Notes to Hermeneutics

1. For a critical assessment of Gadamer’s idea, see Gjesdal 2009, 2.

2. On the concept of the hermeneutical circle, and the sense of ‘presupposition’ at issue for it, see Grondin 2016.

3. For a discussion of the limits of this common account, see Grondin 1994.

4. Husserl describes phenomenology in terms of transcendental philosophy, for example, in Husserl, Cartesian Meditations. See especially Husserl, Cartesian Meditations, §§ 40–41.

5. Gadamer uses the term ‘elements’ more narrowly in Truth and Method to discuss matters pertaining to tradition, in particular.

6. Note that Gadamer makes this comment in connection with Heidegger’s concept of facticity, in particular.

7. In this, Gadamer’s view of the relation of truth to language echoes the later Heidegger’s celebrated idea that ‘language is the house of being.’ See, for example, Heidegger, “Letter on Humanism,” 239 and Heidegger, “The Way to Language,” 135.

8. For a helpful further articulation, see also Gadamer, “Heritage of Hegel,” 335.

9. Lawrence Schmidt uses the term ‘controversies’ to describe debates that emerged in regard to Gadamer’s philosophical hermeneutics and not only Habermas and Derrida, but also E. D. Hirsch and Paul Ricouer (see L. Schmidt 2006, 133–171). The development of philosophical hermeneutics has further been fostered by debates between Emilio Betti (see Grondin 1994, 125–129).

10. Note also that Ricoeur makes a contribution to this debate in “Hermeneutics and the Critique of Ideology.”

11. There are other Anglophone philosophers who have also made contributions to hermeneutics. A notable example is Charles Taylor. See, for example, Taylor 1980.

12. Such a question is raised about Richard Rorty, for example, in Ramberg 2015.

13. Rorty and Vattimo are often associated together with postmodern hermeneutics. See for example Figal 2010, 1; see also Caputo 2018, 171–188).

14. Heidegger turns to Aristotle, including Aristotle’s notion of phronesis, in the course of his lectures from the 1920s. Gadamer turns to Aristotle’s ethics as a source of his account of interpretive experience, for example, in Truth and Method, Part II.2.B.

Copyright © 2020 by
Theodore George <t-george@tamu.edu>

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