead to unexpected variance in female reproductive success. Hubbard (1990) allows that theoretically there could be greater variance in reproductive success among men than among women, but claims that generally most societies have the same number of men and women producing children and do not operate using a few “super-studs”. Hubbard points out that it remains to be demonstrated that weaker men, however one would measure this characteristic, have fewer children than powerful men and that women tend to have similar numbers of children.

The final assumption is that the only evolutionary benefit of sex for females is fertilization. As Sterelny and Griffiths (1999) report, the power of the model decreases as the gap between sex and reproduction increases. Hrdy (1986), focusing on primatology, points out that once the notion of female promiscuity and the idea that there can be more reasons for mating than simply gathering sperm from one high quality male, were considered, several new hypotheses regarding the benefits of female promiscuity emerged. Some of these hypotheses are still linked to reproduction, although the picture is more complicated than issues of female choice and male competition. For example, the diverse paternity hypothesis predicts that in unpredictable and changing environments a female’s lifetime reproductive success can be improved by producing offspring with different fathers. Other hypotheses are not directly related to reproduction. Examples include the hypothesis that multiple matings and orgasms are physiologically beneficial to females and the hypothesis that females have sex with subordinate males to stop these males from leaving the social group. Hrdy writes that, “all but one of these hypotheses…were arrived at by considering the world from a female’s point of view” (1986: 127).

She points out that when this change in perspective was happening, primarily in the 1970s, there was an increase in the proportion of women primatologists and that these women were paying attention to female primates. She doubts that it is just chance that led women scientists to look at female behaviors, writing in 1986 that

it is disconcerting to note that primatologists are beginning to find politically motivated females and nurturing males at roughly the same time that a woman runs for vice president of the United States and Garry Trudeau starts to poke fun at “caring males” in his cartoons. (1986: 137)

More recent research on sexual selection has embraced a wider range of perspectives. In particular there is a growing body of feminist research on topics such as male mate choice, female-female competition, and the active female role in evolutionary reproductive conflicts between the sexes (see Hrdy 1981 [1999] and Gowaty 1992, 1997b). Joan Roughgarden offers an alternative to sexual selection, social selection theory, that focuses on the direct ecological benefits of social behavior, including animal mating behavior (2004, 2009). These ecological benefits refer to the ways that social interactions can improve the number of offspring that an individual can raise. This theory can account for the empirical evidence that has been used to support sexual selection. It does not treat same sex sexuality as anomalous because these social interactions can provide ecological benefits that support reproductive success. This theory is the subject of lively debate (e.g., Milam et al. 2011). Ornithologist Richard Prum (2017) has recently argued for a more Darwinian approach to sexual selection, highlighting the importance of the aesthetic and female choice, while questioning the mainstream orthodoxy that assumes that ornamental traits simply display good genes and emphasizing individual freedom and beauty as evolutionary drivers. Whether his account is successful or his critique of contemporary sexual selection theory is entirely fair has been up for debate (see, e.g., Patricelli, Hebets, & Mendelson 2019). Certainly, sexual selection theory is an active field of research, in which there is significant opportunity for further feminist analyses.

4.2 Sociobiology/Evolutionary Psychology

Broadly speaking, sociobiology, which arises out of work in population genetics, population ecology and ethology, is the evolutionary study of human and non-human social behavior. Sociobiologists postulate that some behaviors are traits, just like height or hair color, that are subject to evolution by natural selection. Ideally, to show that a behavior is an evolutionary adaptation, researchers must demonstrate that (1) the behavior is heritable, (2) there is or was behavioral variability among individuals in a population, and (3) that differential reproduction, caused by the presence of the behavior in question, led to an increase in the frequency of individuals tending to exhibit that behavior in a population. Since researchers cannot go back in time to directly observe the evolution of current behaviors, they most often rely on indirect evidence. Sociobiology is most often associated with E.O. Wilson, either his more general work exemplified in his book Sociobiology a New Synthesis (1975) or On Human Nature (1978), which focuses on human sociobiology. There is feminist work in sociobiology such as Sarah Hrdy’s work on mother-infant relations (1981 [1999], 1986).

Evolutionary psychology is sometimes described as psychology that is informed by evolutionary theory and sometimes described as the latest version of sociobiology. Evolutionary psychology differs from sociobiology in several respects. Instead of looking for adaptive explanations for particular behaviors, evolutionary psychologists develop adaptive hypotheses for psychological mechanisms that generate behaviors and tend to assume a modular theory of mind. Whereas there is incredible diversity of human behavior, many evolutionary psychologists postulate a smaller number of mechanisms or modules that are responsible for a range of behaviors. Much work in evolutionary psychology relies on evolutionary theoretical foundations and psychological empirical methods. Major themes in evolutionary psychological research include studies of social exchange (Cosmides 1989; Cosmides & Tooby 1992; Tooby & Cosmides 1992), family dynamics and conflict (including violence against stepchildren [Daly & Wilson 2005] and wives [M. Wilson & Daly 1998]), and human mate choice and sexual jealousy (Buss 1994 [2003], 2005).

There are two major feminist concerns with much sociobiological and evolutionary psychological research on sex and gender. First the research presents a picture of human nature that exhibits androcentric, sexist, and capitalist social values. Feminist philosophers of biology have been motivated to carefully analyze this research and have found significant methodological problems. For example, Elisabeth Lloyd (2003) reveals adaptationist assumptions, as well as failures to demonstrate heritability or the action of natural selection in evolutionary psychological accounts of sexual assault.

A second category of feminist concern regarding much research in sociobiology and evolutionary psychology involves problematic assumptions of a coarse causal connection between genes and behavior. These assumptions, coupled with the assertion that human behaviors are the result of natural selection, makes it seem as though, as Ruth Bleier (1984: 15) puts it, “we had best resign ourselves to the more unsavory aspects of human behavior”. The worry is that these studies of the evolution of human behavior cast behaviors such as violence against women, wives, and children, and the sexual division of labor as biologically determined, hence making attempts at social change seem futile.

For example, sociobiologist, David Barash writes,

There is good reason to believe that we are (genetically) primed to be much less sexually egalitarian than we appear to be (1979: 47)

and

Because men maximize their fitness differently from women, it is perfectly good biology that business and professions taste sweeter to them, while home and child care taste sweeter to women. (1979: 114)

When it comes to sex, sociobiologist E.O. Wilson writes,

It pays for males to be aggressive, hasty, fickle and undiscriminating. In theory it is more profitable for females to be coy, to hold back until they can identify males with the best genes… Human beings obey this biological principle faithfully. (1978: 125)

Feminist and non-feminist philosophers of biology have identified a range of problems common among much research in sociobiology and evolutionary psychology. (The list below is primarily drawn from Bleier 1984; see also Fausto-Sterling 1997, 2000a; Fausto-Sterling et al. 1997; Buller 2005; Kitcher 1985; and Sterelny & Griffiths 1999 offer good overviews and introductions to the non-feminist literature.) These problems include kinds of bias as well as methodological challenges.

  • Androcentrism. Historically female primates were studied only in their interactions with males or with infants. Women primatologists (see Haraway 1989) and sociobiologists (Hrdy 1986) who carefully observed females, as well as other members of primate groups, discovered new information that overthrew previously held beliefs regarding dominance hierarchies, mate selection, and female-female competition by focusing on female-female interactions.

  • Ethnocentrism. Much research on human behavior focuses on identifying and explaining behavioral traits that are universal among humans and have a cross-cultural meaning. For example, Buss argues that love is cross-cultural (1994 [2003]) and Margo Wilson and Martin Daly that marriage is cross-cultural (1992). However, human beings live in a wide variety of cultural and environmental contexts. John Dupré writes

    Anthropologists describe systems of marriage that are monogamous, polygamous, occasionally polyandrous, hypergamous or hypogamous (women marrying up or down although equal status is said to be the commonest case), between people of the same sex, and is some cases as not involving sexual relations at all. (2001: 59)

    This makes it difficult to imagine what the cross-cultural universal could be. It also makes it very easy to make false assumptions about the nature of such a phenomenon based on a particular cultural perspective.

  • Anthropocentrism. There is room for unrecognized or implicit social values to enter into research when researchers make comparisons among species. It is easy to create circular arguments when researchers use loaded terms, defined in the context of particular human language and culture, to describe animal behavior and then use those descriptions to argue that human behaviors are innate because they are found in animals. For example, it is common to refer to “harems” and “prostitution” when describing the behavior of non-human primates. There is an extensive literature on the evolution of rape, with rape being “observed” in flowers, scorpion flies, some species of fish and ducks, and then these observations are used to draw conclusions about the biological nature of rape in humans. An obvious problem is that rape in humans is defined as sex in the absence of consent or that is against the victim’s will. The same notion of consent or will in flowers, flies, fish, and ducks is absent.

  • Lack of attention to limitations inherent in studying humans. Human behavior is a fraught area of study. On one hand it is seductive because there is a deep interest in trying to understand why we behave as we do. One the other hand, if researchers are trying to understand social behavior in general, there is little to recommend human beings as experimental subjects. First, it is unethical to perform the necessary controlled experiments on humans. Furthermore, such experiments are impractical because we live too long for researchers to conveniently follow the development and evolutionary consequences of particular behavioral traits and tendencies. In addition, a common evolutionary investigative technique is to compare traits among closely related species. However as Sterelny and Griffiths (1999) point out, human beings are evolutionary orphans. Even though there are several species of non-human primates that are extensively studied, they are simply not as numerous, nor do they form as closely a related group of species with humans, as can be found in, for example, groups of social ant or bee species. Finally, human behavior is complicated by intentionality, language and culture, which make comparisons between human and non-human animals challenging. For example, refer back Martin’s (2003) critique of evolutionary explanations of rape. The notion of consent means something very different in a human as opposed to an animal context. As a result of limitations inherent to studying the evolution of human behavior, it is more challenging to draw conclusions about human behavior than about the behavior of many other groups of animals, and conclusions about human beings might need to be more tentative than conclusions about other organisms.

  • Lack of attention to changing environments. There is a lack of good information about the environment, including the social environment, in which humans evolved. We know that there are differences among the environments in which people currently live and between current environments and early human environments. Postulating evolutionary adaptations only makes sense in reference to a particular environment because adaptations are responses to particular environmental challenges. A behavior may be an adaptation to a past environment and not benefit individuals in a current environment. Alternatively, a behavior may benefit an individual without being the result of natural selection for that benefit. As a result, conclusions drawn about the evolution of human behavior need to be tentative.

  • Adaptationism (Failure to adequately consider causes of evolution other than natural selection). Causes of evolution other than natural selection must be tested. For example, even if there are behaviors that are correlated with specific genes it does not follow that the behavior is the result of natural selection and hence is an adaptation. Genes commonly have multiple effects and it is possible for natural selection to select for only one of those effects. In this case the other effect will increase in frequency in the population even though it is not selected for. A similar case can occur when two genes are linked on the same chromosome. In this way a behavior may be very common not because it confers an evolutionary advantage, but because it is associated with a different beneficial trait. Other causes of evolution include random drift, mutation, and immigration of individuals between populations. Recall that Elisabeth Lloyd identified adaptationism as a problem with Thornhill and Palmer’s arguments about the evolution of rape (2003) and most accounts of the evolution of the female orgasm (2005).

  • Lack of clear definitions of behavior. Behavioral traits need to be clearly defined. For example, it is postulated that males are naturally more aggressive than females. What counts as aggression is unclear. Is it going to war, or punching another individual, or having very active adrenal function? The appropriate grain of analysis is not clear. If one lives in a culture in which males are considered more aggressive than females, then one may notice the higher proportion of men rather than women who commit violent crimes and not notice cases of females fighting to defend their offspring or competing with each other for resources. The issue of defining traits is not only a matter of clarity. Ontology is at stake because for evolutionary hypotheses to explain what exists in the world, our definitions must divide up the world into traits that are passed from generation to generation and on which natural selection can act.

  • Problematic choice of comparison species. The data one can gather and the conclusions one can draw about human behavioral evolution from non-human primates are highly dependent on the primate species to which one attends. For example, in mid-twentieth century primatology researchers chose species for study, such as savanna baboons, which had social structures that seemed similar to humans. In the 1970s feminist primatologists were instrumental in convincing the scientific community that chimpanzees were a more appropriate species for modeling key transitions in human evolution. This switch in model organism was supported by molecular phylogenetic, comparative anatomical, and paleontological data, but it was also a strategic feminist move, as chimpanzees are matrifocal creatures with complex social lives. This facilitated a research focus on mothering, which was consistent with the focus on maternal thinking and social motherhood in that period of western feminism (Haraway 1989). There are at least two kinds of recommendations that arise here. First, if one is focusing on removing bias, then one should take care not to falsely generalize across the diversity that can be found among primate species (Hrdy 1986). Second, one needs to take responsibility for one’s choice of model organism, because it will have an impact on the kinds of knowledge that one can produce (Haraway 1989).

Evolutionary research regarding human behavior is especially difficult to do well. It is very easy to take an aspect of human social behavior that seems universal to a particular group of researchers, for example male aggression, and create a compelling but unsupported story about why that behavior enhances the survival and reproduction of individuals exhibiting it and hence “explains” why it is currently “universal”. In particular, there is little analysis of just what it is that makes these stories seem compelling or even plausible. It is important to note that these just-so stories predominantly support the social status quo and traditional Western, capitalist, patriarchal “virtues” ranging from a tendency to be entrepreneurial and the inevitability of hierarchical social arrangements, to the naturalness of male promiscuity and violence against women. Although some feminists are very pessimistic about the possibility of conducting non-sexist research on the evolution of human behavior, there is not a general view within feminist philosophy of biology that all sociobiological research is problematic. In fact, some feminist critics and scientists use non-sexist sociobiological research on non-human animals (for example the work of Sarah Hrdy) to critique problematic evolutionary accounts of gendered behavior.

Sexual selection and evolutionary accounts of behavior that relate to sex and gender are examples of two areas of science that have been treated to extensive analysis by feminist philosophers of biology.

5. Conclusion

There are at least three areas in which feminist philosophy of biology can be fruitfully developed. First, many topics are addressed by both feminist and non-feminist philosophers of biology, but there is often a paucity of interactions between these two bodies of literature. For example, reductionism is an important topic in both fields, and in both fields there is generally an anti-reductionist consensus, yet they rarely cite each others’ work (for exceptions see Dupré 1993, 2001 and Fehr 2004, 2012) and typically speak to one audience or the other, rather than addressing both. There is a wide range of anti-reductionist arguments on which feminists could draw and non-feminists can be aided by careful considerations of the social and political impact of reductionism. More interaction between feminist and non-feminist philosophers of biology could be mutually beneficial.

Second, there is room for further integrating feminist philosophy of biology with feminist epistemology and philosophy of science. Feminist philosophy of biology includes a vast body of literature documenting the impact of sexism and androcentrism in both the practice of biology and the knowledge produced by biologists. There are significant opportunities to further develop this work in light of advances in feminist and social epistemology (such as epistemologies of ignorance and epistemic injustice). Furthermore, current interest by historians in documenting the contributions of early feminist scholars would surely find a variety of fascinating stories and lessons through examining the lives and works of feminist biologists and philosophers of biology working in the 1970s to 1990s, particularly in relation to the science wars.

Third, there are opportunities to develop feminist analyses on a wide range of topics in the biological sciences. Some of these topics are perennial, such as research into sexual selection and sociobiology and evolutionary psychology, discussed above. Others are more of the moment. For instance, current interest in animal studies suggests that now may be a particularly productive time for feminist philosophers of biology, who are ever alert to the distorting effects of power structures and situatedness, to engage these conversations. A similar point might be made about the Gaia hypothesis (and perhaps ecology more generally), especially in light of catastrophic climate change and the imminent ecological collapse that it promises. Also, there are opportunities to develop feminist analyses of scientific research programs that are relatively new such as genomics, proteomics and other “omics” research programs as they relate to gender (see Keller 2000; S. Richardson 2013). Similarly, the scientifically rigorous and politically astute approaches of feminist philosophers of biology are clearly needed as “sex-based biology” comes to inform new trends in the medical sciences, such as precision medicine (DiMarco, Zhao, Boulicault & Richardson 2022). The use of AI in biological research and research bridging biology and fields such as computer science, engineering, and physics cries out for intersectional feminist analysis as in all of these areas of investigation there is room to ask questions about the role of interests and power in the construction and use of knowledge as well as other epistemic questions rooted in recent work in feminist epistemology and feminist philosophy of science.

There are many ways to chart the boundaries of feminist philosophy of biology. While feminist philosophy of biology continues to advance by engaging new areas of biological research and developing new research approaches several themes (such as explanatory pluralism, the rejection of reductionist, determinist and essentialist explanations, and an appreciation of the complex ways that values enter the sciences) remain central to the field. It is striking that nonfeminist philosophy of biology has increasingly come to agree with these positions long held by feminists.

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Other Internet Resources

  • GenderSci Lab, founded by Sarah Richardson.
  • Van Anders Lab, social neuroendocrinology, feminist science, sexuality, gender/sex, sexual diversity.

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