George Eliot

First published Mon Apr 28, 2025

The work of George Eliot (1819–1880) challenges any strong disjunction between philosophy and art. Her deepest philosophical interests were in ethics, aesthetics, and the relation between them. Indebted above all to Spinozism and Romanticism, she developed her thinking in sustained dialogue with the European philosophical tradition, both before and after she began to write fiction under the pseudonym “George Eliot” in 1857. She wrote novels, shorter stories, poetry, and review essays, and throughout her career she experimented with literary form. Through her bestselling novels, her engagements with philosophy and with contemporary questions about morality, art, politics, feminism, religion and science reached wide readerships.

1. Life and Works

George Eliot was born Mary Anne Evans on November 22, 1819. (Despite several changes of name over the course of her life, she will be referred to as “George Eliot” or “Eliot” throughout this entry.) She grew up in modest circumstances in rural Warwickshire, England. No one in her family received a university education, but she had access to an extensive library at Arbury Hall, the estate managed by her father. After learning French at school, she taught herself German, Latin, Greek, and, later in life, Hebrew. Her family were conservative Anglicans; in her youth Evans passed through a devout phase, then went on to question and criticize Christianity.

Eliot’s first scholarly work, a translation of D. F. Strauss’s Life of Jesus Critically Examined, was published in 1846. In translating this controversial work, Eliot was following in the footsteps of Samuel Taylor Coleridge and Thomas Carlyle, who had produced English translations of important German works (by Schiller and Goethe respectively) during the first decades of the nineteenth century. Eliot was thus positioning herself as a modern woman of letters, within this broadly Romantic and Germanic intellectual movements (Ashton 1980; Newton 1981; Carlisle 2025).

In 1850 Eliot moved to London, adopted the name Marian Evans, and became de facto editor of The Westminster Review, a high-brow radical journal founded in 1824 by Jeremy Bentham and edited by John Stuart Mill from 1836 to 1840. Eliot was not the first female editor of a periodical, but she was the first women to be closely involved with such a prestigious quarterly journal (Dillane 2011). She co-edited The Westminster Review with the publisher John Chapman, who acquired it in 1851. In their “Prospectus”, printed in their first issue of January 1852, Chapman and Eliot highlighted the journal’s special interest in “Social Philosophy”; its commitment to free speech and “Progress”; and its support for gradual reform, including “a progressive extension of the suffrage, in proportion as the people become fitted for using it”. On religious questions, the editors declared their “uncompromising pursuit of truth” and their “conviction that religion has its foundation in man’s nature”, while recognizing religion to be closely connected to “moral”, “poetic”, and “emotional” development (Chapman & Eliot 1852). This progressive editorial agenda somewhat softened the radical politics and secularism of the Westminster Review under Bentham and Mill. A more significant difference was its greater emphasis on new and recent literary works (Gray 2000; Dillane 2011). The issues co-edited by Eliot and Chapman carried substantial articles on contemporary literature in England, America, Germany, and France, propagating the very concept of a national literature. Eliot also oversaw innovations in the journal’s design and layout, including the addition of a substantial index.

As editor at the Westminster Review, Eliot entered a network of influential intellectuals including J. S. Mill, Herbert Spencer, Harriet Martineau, James Froude, and George Henry Lewes. Lewes became her long-term partner and collaborator. In the late 1850s she took on the name “Marian Lewes”, though Lewes remained legally married to his estranged wife Agnes Lewes. Their relationship was widely regarded as scandalous, and ruined Eliot’s reputation. For years she was socially ostracized. While this changed when she became a celebrated author, the reputational damage from her partnership with Lewes continued to affect her life, work, and public image.

During the 1850s Eliot produced the first English translations of Ludwig Feuerbach’s On the Essence of Christianity (1854) and Spinoza’s Ethics (1856, but unpublished in her lifetime). Feuerbach, like Strauss, was a liberal German Protestant influenced by the German Idealists, especially Hegel; a reviewer of Eliot’s translation of The Essence of Christianity criticized the way it “exhibit[ed] the new Hegelian Atheism to English readers” (Anonymous 1854: 559). Eliot admired Feuerbach’s ideas, and planned to publish an original essay titled “On the Idea of a Future Life”, advertised in the Westminster Review as forthcoming by the translator of Feuerbach. This lost essay may have resembled The Essence of Christianity in being a philosophical-theological treatise aimed at a broad cultured readership, and in applying Feuerbachian insights to the question of human immortality. Framing her professional identity as the translator of Strauss and Feuerbach suggests a plan to contribute in her own voice to the religious and philosophical debates carried out by these German thinkers.

In translating Spinoza, Eliot was going back to the most significant source of her intellectual milieu. Spinoza’s non-dualist metaphysics was a foundation for German Romanticism and Idealism alike, and thus formative for Strauss and Feuerbach. Although Eliot’s translation of the Ethics remained unpublished and therefore did not have the cultural impact it deserved, its effect on her own intellectual formation was both immediate and enduring. Its influence is evident on her Westminster Review essays on the popular Calvinist preacher John Cumming (Carlisle 2020a: 22–26) and on Wilhelm Riehl’s The Natural History of German Life (Carlisle 2020b: 601–4). These substantial, authoritative, wide-ranging essays, marking the culmination of Eliot’s journalistic career, were both written during her immersion in Spinoza. Scholars have traced through the novels of George Eliot Spinozist ideas about freedom and determinism, emotion, human flourishing, and the work of imagination (Atkins 1978; Lynn 1996, Armstrong 2013; Gatens 2003, 2007, 2023; Frazer 2018; Anger 2001 [2019]). Towards the end of her career, Eliot would examine questions about literary labour—scholarship, originality, appropriation, productivity, cultural transmission—and about the nature of Englishness that first arose during her generative period as a translator (Raterman 2013; Carlisle 2025).

The pseudonym “George Eliot” was first adopted in 1857, a few weeks after Eliot published her first work of fiction in Blackwood’s Magazine. This debut was the first of three magazine stories, subsequently published together as Scenes of Clerical Life (1858). Eliot wrote seven novels: Adam Bede (1859), The Mill on the Floss (1860), Silas Marner (1861), Romola (1863), Felix Holt: The Radical (1866), Middlemarch (1871–2), and Daniel Deronda (1876). Her last published work was a semi-fictional, satirical and intensely ironic essay collection titled Impressions of Theophrastus Such (1879), after the Peripatetic philosopher Theophrastus. Eliot’s other works include the novellas The Lifted Veil (1859) and Brother Jacob (1864); the verse dramas The Spanish Gypsy (1868) and Armgart (1870); The Legend of Jubal and Other Poems (1874); and numerous critical essays that were published, mostly anonymously, throughout the 1840s, 50s and 60s.

During the 1850s and 60s Eliot and Lewes travelled quite frequently to the European continent, especially the major cities of Germany and Italy. The couple did not have children, though Eliot was stepmother to Lewes’s three sons. Lewes died in 1878, and in the spring of 1880 Eliot married her old friend John Cross, a wealthy banker. She died in London on December 22, 1880. She was buried under the names “Mary Ann Cross” and “George Eliot” in North London’s Highgate Cemetery, next to Lewes’s grave. Her wish to be buried in Poet’s Corner in Westminster Abbey was denied by church leaders due to her “notorious antagonism to Christian practice in regard to marriage” (Carlisle 2023: 267–8).

While Eliot usually described herself as an artist, many contemporaries regarded her as a philosopher. A few months after her death, an early volume of MIND carried a substantial article on “George Eliot’s Art” (Sully 1881). During the twentieth century, her exploratory intellectual style, coupled with her decision to work in the medium of fiction, tended to occlude her significance for an increasingly professionalized and technical discipline of philosophy. Twenty-first-century scholars have been more keen to recognize Eliot’s contributions to philosophy, especially in view of the fact that Victorian women had to philosophize outside the academy. While British universities did not begin to admit women until the 1860s and restricted their access to higher qualifications and academic careers well into the twentieth century, philosophical thinking can be found in a wide variety of women’s writing, including letters, poems, novels, travel writing, memoir, and journalism (Stone 2023).

2. Philosophical Method

Eliot’s literary practice was integral to her philosophical method. Her style of thinking is often exploratory and dialectical, reflexive and self-problematizing. When doctrinal statements are made by a character or a narrator, we cannot assume they articulate Eliot’s own position. For these reasons, her philosophical claims can be difficult to pin down. Moreover, she argued against the application of “general doctrine[s]” (M III: 133) and “general rules” (MF III: 265) to the complexities of human life. Eliot aimed less to solve problems, or offer ready-made doctrines, than to undertake an open-ended enquiry alongside her readers. In 1870, while writing her masterpiece Middlemarch, she stated that “I don’t consider myself a teacher, but a companion in the struggle for thought” (Eliot to Mary Ponsonby, 11 February 1875; LGHL 3: 83).

Language was Eliot’s medium for this intellectual “struggle”, and one highly distinctive feature of her thought is the depth and breadth of her linguistic expertise. She was not only an immensely skilled literary writer, but a scholar of languages and a translator. Linguistic precision had enduring importance for Eliot: in an 1865 book review she laments

a fatiguing use of vague or shifting phrases, such as “modern civilization”, “spirit of the age”,…“habits of religious thought”, unbalanced by any precise definition. (Eliot 1865: 54)

Yet precision, she observes, is always endangered by the subtleties, ambiguities and multivalences inherent in all natural languages. While some of her contemporaries—rather like modern analytic philosophers—sought to rectify this by constructing “a universal language on a rational basis…which effects the purpose of communication as perfectly and rapidly as algebraic signs”, Eliot argues that such a language “will never express life, which is a great deal more than science” (Eliot 1856b: 69). Furthermore, a purely logical language would lack all “power over the imagination” (Eliot 1856b: 69). Achieving truthfulness in writing therefore requires a literary skill close to “genius” to employ natural language with sufficient “definiteness and certainty” (Eliot 1856b: 69).

Eliot created remarkably sophisticated literary works, and their full philosophical value cannot be appreciated separately from their aesthetic features. An excessive focus on the explicit philosophical pronouncements made by Eliot’s narrators, by her characters, or by Eliot herself, could give rise to the worry that assertions are being made without argument. Considered more holistically, her texts challenge the narrow definition of argument that underpins this concern.

3. The Human Condition: Key Concepts

3.1 Character

As a creator of characters, Eliot confronted questions about the nature and significance of character throughout her literary career. In this way she contributed to wider philosophical debates: in 1843 John Stuart Mill proposed an “Exact Science of Human Nature” which would be a “science of character…including the formation of national or collective character as well as individual” (Mill 1843: bk. VI, ch. V, §4 [1889: 567]). Mill named this new science “Ethology”, thus placing it within an Aristotelian tradition of moral philosophy focused on the cluster of concepts—character, custom, habit, and way of life—signalled by the Greek word ethos. Eliot invokes this tradition explicitly by naming the narrator of her final work after Theophrastus, pupil of Aristotle and author of The Characters (Henry 1994; Brilmyer 2014). The working title of Impressions of Theophrastus Such was “Characters and Characteristics of Theophrastus Such”.

The concept of character was Eliot’s route into metaphysical questions of freedom and determinism (G. Levine 1962; Brilmyer 2015). At stake in nineteenth-century debates about character was a dispute between biological determinists and defenders of a liberal doctrine of collective and individual moral improvement. Though influenced by the strict determinism she encountered while translating Spinoza’s Ethics, Eliot refuses the polarities of this debate and probes its complexities. Her art emphasizes social over biological constraints, and inter-dependence over both determinism and free will. Its explorations of habit and custom—laws that, to borrow Leibniz’s opportune phrase, “incline without necessitating” (Look 2008 [2022: § 4])—open up a middle path through these alternatives. In “The Natural History of German Life”, an 1856 review of two works by the German sociologist Wilhelm Riehl, Eliot notes “the generic character of the German peasant” for whom “custom” is the “supreme law” (Eliot 1856b: 68; Dillane 2009).

Silas Marner begins with a dismal vision of the mechanization of human character in an industrial age. Silas, a weaver, has degenerated into a biological-mechanical hybrid, “shrunk” and “bent” into “a constant mechanical relation to the objects of his life”:

The livelong day he sat in his loom, his ear filled with its monotony, his eyes bent close down on the slow growth of sameness in the brownish web, his muscles moving with such even repetition that their pause seemed almost as much a constraint as the holding of his breath. (SM 29–31)

Over the course of the novel, Silas is re-humanized by the love of an adopted daughter and new friendships with his neighbours. However, this story’s fable-like literary form strikes a warning that its hero’s happy ending is due to quasi-miraculous good fortune, not a freely-willed programme of self-improvement.

In Middlemarch, Eliot’s narrator observes that character is “a process and an unfolding” (M I: 226). The novel’s plot and literary form emphasize the dependence of this character “process” on social more than biological conditions. Its narrator inclines towards social determinism by claiming that “There is no creature whose inward being is so strong that it is not greatly determined by what lies outside it” (M III: 464; cf. Spinoza, Ethics IVp18s: “we can never bring ourselves to a state in which we should want nothing external in order to preserve our existence”). In keeping with its title, however, Middlemarch steers a middle course between determinism and free will, while drawing on biological metaphors (Brilmyer 2015). In one scene, Reverend Farebrother advises the novel’s heroine, Dorothea Brooke, that

character is not cut in marble—it is not something solid and unalterable. It is something living and changing, and may become diseased as our bodies do;

“then it may be rescued and healed”, replies Dorothea (M III: 310). Yet any moral healing accomplished over the course of the novel is, at best, partial.

3.2 The Milieu

Like character, the milieu is a crucial concept in Eliot’s art. In the early decades of the nineteenth century this concept emerged, within the new science of biology, to draw attention to the relations between an organism and its surrounding conditions of existence. Lamarck’s les circonstances and Geoffroy Saint-Hilaire’s le milieu ambiant preceded Auguste Comte’s use of le milieu in 1838, evoking “a certain intuition of a centred formation” (Canguilhem 2001: 11). Another new science, “sociology”, stretched the concept to encompass cultural as well as natural conditions of life. In the early 1850s, Eliot urged Herbert Spencer to read Comte’s Cours de philosophie positive; Spencer then developed Comte’s concept of milieu, proposing “environment” as a single term naming biological and social circumstances. His thesis that organisms are constantly adjusting to their environment anticipated the theory of adaptation presented in Darwin’s Origin of Species.

For Eliot—unlike Spencer—science provides a model or analogy rather than a method for the investigation of human life.

In natural science, I have understood, there is nothing petty to the mind that has a large vision of relations, and to which every single object suggests a vast sum of conditions. It is surely the same with the observation of human life,

declares the urbane narrator of The Mill on the Floss (MF II: 151). Eliot sees human lives as “interwoven”, and construes the novelist’s task as “unravelling” a complex web of relations to reveal the interconnectedness of all things (M I: 214). At the same time, her artistic process entailed creating intricate literary webs; of her last novel, Daniel Deronda, she wrote that “I meant everything in the book to be related to everything else there” (Eliot to Barbara Bodichon, 2 October 1876; Letters 6: 290).

In his 1881 MIND article on “George Eliot’s Art”, James Sully highlights Eliot’s deployment of the concept of milieu:

A character divorced from its surroundings is an abstraction. A personality is only a concrete living whole when we attach it by a network of organic filaments to its particular environment, physical and social… [Eliot] looks on these [surroundings] as having a living continuity with the people whom she sets among them. Their artistic value is but a reflection of all that they mean to those for whom they have made the nearer and habitually enclosing world. (Sully 1881: 382–3)

Both the natural milieu and the social milieu are important subject-matter in Eliot’s art. Her attitude towards the social “world” or “medium” (as she sometimes translates milieu) is profoundly ambivalent. A tight-knit provincial milieu provides a nexus of meaning and belonging—in short, a home; it can also be overwhelming and constrictive. Ambitious, idealistic Dr Lydgate, for example, finds that “the petty medium of Middlemarch had been too strong for him” (M I: 285). Yet a more cosmopolitan milieu risks dislocating human lives from their habitat. “A human life, I think, should be well rooted in some spot of a native land”, opines the narrator of Daniel Deronda, and several characters in this novel’s modern setting suffer from the lack of “this blessed persistence in which affection can take root” (DD I: 26–7).

In 1868, while working on Middlemarch, Eliot condensed her thoughts on the milieu in a short unpublished essay titled “Notes on Form in Art”. Here she defines form as “a limit determined partly by the intrinsic relations or composition of the object, and partly by the extrinsic action of other bodies upon it” (Eliot 1868 [1963: 434]). The formation of an artwork mirrors the formation of character insofar as it unfolds within an aesthetic and ethical milieu: “in adjustment with certain given conditions of sound, language, action, or environment”. Emphasizing relationality and interdependence, she elucidates a Spinozist

conception of wholes composed of parts more and more multiplied and highly differenced, yet more and more absolutely bound together by various conditions of common likeness or mutual dependence. (Eliot 1868 [1963: 433])

Following Spinoza, she suggests that complexity corresponds to power; again, she seems to apply this principle to artworks as much as to organic wholes. When Eliot writes that

the highest Form, then, is the highest organism, [i.e.] the most varied group of relations bound together in a wholeness which again has the most varied relations with all other phenomena. (Eliot 1868 [1963: 433])

she articulates the ideal of literary form that guides her mature fiction. Eliot’s novels, above all Middlemarch and Daniel Deronda, depict the intricate connectedness of ecological, biological, social, political and psychological forces, often by constructing analogical relations between multiple characters and events (Mansell 1965a; Carlisle 2020b).

3.3 Self-Centredness

Selfishness is the most basic moral problem confronted in Eliot’s work. It is closely connected with her concept of the milieu, according to which every organism is, by definition, in the middle of its environment. On a psychological level, when human beings locate themselves at the centre of a world, their self-centring involves a failure to attend to others’ subjectivity. This failure is epistemic as well as moral; Middlemarch’s narrator declares that “We are all of us born in moral stupidity, taking the world as an udder to feed our supreme selves” (M I: 323). Eliot illustrates this claim by describing how Dorothea, a young wife, struggles to “conceive with that distinctness which is no longer reflection but feeling” that her husband has “an equivalent centre of self, whence the lights and shadows must always fall with a certain difference” (M I: 323).

In another key passage, the image of “concentric circles” around a “centre” evokes Eliot’s concept of milieu, while functioning more explicitly as a symbol of human egoism:

An eminent philosopher among my friends…has shown me this pregnant little fact. Your pier-glass or extensive surface of polished steel made to be rubbed by a house maid, will be minutely and multitudinously scratched in all directions; but place now against it a lighted candle as a centre of illumination, and lo! the scratches will seem to arrange themselves in a fine series of concentric circles round that little sun. It is demonstrable that the scratches are going everywhere impartially, and it is only your candle which produces the flattering illusion of a concentric arrangement, its light falling with an exclusive optical selection. These things are a parable. The scratches are events, and the candle is the egoism of any person now absent — of Miss Vincy, for example. (M I: 403; Albrecht 2020: 59–88)

Eliot’s moral critique of egoism always involves self-critique. Interestingly, she saw this ordinary human egoism mirrored in her artistic work: “But what is fiction other than an arrangement of events or feigned correspondences according to predominant feeling? …we make what pleases us” (Eliot 1868 [1963: 434]; Albrecht 2020: 68–75).

3.4 Triviality and significance

A persistent theme in Eliot’s work is the contrast, within human life, between significance and insignificance—and the unsettling of this distinction. Consider the rather conventional insight expressed here in a letter to a friend, written when Eliot was in her mid thirties:

When we are young we think our troubles a mighty business—that the world is spread out expressly as a stage for the particular drama of our lives… I have done enough of that in my time. But we begin at last to understand that these things are important only to one’s own consciousness, which is but a globule of dew on a rose-leaf that at mid-day there will be no trace of. (Eliot to Cara Bray, 19 May 1854; Letters 2: 156)

Eliot’s novels frequently dramatize the inflated self-importance described in the first part of this quotation. However, they also subvert conventional judgements about relative importance and triviality.

The “great man” theory of history, prominent among Eliot’s contemporaries, epitomizes those conventional judgements. Notable examples (all of whom Eliot read closely) are Thomas Carlyle’s On Heroes, Hero-Worship, and the Heroic in History (1841); Auguste Comte’s positivist calendar (1849), with its thirteen lunar months named after eminent men such as Aristotle and Descartes; and Ralph Waldo Emerson’s Representative Men (1850). By contrast, Eliot placed obscure, mediocre lives at the centre of her fictional worlds. Middlemarch in particular directly challenges the “great man” paradigm by invoking a feminine exemplar, Saint Theresa, and by refracting her exemplarity through Dorothea Brooke’s “unhistoric” life (M III: 465).

Eliot achieves these effects through narrative irony. Early in Middlemarch, the reader is encouraged to laugh at Dorothea’s grandiose aspirations.

There would be nothing trivial about our lives. Every-day things with us would mean the greatest things. It would be like marrying Pascal… I should see how it was possible to live a grand life here—now—in England,

thinks Dorothea, as she contemplates marriage to Edward Casaubon, a petty-minded amateur scholar (M I: 40). Yet Eliot attributes an unseen moral grandeur to Dorothea’s struggles to live a good life, and (ironically) discloses this to the reader.

Eliot is not only concerned with rethinking the question of who might count as significant, and morally exemplary. She is also occupied by the tension between the intense significance we accord to our own lives and the lives of those close to us, and their comic insignificance sub specie aeternitatis. This theme is prominent in Middlemarch and is further intensified in Daniel Deronda, which features a quintessentially trivial heroine, Gwendolen Harleth, who is preoccupied with her “small inferences of the way in which she could make her life pleasant” (DD I: 181). Gwendolen cuts a tiny figure in a novel set on the grand stage of world history, and at the enlarged scales of modern astronomy and ancient cosmology.

What in the midst of that mighty drama are girls and their blind visions? Could there be a slenderer, more insignificant thread in human history than this consciousness of a girl…?

asks the narrator (DD I: 181). This proves to be an ironic question, as Eliot uses Gwendolen’s marriage plot to stage a cosmic struggle between good and evil, drawing on the Kabbalistic myth of a human soul’s arduous journey to its divine source (Baker 1973; Carlisle 2023: 217–19, 340–42).

3.5 Thought and feeling

The words “thought” and “feeling”, “think and feel”, frequently appear conjoined in Eliot’s writing. Her novels treat the integration of thought and feeling as an intellectual-affective ideal constitutive of human flourishing (which she tends to construe in terms of psychic and moral growth).

This element of Eliot’s thought is influenced by her close study of both Spinoza and Comte during the 1850s (Gatens 2019). Spinoza’s Ethics devotes one of its five parts to an analysis of human emotions that treats them as universal and fully intelligible, comparable to the objects of geometry (Ethics III, Preface). Spinoza argues that both the imagination and the affects can be trained, though not eliminated, by the power of understanding. He regards the highest kind of knowing as intuitive, and distinguished by the immediacy of feeling:

we feel [sentimus], we experience, that we are eternal. For the mind no less feels [sentit] those things which it conceives by the understanding, than those which it has in the memory. (Ethics Vp23s)

According to Eliot’s interpretation of the Ethics, such intellectual feeling is continuous with emotional feeling: she consistently introduces the verb “to feel” into her translations of Spinoza’s discussions of the emotions. In his late work The System of Positive Polity (1855) Comte postulates a “unity” and “harmony” of human being comprising “a complete convergence both of the Feelings and of the Thoughts”; “the continuous union of the two principal elements, affective and speculative” (Comte 1875: 16–17). For Comte, these elements are gendered female and male respectively, and their balance within society turns out to require women to devote themselves to domesticity and “surrender all claim to temporal authority”, even within the home (Comte 1875: 302). In 1875, when the English translation of The System of Positive Polity was published, Eliot took detailed notes on Comte’s account of the relationship between emotion and knowledge (Wright 1986: 173–201; Anger 2001 [2019: 223]).

Eliot suggests that knowledge pertaining to human life, particularly in its experiential and moral dimensions, is deficient if it lacks feeling. She went so far as to claim that her friend Herbert Spencer’s philosophical work—“his theorising, & his mode of pursuing arguments”—was “injuriously affected” by his “inadequate endowment of emotion” (Eliot to Mary Ponsonby, 11 February 1875; LGHL 3: 83). By contrast, the artist (see §4.3) can be a conduit or medium between thought and feeling. In Middlemarch, Will Ladislaw defines “the poet” as someone possessing “a soul in which knowledge passes instantaneously into feeling, and feeling flashes back as a new organ of knowledge” (M I: 341–2).

Since feeling is essentially first-personal, its importance for Eliot is a cause for scepticism about knowledge of other human minds, which differ in their character as well as in their experiential contents. Eliot regards this as a practical difficulty that is not easily solved. Theoretically, her solution is the concept of sympathy (see §5.2), literally “feeling-with”. Sympathy extends affective knowing from the first-person singular to the first-person plural. In one of Middlemarch’s closing scenes, the heroine Dorothea tells her sister Celia that “You would have to feel with me, else you would never know” (M III: 442). This proposition can be read in a doubled semantic context: Dorothea’s communication with her sister on a particular question (how she got together with Will Ladislaw); and Eliot’s communication with her reader on a much broader philosophical question about the possibility of an adequate interpersonal knowledge that can underpin ethics.

4. Philosophy of Art

Eliot developed her philosophy of art first as a critic and then as a practitioner. She construed her turn to fiction writing in the 1850s as the discovery of her artistic vocation, and consistently described herself as an artist. Taking a self-problematizing view of the moral purposes of literature, Eliot reflected critically on the ethics of sympathy dramatized in her fiction and exemplified in her narrative voice.

4.1 Realism

Eliot diagnosed and criticized other-worldliness in art, as in religion: an aversion to life as it is (Eliot 1857). But what does it mean for art to be true to life? Eliot’s answer to this question draws on John Ruskin’s analysis of visual art to defend “realism”, defined as

the doctrine that all truth and beauty are to be attained by a humble and faithful study of nature, and not by substituting vague forms, bred by imagination on the mists of feeling, in place of definite, substantial reality. (Eliot 1856a: 626; Henry & Levine 2019)

This realism is qualified in two important respects. First, while Eliot here uses “imagination” and “feeling” pejoratively, she elsewhere uses these terms much more positively and does not usually oppose them to reality or truth. Explaining her own artistic purpose in 1859, she wrote that

If Art does not enlarge men’s sympathies, it does nothing morally… the only effect I ardently long to produce by my writings, is that those who read them should be better able to imagine and to feel the pains and the joys of those who differ from themselves in everything but the broad fact of being struggling erring human creatures. (Letters 3: 111; emphasis in original)

Second, realism for Eliot (as for Ruskin) always entails interpretation. She regards art as “inevitably subjective” even when it attempts to be “purely imitative”: “the most active perception gives us rather a reflex of what we think and feel, than the real sum of the objects before us” (Eliot 1855a: 703). She suggests, via the narrator of Adam Bede, that in order to “avoid any…arbitrary picture” of life, the artist should give a “faithful…account of men and things as they have mirrored themselves in [his] mind” (AB I: 265; Mansell 1965b).

So Eliot holds that truth in art is necessarily mediated by the artist’s subjectivity. She characterizes that subjectivity by the self-complicating metaphor of a mirror that is “defective”, possibly distorting. On this view, the artist may be unable to perceive accurately things as they are, yet must strive for honesty about what they do see. Thus Eliot casts doubt on epistemic truth while urging moral truthfulness:

the mirror is doubtless defective; the outlines will sometimes be disturbed, the reflection faint or confused; but I feel as much bound to tell you as precisely as I can what that reflection is, as if I were in the witness-box narrating my experience on oath. (AB I: 265–6; Albrecht 2020: 30–58)

The courtroom simile here accentuates realism’s moral seriousness. This passage also indicates that realism’s commitment to truthfulness entails careful attention to linguistic precision (see §2).

4.2 The purposes of art

Eliot wrote in hope of literary communion with her readers. She construes this communion as both affective and intellectual. “What one’s soul thirsts for”, she wrote in 1873,

is…that what one meant has been perfectly seized, that the emotion which stirred one in writing is repeated in the mind of the reader. (Letters 5: 374)

The narrator of her very first story hopes that the reader will “learn with me to see” the wide range of affective experience that normally remains concealed within an ordinary “human soul” (SCL 67).

Her aesthetic realism has a clear moral purpose. It means endeavouring to depict human beings not as they ought to be, but as they are, since real human beings are the objects of our moral concern. In “The Natural History of German Life”, her programmatic 1856 review essay, Eliot asserts that

A picture of human life such that a great artist can give, surprises even the trivial and the selfish into that attention to what is apart from themselves, which may be called the raw material of moral sentiment. [Art] is a mode of amplifying experience and extending our contact with our fellow-men beyond the bounds of our personal lot. (Eliot 1856b: 54; see also Letters 3: 111; 4: 472)

This commitment is sharply inflected by class consciousness: Eliot seeks to rectify how working-class people, such as labourers and shopkeepers, are customarily judged by readers implicitly assumed to belong to a higher social class. She argues that

the thing for mankind to know is, not what are the motives and influences which the moralist thinks ought to act on the laborer or the artisan, but what are the motives and influences which do act on him. We want to be taught to feel, not for the heroic artisan or the sentimental peasant, but for the peasant in all his coarse apathy, and the artisan in all his suspicious selfishness. (Eliot 1856b: 54–5)

Eliot claims that artists offer new knowledge, insofar as art extends the range of our perceptions—not least by channelling attention to phenomena that have been veiled by habit, or by self-centred preoccupations. In “The Natural History of German Life”, this aesthetic cognitivism is underpinned by an account of imaginative, associative thinking drawn from Part 2 of Spinoza’s Ethics (Ethics IIp18). Eliot observes how a certain word (her example is “railways”) evokes in the mind of an ordinary person a limited “range of images” representing that person’s particular experiential history, whereas in the mind of an expert the same word will evoke a much fuller knowledge, comprising “all the essential facts in the existence and relations of the thing” (Eliot 1856b: 51–2). She argues that such a complete knowledge of the working classes can be gained by studying “their natural history”, and can be articulated by artists as well as by theorists. The distinction between “narrow” and “wide” mental capacities recurs continually in Eliot’s novels, marking a moral as well as a cognitive divide. The “Natural History” essay qualifies this distinction by suggesting that wide views must be matched by wide “observation” that yields “concrete knowledge” of particulars (Eliot 1856b: 51–2, 56). Wide views alone are not just insufficient, but potentially pernicious. They may produce a character such as Middlemarch’s Mr Brooke, whose mental openness is mere vacuity, just as his tolerance amounts to little more than neglect of his moral responsibilities, not least for his poor tenants who live in squalid conditions (Carlisle 2020b).

Like her realism, Eliot’s view of the purpose of art is self-complicating. Despite the strong cognitivist strand theorized in her critical writings and pursued in her fiction, Eliot also valued epistemic humility. She expressed the hope that her own art might instil this epistemic virtue.

I only wish I could write something that would contribute to heighten men’s reverence before the secrets of each other’s souls, that there might be less assumption of entire knowingness, as a datum from which inferences are to be drawn

she wrote to a friend in 1859 (Letters 3: 164).

4.3 The artist

The influence of Romanticism meant that the figure of the artist loomed large for Eliot. Her treatment of this figure exemplifies her dialectical, self-critical mode of thinking. She depicts the artist as productively hyper-sensitive, while exploring the pitfalls of this sensitivity.

[E]very great artist is a teacher..., by giving us his higher sensibility as a medium, a delicate acoustic or optical instrument, bringing home to our coarser senses what would otherwise be unperceived,

she declares in an essay on Goethe (1855d: 289). However, Eliot’s melodramatic story “The Lifted Veil” (1859) probes the darker side of this hyper-perceptive artist, parodied by its clairvoyant and “morbidly sensitive” (1859 [1878: 297]) protagonist, Latimer, who is depressed, misanthropic, and destined to a lonely death. This is partly a self-portrait: Eliot refers to “my morbid sensibility” in a letter written in the same year as “The Lifted Veil” (Letters 3: 164). In Middlemarch, Eliot’s narrator appears to defend a kind of saving ignorance as a counterpoint to the perils of hypersensitivity:

If we had a keen vision and feeling of all ordinary human life, it would be like hearing the grass grow and the squirrel’s heart beat, and we should die of that roar which lies on the other side of silence. As it is, the quickest of us walk about well wadded with stupidity. (M I: 297–8)

Eliot treats the artist’s creative egoism with similar ambivalence. We have seen (4.1) how Eliot’s artist mediates reality in the mirror of their own subjectivity and experience. This is depicted as an act of generosity or of narcissism—or possibly both at once. When the narrator of Adam Bede expounds his theory of literary realism, he rejects the idealizing alternative, which would “refashion life and character entirely after my own liking”, thereby creating an “arbitrary picture” (AB I: 265). Eliot uses similar phrasing to describe young Maggie Tulliver, the partially autobiographical heroine of The Mill on the Floss, “refashioning her little world into just what she should like it to be” (MF I: 69). Maggie, an avid reader, feels that “the world outside books was not a happy one” (MF II: 80). Perhaps Eliot’s implicit comment here is that Maggie’s imagination is shaped by idealizing, romanticizing literature of the type she criticizes. Yet the characterization may also involve a self-critique. Despite her realist commitment to truthfully depicting averagely flawed human beings, the distinctive compassionate tone of Eliot’s narrative voice nevertheless refashions the world as she would like it to be. The literary world of Eliot’s fiction is infused with sympathy and acceptance; it is, in other words, a world as it appears in the eyes of an attentive, loving mother. James Sully aptly described Eliot’s trademark “attitude of a large maternal charity” and “mood of compassionate tenderness touched with playful indulgence” (Sully 1881: 391). In this respect Eliot’s fictive world is markedly different from the real world that its author herself experienced—a world formed both by narrowly moralistic human judgements, and by the doctrines of divine judgement espoused by patriarchal religion.

5. Moral Philosophy

Eliot’s fiction explores situations of moral conflict and dilemma. For example, should a wife leave an abusive and/or adulterous marriage (see “Janet’s Repentance” and Romola)? Eliot also depicts protagonists struggling to choose an overall ethical orientation: between passion and duty (The Mill on the Floss), or between conformity and rebellion (Romola again). Her treatment of these cases consistently emphasizes their complexity, resists formulaic solutions, and rejects the view that absolute and general moral principles can reliably guide moral judgements. “There is no master key that will fit all cases”, states the narrator of The Mill on the Floss. Moral judgements must therefore be “checked and enlightened by a perpetual reference to the special circumstances that mark the individual lot” (MF III: 264).

The ethical outlook dramatized in Eliot’s fiction is resolutely humanist and secular. In an early essay she echoes Spinoza and Feuerbach in rejecting the supernaturalist doctrinal framework underpinning Christian ethics:

I am just and honest, not because I expect to live in another world, but because, having felt the pain of injustice and dishonesty towards myself, I have a fellow-feeling with other men, who would suffer the same pain if I were unjust or dishonest towards them… I have a tender love for my wife, and children, and friends, and through that love I sympathize with like affections in other men. It is a pang to me to witness the suffering of a fellow-being, and I feel his suffering the more acutely because he is mortal—because his life is so short. (Eliot 1857: 18)

Eliot believed that Jesus’s teachings, documented in the New Testament, included “false views and expectations”, and she argued that Christianity’s “dualistic theory—the antithesis of God and the world”—fostered “an egotistic seeking for ‘salvation’” (Letters 8: 26–7).

Eliot also criticizes moralism, both in life and in art. She frequently draws a normative contrast between “narrow” and “wide” views, signifying, respectively, excessively moralistic judgement and sympathetic tolerance. In a review of Goethe’s novel Wilhelm Meister’s Apprenticeship, she argues that “the line between the virtuous and vicious, so far from being a necessary safeguard to morality, is itself an immoral fiction” (Eliot 1855b: 703).

5.1 Meta-ethical theory

Eliot’s moral particularism led James Sully to claim that “George Eliot gives us a life-like picture of the moral struggle, and not a theory of it” (Sully 1881: 391). However, this claim is too hasty: it is possible to reconstruct several meta-ethical claims from Eliot’s fiction. To begin with, the insistence on “circumstances” in the passage quoted above from The Mill on the Floss highlights the moral significance of the concept of the milieu deployed in Eliot’s novels (see §3.2). Duty is another moral concept that structures her thinking, accompanied by the claim that particular duties must be determined with reference to each individual’s situation. Eliot’s sustained interest in the concepts of character and habit situates her moral thinking within the virtue ethics tradition (see §3.1). At times she espouses an exemplarist moral theory that foregrounds the concept of imitation; here we may detect the influence of Spinoza’s Ethics as well as more contemporary works such as Carlyle’s Heroes and Emerson’s Representative Men (see §3.4). Her interest in the concept of a character “type”, going back to Theophrastus’s Characters, suggests a meta-ethical view that fuses virtue theory and exemplarism.

Eliot is explicitly critical of utilitarianism, particularly insofar as this approach depends on the calculation of consequences. One line of argument appeals to the nature of moral agents. Eliot suggests that moral motivation is largely emotional, and that the emotions are fundamentally unsuited to calculative thinking. As the narrator of “Janet’s Repentance” puts it, “emotion is obstinately irrational: it insists on caring for individuals; it absolutely refuses to adopt the quantitative view of human anguish” (SCL 253). A second line of argument, also advanced in this text, focuses on the nature of suffering. This, Eliot claims, cannot be quantified: “human pain refuses to be settled by equations” (SCL 254). Such direct statements are only part of Eliot’s argumentative strategy, which is also dramatic or performative. The statements just quoted, for example, are made in the course of a narrative that has already engaged readers’ emotions to make them care intensely about an individual character and her particular life story.

A third line of argument against utilitarianism targets consequentialism as such. While Eliot’s novels tend to insist that people cannot escape the consequences of their own actions, they also emphasize the difficulty of predicting consequences in advance. This idea is developed but also qualified in Impression of Theophrastus Such, where Eliot’s narrator voices scepticism about a consequentialist ethical theory based on concepts of rational deliberation and free choice:

Few lives are shaped, few characters formed, by the contemplation of definite consequences seen from a distance and made the goal of continuous effort or the beacon of a constantly avoided danger: such control by foresight, such vivid picturing and practical logic are the distinction of exceptionally strong natures; but society is chiefly made up of human beings whose daily acts are all performed either in unreflecting obedience to custom and routine or from immediate promptings of thought or feeling to execute an immediate purpose. (ITS 90–91)

Here Eliot’s use of terms such as “few” and “chiefly” illustrates her principled resistance to universalist statements.

In Middlemarch Eliot offers a somewhat different epistemic critique of consequentialism, by claiming that consequences are difficult or impossible to know not only in advance, but also in retrospect. Middlemarch’s narrator concludes the novel by observing, of its heroine, that “the effect of [Dorothea’s] being on those around her was incalculably diffusive” (M III: 465). This claim is not restricted to Dorothea; it is itself diffused over an indefinite range of “acts” which contribute to the overall “good of the world”. The meta-ethical proposal here is that since the “effects” of actions cannot be calculated, they cannot provide a basis for moral judgement.

5.2 Sympathy

The concept of sympathy at the heart of Eliot’s moral philosophy is indebted to Feuerbach, whose Essence of Christianity—which Eliot translated in the early 1850s—made “suffering in common” a foundation for ethical life (Feuerbach 1854: 53; see Griffin 2017; Anger 2001 [2019]). In Eliot’s novels, sympathy is a cognitive and emotional achievement, rooted in natural human feelings that are in need of cultivation and correction. Sympathy provides an antidote to another prevailing human tendency: harsh moral judgements of others. The narrator of “Janet’s Repentance” praises “deep-sighted sympathy which is wiser than all blame, more potent than all reproof” (SCL 203). In Middlemarch, sympathy’s cognitive power is accentuated through a key scene of emotional crisis, where Dorothea finds that all her “vivid sympathetic experience returned to her now as a power”, illuminating her practical reason “as acquired knowledge asserts itself and will not let us see as we saw in the day of our ignorance” (M II: 321).

Like Spinoza and Hegel, Feuerbach set out an account of human relations that emphasizes both interdependence and difference:

we two cannot be without each other…only community constitutes humanity… between me and another human being there is an essential, qualitative distinction. (Feuerbach 1850: 158–9)

For Eliot, similarly, sympathy involves both commonality and otherness (Ermarth 1985). Scholars have debated whether Eliot shifted her emphasis from commonality to difference over the course of her literary career, or maintained a more dialectical view of these two concepts throughout her work (Hollander 2013: 62–87; Albrecht 2020). Either way, Eliot is certainly attentive to the limits of sympathy, and to its limited efficacy. Middlemarch’s Dorothea Brooke naively “expected to walk in full communion” with her husband (M II: 3), and finds herself unable to do so. In The Mill on the Floss Maggie Tulliver tells her brother Tom that

You can’t quite judge for me—our natures are very different. You don’t know how differently things affect me from what they do you. (MF III: 59)

Eliot, a famously consoling writer, can be sceptical about consolation.

We are all islands…and this seclusion is sometimes the most intensely felt at the very moment your friend is caressing you or consoling you,

she wrote to a friend in 1854, a few weeks after completing her translation of Feuerbach (Eliot to Cara Bray, 19 May 1854; Letters 2: 156).

The obstacles to sympathy are the obstacles to moral growth. Chief among them is egotism (see §3.3). Yet there are other, more aesthetic obstacles, such as snobbery and xenophobia. In an early essay Eliot denounces “the vulgarity of exclusiveness” (Eliot 1856b: 54) and her novels depict both social and aesthetic snobbery; she is not above exploring the difficulty of feeling common humanity with someone who is unattractive, overweight, or poorly dressed. “It is needful that I should have a fibre of sympathy connecting me with that vulgar citizen who weighs out my sugar in a vilely-assorted cravat and waistcoat” remarks the narrator of Adam Bede (AB I: 271). Insofar as the moral problem is aesthetic, so the remedy is aesthetic: Eliot’s novels dramatize a sympathetic way of “seeing”, or of paying attention. Adam Bede, for example, depicts unattractive people who are indeed loved, and therefore lovable.

Yes! thank God [exclaims the narrator], human feeling [i.e., love] is like the mighty rivers that bless the earth: it does not wait for beauty—it flows with resistless force and brings beauty with it. (AB I: 269)

This is precisely what the compassionate gaze of Eliot’s narrators attempts to do for her widely assorted characters, who possess various mixtures of physical and moral flaws.

The ideals of feeling-with, thinking-with, and seeing-with embedded in Eliot’s concept of sympathy are integral to the practice of intellectual companionship she undertakes as a philosopher and artist (see §2). Rational argument is considered a reliable philosophical tool insofar as reason is communicable and universal (or, more modestly, commands broad regional consensus). The affects have an equivalent claim to communicability and commonality (see §3.5) only if the “feeling” element within emotional intelligence and intuitive understanding carries a comparably compelling force. The communicative success of Eliot’s novels constitutes her primary argument in favour of this view.

5.3 Social ethics

While Eliot’s writings frequently reference political events and issues, her approach to such matters is more moral than political. Broadly speaking, she maintained a hope for both individual and collective moral progress. Politically, she favoured gradual and moderate reform, rather than revolution, because she believed that continuity with the past is the essence of culture. From Felix Holt: The Radical onwards, her thinking about the role of art within the national political arena engaged closely with Mill’s “On Representative Government” and Matthew Arnold’s Culture and Anarchy (Gallagher 1985: 217–267). Her consideration of these questions is characteristically attuned to ambiguity.

Eliot’s art engages in intensive yet subtle ways with what Victorians called “the Woman Question”. She returns repeatedly to the question of female vocation; several of her female characters struggle to find intellectual or artistic fulfilment. Marriage is explored in all her novels, especially but not exclusively from a female point of view. In keeping with her moral particularism, Eliot considers broadly moral benefits and harms within a series of particular marriages. She gives close attention to marital violence and coercive control: variations on this theme appear in “Janet’s Repentance”, “The Lifted Veil”, Romola, Middlemarch, and Daniel Deronda. Her analysis of two unhappy marriages in Middlemarch mirrors Hegel’s account of the master-slave dialectic in The Phenomenology of Spirit, which Eliot studied while writing the novel. Drawing on the Hegelian theme of recognition, Eliot’s depiction of the Casaubons and the Lydgates explores how a partnership can be mutually destructive: all these partners misrecognize one another, because they imagine their prospective spouse according to their own desires (Armstrong 2020; Carlisle 2023: 190–98). Eliot’s most radically feminist critique of marriage occurs in Daniel Deronda, where the heroine, feeling compelled to marry for money, enters an abusive marriage portrayed as de facto prostitution, with disastrous psychological consequences.

Eliot was cautiously supportive of widening women’s access to higher education. In 1869 her friends Barbara Bodichon and Emily Davies founded Cambridge’s first women’s college, to which Eliot—who was by then wealthy as a consequence of her bestselling novels—donated a relatively modest £50. Her writing is more emphatic in highlighting the paucity of women’s education and considering its diverse effects on different female characters. Middlemarch’s Rosamond Vincy, whose shallow education does nothing to reform her vain, self-centred character, exemplifies Mary Wollstonecraft’s ingenious argument that giving women equal access to education will be beneficial to men. In a brief essay on Wollstonecraft’s The Vindication of the Rights of Women (1792), Eliot endorses the view that “so far as obstinacy is concerned, your unreasoning animal is the most unmanageable of creatures”: in other words, an “unreasoning” wife will be troublesome to her husband (Eliot 1855c: 988–9; Carlisle 2023: 196–7). The plot of Middlemarch exposes Dr Lydgate’s error in fearing intellectual women, since Rosamond, his wife, turns out to be a far more formidable adversary.

In her late works Daniel Deronda and Impressions of Theophrastus Such, Eliot gives sustained attention to race and nationality. Both texts examine antisemitism, and advocate for a Jewish state (Anderson 1997). Less overtly, Daniel Deronda puts forward a moral critique of the British Empire, personified by the coercive cruelty of “white-handed” aristocrat Henleigh Grandcourt, and highlights the Church of England’s complicity in colonial and patriarchal violence via its depiction of a hypocritical clergyman, Henry Gascoigne (DD III: 74; Henry 2001 [2019]; Carlisle 2023: 221). In a letter to the American abolitionist Harriet Beecher Stowe, written shortly after the publication of Daniel Deronda, Eliot extends its critique of antisemitism to other forms of racism:

not only towards the Jews, but towards all oriental peoples with whom we English come into contact, a spirit of arrogance and contemptuous dictatorialness is observable which has become a national disgrace. There is nothing I should care more to do, if it were possible, than to rouse the imagination of men and women to a vision of human claims in those races of their fellow-men who most differ from them in their customs and beliefs. (Letters 6: 301)

Theophrastus Such, an Englishman, states directly that “we are a colonizing people, and it is we who have punished others” (ITS 264; Henry 2001 [2019]).

6. Influence

At the end of Middlemarch, Eliot’s narrator remarks that its heroine’s influence on others has been “incalculably diffusive”. Although George Eliot, already during her lifetime a celebrated novelist whose works inspired reverence as well as critical acclaim, was very different from the obscure, “unhistoric” Dorothea Brooke, this remark does apply in one sense to Eliot herself. Her novels, in English and in translation, have been and continue to be very widely read (and re-read) by ordinary people, including schoolchildren. Few other philosophers are so diffusively influential as George Eliot.

It perhaps goes without saying that a nineteenth-century woman who pursued her philosophical work in the medium of fiction was taken less seriously, as a philosopher, than contemporaries such as J. S. Mill and Herbert Spencer. Nevertheless, Nietzsche took George Eliot seriously enough to deem her worthy of insult. In Twilight of the Idols he treats Eliot (a “little moral female”) as the prime example of English “moralists” who reject Christian belief only to cling more tightly to Christian morality (Nietzsche 1889: Streifzüge eines Unzeitgemässen §5 [2005: 193]). Here Nietzsche displays his ignorance of the sophistication and complexity of Eliot’s moral thinking; his own naturalistic, physiological ethics were indebted to an English philosophical tradition that Eliot, along with Spencer and Lewes, helped to shape (see Staten 2014: 1–9). In the 1870s and 80s Sigmund Freud read and admired Middlemarch and Daniel Deronda, and may have been influenced by Eliot’s study of the effects of “suppressed experience” (DD II: 120) on psychological and emotional development, as well as by her subtle explorations of female experience in particular (see Jones 1953: 131, 168, 174; Rotenberg 1999). As a consequence of her abusive marriage, the heroine of Daniel Deronda displays symptoms of nervous disorders, such as hysteria and anorexia nervosa, that were receiving scientific attention at that time (Vrettos 1990; Matus 2008; Carlisle 2023: 221–2, 342–3).

While philosophers throughout history, at least since Plato, have experimented with literary form in ways that are not philosophically trivial, Eliot exerted a decisive influence on new convergences between philosophy and literature during the twentieth century. As some contemporary critics recognized, Middlemarch “marks an epoch in the history of fiction” insofar as its interest in subjectivity and inter-subjectivity determines “the form in which the conception is placed before us” (Simcox 1873). Eliot exerted a profound influence on Anglophone modernism, with its distinctive attention to the relation between truth and literary form. Virginia Woolf and Henry James, for example, were direct heirs to her literary innovations. Eliot’s novels, not least her semi-autobiographical The Mill on the Floss, were also formative for Proust and Simone de Beauvoir, whose own experiments in life-writing were the medium for their philosophical work (see Fraser 1994: 87–113; Gobeil 1965). In light of such influence—and arguably because of, as well as despite, its diffusiveness—Eliot can justly be regarded as the progenitor of the modern philosophical novel.

In the second half of the twentieth century, literary formalism shaped scholarly and critical practices in the humanities. This disciplinary development produced techniques of close reading that have been applied, in return, to Eliot’s novels—above all Middlemarch—to reveal their power, intricacy and originality as works of both art and philosophy.

Bibliography

A. Primary works

A.1 Fiction by George Eliot

All references to George Eliot’s fictional works are to the Cabinet Edition of her works. These volumes were all published in 1878 by John Blackwood in Edinburgh, with the exception of Impressions of Theophrastus Such which was published in 1879.

Abbreviations to cited texts are as follows; where applicable the abbreviation is followed by the volume number:

  • [SCL] 1858, Scenes of Clerical Life (two volumes), London/Edinburgh: William Blackwood and Sons. Collects three previously published stories including:
    • 1857, “Janet’s Repentance”, Blackwood’s Edinburgh Magazine, 82: 55–76, 189–206, 329–344, 457–473, 519–541. Cabinet edition SCL 2: 39–317
  • 1859 [1878], “The Lifted Veil”, Blackwood’s Edinburgh Magazine, 86: 24–47. Reprinted, 1878, Cabinet edition 2: 275–342. [“The Lifted Veil” available online]
  • [AB] 1859, Adam Bede (two volumes), London/Edinburgh: William Blackwood and Sons.
  • [MF] 1860, The Mill on the Floss (three volumes), London/Edinburgh: William Blackwood and Sons.
  • [SM] 1861, Silas Marner, London/Edinburgh: William Blackwood and Sons.
  • 1863, Romola (three volumes), London/Edinburgh: William Blackwood and Sons.
  • 1866, Felix Holt: The Radical (three volumes), London/Edinburgh: William Blackwood and Sons.
  • [M] 1871–72, Middlemarch (four volumes [three volumes in the Cabinet edition]), London/Edinburgh: William Blackwood and Sons.
  • [DD] 1876, Daniel Deronda (four volumes [three volumes in the Cabinet edition]), London/Edinburgh: William Blackwood and Sons.
  • [ITS] 1879, Impressions of Theophrastus Such, London/Edinburgh: William Blackwood and Sons.

A.2 Essays, articles and reviews by George Eliot

A.3 Correspondence

  • The George Eliot Letters. Nine volumes, edited by Gordon S. Haight, New Haven: Yale University Press, 1954–1978. (Cited as Letters followed by volume number).
  • The Letters of George Henry Lewes. Three volumes, edited by William Baker, Victoria BC: University of Victoria, 1995–1998. (Cited as LGHL followed by volume number).

A.4 Translations by Eliot

  • Feuerbach, Ludwig, 1854, The Essence of Christianity, translated by Marian Evans from the second German edition of Das Wesen des Christentums, London: Edward Chapman and William Hall. The original German version was published in 1841. [Evans translation of Feuerbach 1854 available online]
  • [Ethics] de Spinoza, Benedict, The Ethics of Benedict de Spinoza, translated by George Eliot in 1856 but not published in her lifetime. Her translation was later published as Spinoza’s Ethics, translated by George Eliot, Clare Carlisle (ed.), Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 2020.

A.5 Primary works by other authors

  • Mill, John Stuart, 1843 [1889], A System of Logic, Ratiocinative and Inductive, 2 volumes, London: J. W. Parker. People’s edition, London: Longmans, Green and Co. 1889.
  • Comte, Auguste, 1875, System of Positive Polity, Second Volume, containing Social Statics, or the Abstract Theory of Human Order, Frederic Harrison (trans.), London: Longmans, Green and Co. Originally published as Système de politique positive, ou traité de sociologie instituant la religion de l’Humanité, 4 volumes, Paris, Carilian-Goeury, 1851–1854. [Comte 1875 available online]
  • Nietzsche, Friedrich, 1889 [2005], Götzen-Dämmerung, oder, Wie man mit dem Hammer philosophiert, Leipzig: C. G. Neumann. Translated as “Twilight of the Idols, or How to Philosophize with a Hammer”, in The Anti-Christ, Ecce Homo, Twilight of the Idols, and Other Writings (Cambridge Texts in the History of Philosophy), Aaron Ridley and Judith Norman (eds), Judith Norman (trans.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005, 153–230.

B. Secondary works

  • Anonymous, 1854, Review of Eliot’s translation (1854) of Feuerbach in “Theology and Philosophy”, Westminster Review, 62: 559–560.
  • Albrecht, Thomas, 2020, The Ethical Vision of George Eliot (Among the Victorians and Modernists), New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780429343667
  • –––, 2023, “Sympathy and Alterity: The Ethical Sublime in Romola”, in Harris and Sussman 2023: ch. 6.
  • Anderson, Amanda, 1997, “George Eliot and the Jewish Question”, The Yale Journal of Criticism, 10(1): 39–61. doi:10.1353/yale.1997.0001
  • Anderson, Amanda and Harry E. Shaw (eds), 2013, A Companion to George Eliot (Blackwell Companions to Literature and Culture 82), Chichester, UK/Hoboken, NJ: John Wiley & Sons. doi:10.1002/9781118542347
  • Anger, Suzy, 2001 [2019], “George Eliot and Philosophy”, in Levine 2001: 76–97 (ch. 8). Reprinted in Levine and Henry 2019: 215–235 (ch. 12). doi:10.1017/9781108147743.013
  • Armstrong, Isobel, 2013, “George Eliot, Spinoza, and the Emotions”, in Anderson and Shaw 2013: 294–308 (ch. 21). doi:10.1002/9781118542347.ch21
  • –––, 2020, “George Eliot, Hegel, and Middlemarch”, 19: Interdisciplinary Studies in the Long Nineteenth Century, 29. doi:10.16995/ntn.1992
  • Ashton, Rosemary, 1980, The German Idea: Four English Writers and the Reception of German Thought, 1800–1860, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press.
  • Atkins, Dorothy, 1978, George Eliot and Spinoza, Salzburg: Institut für Englische Sprache und Literatur, Universität Salzburg.
  • Baker, William, 1973, “The Kabbalah, Mordecai, and George Eliot’s Religion of Humanity”, The Yearbook of English Studies, 3: 216–221. doi:10.2307/3506871
  • Brilmyer, S. Pearl, 2014, “‘The Natural History of My Inward Self’: Sensing Character in George Eliot’s Impressions of Theophrastus Such”, PMLA/Publications of the Modern Language Association of America, 129(1): 35–51. doi:10.1632/pmla.2014.129.1.35
  • –––, 2015, “Plasticity, Form, and the Matter of Character in Middlemarch”, Representations, 130(1): 60–83. doi:10.1525/rep.2015.130.1.60
  • Canguilhem, Georges, 2001, “The Living and Its Milieu”, John Savage (trans.), Grey Room, 3: 7–31. doi:10.1162/152638101300138521
  • Carlisle, Clare, 2020a, “George Eliot’s Spinoza: An Introduction”, in Spinoza’s Ethics, translated by George Eliot, Clare Carlisle (ed.), Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1–60.
  • –––, 2020b, “George Eliot and Spinoza: Philosophical Formations”, Victorian Studies, 62(4): 590–615. doi:10.2979/victorianstudies.62.4.02
  • –––, 2023, The Marriage Question: George Eliot’s Double Life, London: Allen Lane.
  • –––, 2025, “George Eliot’s Translations”, in The Oxford Handbook of George Eliot, Juliette Atkinson and Elisha Cohn (eds), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 371–385. doi:10.1093/oxfordhb/9780192856593.013.22
  • Dillane, Fionnuala, 2009, “Re-Reading George Eliot’s ‘Natural History’: Marian Evans, ‘the People,’ and the Periodical”, Victorian Periodicals Review, 42(3): 244–266. doi:10.1353/vpr.0.0082
  • –––, 2011, “‘The Character of Editress’: Marian Evans at the Westminster Review , 1851–54”, Tulsa Studies in Women’s Literature, 30(2): 269–290. doi:10.1353/tsw.2011.a498330
  • Dolin, Tim, 2023, “The Grounds of Exception: Liberal Sympathy and Its Limits in Daniel Deronda and C.H. Pearson’s National Life and Character”, in Harris and Sussman 2023: ch. 9.
  • Ermarth, Elizabeth Deeds, 1985, “George Eliot’s Conception of Sympathy”, Nineteenth-Century Fiction, 40(1): 23–42. doi:10.2307/3044834
  • Fleishman, Avrom, 2010, George Eliot’s Intellectual Life, Cambridge, UK/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511691706
  • Fraser, Robert, 1994, Proust and the Victorians: The Lamp of Memory, New York: St. Martin’s Press & London: Macmillan.
  • Frazer, Sophie Alexandra, 2018, “George Eliot and Spinoza: Toward a Theory of the Affects”, George Eliot–George Henry Lewes Studies, 70(2): 128–142. doi:10.5325/georelioghlstud.70.2.0128
  • Gallagher, Catherine, 1985, The Industrial Reformation of English Fiction: Social Discourse and Narrative Form, 1832–1867, Chicago, IL: University of Chicago Press.
  • Gatens, Moira, 2003, “Freedom and Determinism in ‘Middlemarch’, or Dorothea, the Lunatic”, Sydney Studies in English, 29: 35–45.
  • –––, 2007, “George Eliot’s ‘Incarnation of the Divine’ in ‘Romola’ and Benedict Spinoza’s ‘Blessedness’: A Double Reading”, George Eliot–George Henry Lewes Studies, 52/53: 76–92.
  • –––, 2009, “The Art and Philosophy of George Eliot”, Philosophy and Literature, 33(1): 73–90. doi:10.1353/phl.0.0037
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