Internalist vs. Externalist Conceptions of Epistemic Justification

First published Thu Dec 4, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Clayton Littlejohn replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

There are two debates in epistemology that can be described as a debate between internalists and externalists: a debate about propositional knowledge and a debate about epistemic justification. The debate about knowledge is primarily about whether propositional knowledge requires some internal epistemic condition, an epistemic condition (e.g., justification, rationality) that depends wholly upon factors internal to the thinker and her perspective on the world. Internalists claim that there is such a condition, arguing that it would not be possible to know, say, unless the thinker has sufficiently good reasons available to reflection (BonJour 1980). Externalists about knowledge deny that there is any such condition, either because they deny that knowledge requires epistemic conditions like justification or rationality (Audi 1995; Kornblith 2008) or because they deny that any such epistemic condition depends wholly upon internal factors (Greco 2010; Williamson 2000). The disagreement that is the focus of this entry is about whether the justification of any thinker’s beliefs might depend in part upon external factors. Internalists about justification defend the view that justification supervenes upon the internal. Externalists about justification deny this. The debate touches upon questions about the nature of normativity and about the role that rational excellence plays in establishing a connection between thought and reality.

The terms of the debate are clarified in §1. In §2 and §3, the most influential arguments for internalism and for externalism about justification are presented. In §4, we look at different conceptions of justification.

1. Terms of the Debates

These debates about knowledge and about justification are, inter alia, disagreements about the connections between justification and knowledge, as well as disagreements about what kinds of internal conditions are necessary for knowledge and whether justification is itself an internal condition (regardless of whether it is necessary for knowledge). The ‘external’ can be characterised negatively as that which does not supervene upon the internal. The internal is most often understood in accessibilist terms (e.g., in terms of that which is reflectively accessible, or in terms of factors that thinkers have privileged access to (Audi 2001; Fumerton 1995)), or in mentalist terms (i.e., in terms of the mental life of an individual thinker and that which supervenes upon the mental (Conee and Feldman 2004)).

A brief review of the early history is needed to clarify the terms of the debate. Armstrong (1973) introduced the term ‘externalism’ into the literature as a way of picking out theories of knowledge that implied that beliefs might sometimes constitute knowledge without the support of a ‘justificatory argument’ (BonJour 1980). BonJour thought that only beliefs supported by the elements of a justificatory argument might constitute knowledge, but foundationalists thought that some knowledge might be immediately available without reliance on such an argument, either because (a) it seems plausible that certain forms of knowledge (e.g., knowledge of what we’re thinking or doing (Anscombe 1962)) do not require the support of any argument that the thinker could potentially offer, or (b) because it seems that positing some knowledge that does not need the support of a justificatory argument is a good way of addressing the regress problem (Audi 1988a; Sosa 1980). Armstrong’s externalist proposed that some knowledge might be possible without the support of a justificatory argument provided that certain ‘natural’ relations connect a thinker’s beliefs to the situations that make those beliefs true, but externalism can be understood more broadly as the view that there are possible cases of propositional knowledge where no purely internal epistemic condition (e.g., rationality, justification) obtains.

Notable examples of externalist theories of knowledge include the proposals that knowledge is nothing more than true belief (Sartwell 1991; 1992), that knowing that p is a matter of the fact that p being causally connected in the appropriate way with believing that p (Goldman 1967), that knowledge is true belief produced by belief-producing systems operative in the environments for which they were well-designed (Millikan 1984; Plantinga 1993), that knowledge is belief that ‘tracks’ the truth in the sense that the belief would not have been formed by the operative methods had the belief been mistaken (Nozick 1981; Roush 2005), and that knowledge is belief based on ‘conclusive reasons’, reasons a thinker would not have had if this belief had been mistaken (Dretske 1971). The term ‘externalism’ seemed apt to describe these views because each view characterised knowledge as a relation between a thinker and a fact that can obtain even if the thinker had no available reasons or evidence to believe that the relevant relation held between their beliefs and the world.

BonJour’s (1980) influential critique of externalist theories of knowledge was, inter alia, a critique of a picture of justification according to which a thinker who meets the conditions of the externalist theories like the ones sketched above would have justification for her beliefs even if the internal conditions that figure in internalist accounts of rationality or justification were absent. His critique forced epistemologists to address three questions:

The knowledge question: Is there any purely internal epistemic condition that is necessary for propositional knowledge?

The dependence question: Is justification necessary for propositional knowledge?

The justification question: Is justification a purely internal epistemic condition?

If there is no consensus on how these questions should be answered, it seems to make sense to distinguish the debate about justification from the debate about knowledge. If someone were to answer the nexus question by affirming that it is possible, by their lights, to have knowledge without justification, they would see that there is a coherent view according to which knowledge should be understood along externalist lines even if justification is something that depends wholly upon factors internal to the thinker.

The debate about justification is typically understood as a debate about a supervenience thesis.[1] Internalists maintain that there is a necessary connection between internal conditions and justification: if two thinkers are internal duplicates, the same things will be justified for them. Externalists about justification reject this. Their view is defined negatively. The debate about knowledge, by contrast, is not normally understood as a disagreement about a supervenience thesis. Facts about knowledge would only supervene upon facts about the internal if we assumed that internal duplicates always know the same things. Given the standard characterisations of the internal, internalism so formulated implies that the scope of factual knowledge is limited to facts that supervene upon the internal, but this view about the potential scope of human knowledge is not widely accepted. The focus of this discussion will be the debate between internalists and externalists about justification, not knowledge.

Note that philosophers of mind draw the line between the internal and external in a completely different way. In philosophy of mind, we might say that factors that are internal to an individual are internal to the bodies of thinking animals (Burge 1979; Gertler 2015). Such conditions that might have to do with the structure of organs or pH levels of blood might be treated as internal by philosophers of mind but external by epistemologists since they do not directly determine what a thinker’s perspective is like or because thinkers have no reflective access to such conditions (i.e., they cannot determine using introspection, reason, and memory of what is known in these ways what our nervous system is like much less whether we have blood).

If the external is characterised negatively (i.e., as that which is not internal), every theory of knowledge and of justification can be classified as internalist or externalist and no theory would be both. Some authors speak of a ‘pure’ externalist view if it characterises some notion without using any internal conditions (Srinivasan 2020). A view that implies that justification depends upon a mixture of internal and external conditions can be classified as externalist even if some authors prefer to describe the view as ‘an internalist externalism’ (Alston 1988a).

The debate is primarily concerned with propositional justification rather than doxastic justification. Ascriptions of propositional justification do not presuppose or entail that the thinker holds the relevant belief (e.g., given the evidence, there might be a justification for Alice to believe that housing prices will go up even if she has not processed this evidence and drawn any conclusions on the matter). Ascriptions of doxastic justification do presuppose or entail that the thinker has the belief in question (e.g., if Alice justifiably believes something about the price of housing, she has to have a belief about it, she must have a justification to form this belief, and the belief itself must be based on the right kinds of factors to be justified). Doxastic justification seems to involve a basing relation that, in turn, might involve a causal connection between beliefs and other states of mind (Korcz 1997; Silva and Oliveira 2024). Because of this, there might be an external element in doxastic justification (e.g., causal links between internal factors) even if propositional justification is an internalist notion. For this reason, many internalists focus on propositional justification.

How do epistemologists characterise the internal and the external? There are two standard characterisations, as mentioned above. Internal conditions are sometimes understood as those that supervene upon a thinker’s mental life (Conee and Feldman 2004; Wedgwood 2002). If two thinkers are perfectly alike in terms of the relevant aspects of their mental lives, they will be internally similar. The mentalist believes that justification supervenes upon the internal where the internal is understood as that which supervenes upon relevant aspects of a thinker’s mental life. On this view, any difference in what two thinkers have justification to believe at any time requires a suitable difference in their respective mental lives at the relevant times. Internal conditions are sometimes understood instead in terms of what is accessible to the thinker (i.e., as that which is available to the thinker via reflection or introspection). The accessibilist believes that justification supervenes upon internal conditions that are understood to be accessible. On this view, if there is any difference in what two thinkers have justification to believe at any given time, there must be some difference in what conditions they have access to at the relevant times (Fumerton 1995; Smithies 2012a).

It is not obvious that these characterisations of the internal and external are equivalent. There might be aspects of a thinker’s mental life that are not accessible. It might be controversial whether that which is accessible to an individual is limited to that individual’s mental life (Gibbons 2006; McDowell 1994; Williamson 2000). A further complicating factor is that there might be aspects of a thinker’s mental life that the mentalist wants to deny might matter to justification. What if knowledge is itself a mental state in its own right so there is a mental difference between someone who knows that the snow has started to fall and someone who believes but doesn’t know this (Gibbons 2001; Nagel 2013; Williamson 2000)? What if perceptions are of a different psychological kind than hallucinations no matter how similar these conscious episodes might seem to those undergoing them (Hinton 1973; Logue 2012; Martin 2004; McDowell 1994)? Few epistemologists who want to be described as ‘internalist’ want to say that there is an internal difference between any thinker who knows some proposition and any other thinker who could not know this proposition (but see McDowell 1995). There is controversy as to whether the mentalist should be troubled by the possibility that there might be aspects of a thinker’s mental life relevant to justification that are not accessible to that thinker (Vahid 2011; Puddifoot 2016).

According to the accessibilist, the conditions that determine what a thinker has justification to believe at any given time are the ones accessible to her at that time. Prominent accessibilists have defended different views about what it is that thinkers have access to. For some, we have access to the grounds, reasons, or evidence that provide (or diminish) rational support (Audi 2001). A less modest view is that thinkers have access to whether there is (adequate) justification for them to believe the propositions they grasp (Chisholm 1988; Ginet 1975; Smithies 2012a). It will simplify discussion to think of accessibilism in terms of access to that which provides rational support. To explicate the notion of access, some authors appeal to the idea of acquaintance (Fumerton 1988) and some to the idea of what is made available via introspection and reflection (Audi 2001).

2. Arguments for Internalism

In this section, the most influential arguments for internalism about justification are presented and examined.

2.1 Clairvoyance and Unusual Faculties

BonJour provides one of the first intuition pumps used to criticise externalism about knowledge, a view that he took to have implausible implications about the nature of justification and its role in securing knowledge:

Norman: Norman, under certain conditions that usually obtain, is a completely reliable clairvoyant with respect to certain kinds of subject matter. He possesses no evidence or reasons of any kind for or against the general possibility of such a cognitive power, or for or against the thesis that he possesses it. One day Norman comes to believe that the President is in New York City, though he has no evidence either for or against this belief. In fact the belief is true and results from his clairvoyant power, under circumstances in which it is completely reliable. (BonJour 1980: 62)

BonJour hoped to use the example to elicit intuitive support for (P3):

The Argument from Clairvoyance

P1. Externalist views of knowledge imply that the external conditions that suffice for turning a belief into knowledge suffice for justification.

P2. Externalist views about knowledge imply that Norman’s beliefs constitute knowledge.

C1. Thus, externalism about knowledge implies that Norman’s beliefs are justified.

P3. Norman’s beliefs, however, are not justified.

C. Externalist views of knowledge are mistaken.

Similar examples involving beliefs produced by unusual faculties can be found elsewhere in the literature (Lehrer 1990).

Externalists about justification have two avenues of response. They might defend the view that Norman’s beliefs are justified or deny that their views imply that Norman’s beliefs are justified. To support the idea that Norman has justification to believe, some externalists have pointed to examples that elicit intuitions less unfavourable to the externalist:

Racist Dinner Table: Nour, a young British woman of Arab descent, is invited to dinner at the home of a white friend from university. The host, Nour’s friend’s father, is polite and welcoming to Nour. He is generous with the food and wine, and asks Nour a series of questions about herself. Everyone laughs and talks amiably. As Nour comes away, however, she is unable to shake the conviction that her friend’s father is racist against Arabs. But replaying the evening in her head she finds it impossible to recover just what actions on the host’s part could be thought to be racist, or what would justify her belief in the host’s racism. If pressed, Nour would say she “just knows” that her host is racist. In fact the host is racist—he thinks of Arabs as inherently fanatical, dangerous, and backward—and as a result sent off subtle cues that Nour subconsciously registered and processed. It is this subconscious sensitivity that led to Nour’s belief that her host is racist. (Srinivasan 2020: 396)

Srinivasan thinks that in Racist Dinner Table, we should say that Nour knows that the host is racist and, in turn, that Nour’s beliefs are justified.

Externalists might resist BonJour’s argument by rejecting (P1). They might argue that their view carries no commitment to the claim that Norman or Nour has justification for their beliefs. Some might be prepared to attribute knowledge to these subjects while maintaining that reflection on similar examples suggests that some knowers might believe propositions that would not be rational to believe. Examples involving chicken-sexers (i.e., thinkers who have the ability to reliably sort male and female chicks into different groups without any idea how it is that they manage to do this thanks, presumably, to some cues that are not consciously identifiable that explain the non-accidental success of their sorting decisions) have convinced some that it might be possible to know a proposition without justifiably or rationally believing that proposition (Foley 1987: 168). There is no consensus on whether knowledge requires rational belief or justification (Lasonen-Aarnio 2010). Alternatively, they might agree that having justification to believe p is a condition on knowing p, but argue that justification (and knowledge) requires a combination of the right internal and external conditions (Sosa 2003). Recall that externalism about justification is the thesis that justification does not supervene upon the internal. Externalism about justification is not equivalent to ‘pure externalism’. Externalism is compatible with the idea that Norman’s beliefs would only be justified if certain internal and external conditions are met. Many virtue reliabilists, for example, believe that justification requires a reliability condition (which is an external factor) as well as a virtue-condition that seems to implicate subjective factors like those that figure in many internalist accounts of justification (Sosa 1991; Greco 1999; Miracchi 2017). The intuitions BonJour hopes to elicit do not speak against a wide range of possible and actual externalist views even if they pose a threat to pure externalism.

2.2 The Normative Character of Justification

Internalists sometimes say that externalists do not do justice to the normative character of justification. This is one way of trying to capture this idea:

The Deontologist’s Argument for Internalism

P1. If A and B are internal duplicates and they form the same beliefs in the same ways, A meets her epistemic duties iff B meets her epistemic duties.

P2. A thinker has justification to believe p when she can form this belief without failing to meet her epistemic duties.

C. If A and B are internally alike, A will have justification to believe p iff B has justification to believe p.

Epistemologists often characterise justification in broadly deontological terms, saying that justified beliefs are beliefs that we ought to hold (Conee and Feldman 2004) or that justified beliefs are the ones we can hold whilst discharging our epistemic duties (Steup 2001).

Critics of the argument might respond in one of two ways. First, some question the idea that justification should be understood in terms of duty. According to one influential line of criticism, it would be better to characterise justification in evaluative terms (i.e., something that would be good to have from the epistemic point of view) because thinkers do not have the right kind of control over their beliefs to have epistemic duties or obligations (Alston 1988b). This is a problem because many are convinced that thinkers do not have voluntary control over their beliefs (Bennett 1990; Hieronymi 2009; Winters 1979). Debates about whether deontological theories of justification require voluntary control continue (Chuard and Southwood 2009; Hieronymi 2008).

Second, some question whether deontologism favours internalism (Bergmann 2006; Littlejohn 2012; Sutton 2007; Williamson 2007; Srinivasan 2020). There are live debates about whether moral duties or the justification of action should be understood along internalist lines (i.e., that internally similar agents have the same duties and the same actions would be justified for them) (P. A. Graham 2010; Thomson 2003). Similarly, there are ongoing debates in the philosophy of law whether agents who are internally similar to agents who act with justification in self-defence cases likewise have justification or merely an excuse to act in similar ways if faced by a merely apparent threat (Baron 2007; Moore 1997). As it is controversial in other normative domains whether internal duplicates will always do equally well in discharging their duties if they act the same way, it is unsurprising that some externalists feel free to describe their views in deontological terms.

Internalists might offer an alternative characterisation of the normative character of justification (e.g., by linking justification to responsibility) or provide further arguments for thinking that normative notions used to characterise justification (e.g., duty) must be understood along internalist lines. If they pursue the first option, they might shift away from talk of duty towards responsibility (Naylor 1988) or rationality (Wedgwood 2002) and argue that justification (so understood) should be understood along internalist lines because responsibility or rationality should be understood as internalist notions.

Internalists who want to link justification to responsibility (either to explicate the notion of duty or to shift away from thinking of justification in terms of duty) might offer this responsibilist argument:

The Responsibilist’s Argument for Internalism

P1. If A and B are internal duplicates and they form the same beliefs in the same ways, A is blameless for her beliefs iff B is blameless.

P2. If neither A nor B can be blamed or held responsible for forming their beliefs, neither failed to fulfill their epistemic duties by forming these beliefs.

P3. A thinker has justification to believe when she can form these beliefs without failing to meet her epistemic duties.

C. If A and B are internally alike, A will have justification to believe iff B has justification to believe.

Responsibilists about justification think that believing responsibly or blamelessly is sufficient either for believing in ways that is consistent with discharging our epistemic duties or for justification. Does this argument avoid the difficulties with the deontologist’s argument for internalism?

Externalists respond in two ways. Some might grant (P1), but question (P2). As they see it, even if a thinker forms her beliefs in responsible ways, she might nevertheless violate a norm or fail to meet some standard and do so excusably. Following Austin (1956), they might maintain that excuses and justifications can both shield an individual from blame or responsibility whilst insisting that the former is insufficient for the latter. Some externalists have argued that internalism about responsibility or blamelessness is compatible with externalism about justification (Littlejohn 2012; Sutton 2007; Williamson forthcoming).

The first premise, (P1), is also controversial. Internalism is typically understood as a time-slice view (i.e., that the internal conditions that determine whether a thinker has justification to believe at a time are limited to those conditions that obtain at that very time). Some externalists have argued that conditions that obtained in the past might matter to whether a belief is responsibly held now. Imagine two ways that Sally might have come to believe that broccoli is healthy: she might have read this somewhere reputable (the good case) or she might have come to believe this by relying on a clearly disreputable source (the bad case). We often retain a belief without storing the evidence on which it was originally based. It might seem that in the good case version, Sally might responsibly believe now the things that she responsibly believed initially. In the bad case, Sally might now be internally just like Sally is in the good case, but it might seem that her belief is not now responsibly held since it was not responsibly formed initially. Losing the grounds or information that Sally originally based her belief on does not seem to some externalists to ‘turn’ an irresponsibly formed belief into one that she can now responsibly hold (Goldman 1999). It should be noted that not all internalists find these sorts of cases convincing. Feldman and Conee (2001) think that the bad case might be a case of justification because things like the ‘conscious qualities’ of her recollection might serve to justify her belief even when the belief was not initially based on adequate grounds.

Finally, there is the rationalist argument for justification:

From Internalism about Rationality to Internalism about Justification

P1. If A and B are internal duplicates and they form the same beliefs in the same ways, A rationally believes iff B rationally believes.

P2. If A and B are both rational in holding their beliefs, both of their beliefs are justified.

C. If A and B are internally alike, A will have justification to believe iff B has justification to believe.

Both premises are controversial. It would not be uncommon for externalists to question (P2) on the grounds that they doubt that the epistemic status we describe using the language of rationality is the same as the status we describe using the language of justification. Reliabilists like Bach (1985), Engel (1992b), and Goldman (1986) have said that their theories of justification are not meant to be theories of rational belief. Other externalists have suggested that rationality might differ from justification in an important way. It seems not to be a rational failure to form beliefs provided that the available information or apparent reasons have been processed correctly, but justification might require something further or something else (e.g., being supported by genuine reasons rather than merely apparent ones, being appropriate given facts that the individual might have overlooked, forgotten, or been non-culpably ignorant of). For further discussion of possible differences between rationality and justification, see Littlejohn (2012), Siscoe (2021), and Sylvan (2018).

Internalists push back against this line in one of two ways. Cohen (1984) says that terms like ‘justified’ and ‘rational’ are essentially synonyms. He adds that even if we doubt or deny this, there is no denying that the notion that has interested many epistemologists is the notion of rationality. Gibbons (2013) argues that justification and rationality ultimately come to the same thing, defending a view according to which the requirements of rationality are normative in such a way that it would be impossible to deny the equivalence. (Similar views about the normativity of rationality have been defended by Kiesewetter (2017) and Lord (2018).)

Internalists often argue that externalism cannot capture the idea that justification or justification-conferring factors are supposed to provide a thinker with guidance. Some philosophers think that whatever has normative significance must be able to provide guidance and that this favours an internalist approach to guidance. Ginet (1975) argues that a thinker must be able to tell that justification is absent on the grounds that in any situation in which a thinker should respond in some way, she must be able to respond in that way. Huemer argues for something similar:

… there cannot be a pair of cases in which everything seems to a subject to be the same in all epistemically relevant respects, and yet the subject ought, rationally, to take different doxastic attitudes in the two cases—for instance, in one case to affirm a proposition and in the other to withhold. (Huemer 2006)

If these arguments succeed, what kind of internalism do they support? They might be taken to support the relatively modest idea that the grounds that determine what we have justification to believe are accessible to the thinker, or the more demanding view that we also have access to the adequacy or inadequacy of the accessible grounds that determine what there is justification to believe:

The internalist assumes that, merely by reflecting upon his own conscious state, he can formulate a set of epistemic principles that will enable him to find out, with respect to any possible belief he has, whether he is justified in having that belief. (Chisholm 1988: 286)

Many have argued that internalists and externalists alike should agree that a thinker might be under a requirement to respond in some way (or refrain from so doing) even if they are not in a position to know this response is required (Littlejohn 2012; Sorensen 1995; Srinivasan 2015b; Williamson 2000). If this is right, that might suggest that there are important normative notions that do not provide the kind of guidance the internalist alleges must be provided by any genuinely normative notion. Suppose there is a norm that enjoins someone to refrain from X-ing if condition C obtains (e.g., if we are angry, we should not to go bed; if we do not have a sufficiently high degree of rational confidence, we should not believe; if we do not feel cold, we should not turn on the heat; if the radio is too loud, we should not turn it louder). Even if some agent had perfect knowledge of the norms governing belief, this agent still might not be able to discern in her present situation what she would be required to do if she couldn’t be certain that C obtains whenever it does, and that suggests that the norms that have C as an application condition do not provide the kind of guidance thought to be built into normative notions. Some have argued that even internal conditions are not luminous (Williamson 2000). Debates about whether there are any luminous conditions persist (Berker 2008; Srinivasan 2015a). There are continued attempts to show that the presence or absence of justification is something that we can always know or, at least, have justification to form beliefs about (Kiesewetter 2016; Smithies 2012a).

2.3 Evidence and Justification

Some epistemologists appeal to theories of evidence to motivate internalism. According to contemporary evidentialists, a thinker’s evidence completely determines what she has justification to believe (Adler 2002; Conee and Feldman 2004; McCain 2014). If a thinker has sufficient evidence for believing p, she has a justification to believe p. If, however, a thinker has a justification to believe p, she must have evidence that provides adequate support for this belief. Given the connection between evidence and justification, some internalists might argue that internalism about evidence supports internalism about justification (Silins 2005):

From Evidentialism to Internalism

P1. It is impossible for there to be differences in the justification there is for two thinkers if these thinkers have the same total evidence.

P2. It is impossible for two thinkers to differ in terms of their total evidence if they are internally indiscernible.

C. Thus, it is impossible for there to be differences in the justification there is for two thinkers if they are internally indiscernible.

The literature contains very different responses to this kind of argument. Some object to the argument by questioning the first premise, (P1). Philosophers interested in knowledge of our own actions (Anscombe 1957), knowledge of our own bodies (Anscombe 1962), perceptual knowledge (Austin 1962; Brewer 2011; Davidson 1986; McGinn 2012; Travis 2013), and memorial knowledge (Audi 1995; Malcolm 1963; Moon 2012) have argued that there are forms of propositional knowledge that do not require supporting evidence. Whilst Audi describes this kind of knowledge as knowledge without justification, some think of these cases as cases where something provides justification without furnishing the thinker with evidence that in turn secures this normative status. Additionally, some externalists challenge (P1) on the grounds that the combination of internalism and evidentialism supports a kind of scepticism that most contemporary epistemologists reject (Greco 2000).

(P2) is also controversial. Some argue for evidential internalism by appeal to considerations about basing. A common suggestion is that there is propositional justification to believe when a thinker’s evidence gives them the support needed to properly believe something and that doxastic justification requires that our beliefs are based on good reasons or evidence. Philosophers often say that an individual’s responses are based on some grounds or evidence only if they are causally connected in the appropriate way to these grounds or evidence (Davidson 1963; Korcz 1997). Some philosophers then argue that the (proximate) causes of our beliefs are always internal factors (Huemer 2007; Wedgwood 2002). Because of this, evidential internalism might seem quite plausible. It might suggest that the only rational bases we can have for our beliefs consists of evidence that supervenes upon internal factors. These arguments have been resisted in a number of ways. Some philosophers think that our talk of a basis is ambiguous between a causal-explanatory basis and an evidential basis (Swain 1979). Some would argue that a thinker’s basis must be the kind of thing that might be identical to good reasons to believe (where these are sometimes facts about the situation that do not supervene upon internal conditions) (Dancy 2000; Alvarez 2010) and others defend views on which the good reasons must only be suitably related to subject’s reasons for responding that way (Mantel 2018; Mitova 2017). It might be enough, for example, that the subject’s reasons represent the good reasons there are for responding that way.

Difficulties for (P2) arise when we try to give an informative account of what a thinker’s evidence might be. If we understand the internal in terms of the accessible, it seems that the evidential internalist might be committed to two claims:

Positive Accessibility: If something is part of the thinker’s evidence, the thinker has reflective access to it.

Negative Access: If something is not part of the thinker’s evidence, the thinker can tell by reflection that it is not.

On a (non-factive) mentalist understanding of the internal, the evidential internalist has to say that a thinker’s evidence supervenes upon her non-factive mental states. Arguments for identifying a thinker’s evidence with her knowledge present difficulties for both views:

E=K: A thinker’s evidence includes p iff the thinker knows that p. (Hyman 2006; Williamson 2000)

Given the modest anti-sceptical assumption that the scope of our knowledge includes facts that are not reflectively accessible (e.g., facts about external objects we see, facts about events we remember), it seems that E=K conflicts with Positive Accessibility. E=K also presents problems for Negative Access. Suppose that Agnes knows that she has limbs and her brain in a vat counterpart falsely believes that it has limbs. Whilst Agnes’s evidence, according to E=K, would include the known fact, the brain in a vat counterpart cannot tell by reflection that its evidence does not include the fact that it has limbs. The conflicts between non-sceptical assumptions, E=K, and (non-factive) mentalism should now also be apparent. While (non-factive) mentalists are not committed to Positive or Negative Access, they are committed to the claim that thinkers in the same non-factive mental states must have the same evidence. Given E=K, that commits them to the sceptical view that we can never know more about the external world that our non-factive mental duplicates can.

E=K is highly controversial. The (non-factive) mentalists reject it (Conee and Feldman 2008; McCain 2014). Some object to E=K on the grounds that the kind of accidental connections between believers and facts that preclude knowledge do not prevent us from acquiring evidence. In fake barn cases, for example, it might seem that we cannot know that the building we see is a barn, but perhaps this does not prevent us from acquiring as evidence the fact that it is a barn (Hughes 2014; Locke 2015; Mitova 2017). (This description of the case is controversial (Schellenberg 2018).) Someone sceptical of evidential internalism might observe that weaker views than E=K spell trouble for the view. Taking the modest anti-sceptical assumption that we have some immediate knowledge of the external world for granted, the evidential internalist must deny (at least) one of the following claims:

Weak Propositionality: Some evidence is propositional.

Factivity: All propositional evidence consists of true propositions or facts.

Immediacy: Anything known non-inferentially belongs to a thinker’s evidence.

Some philosophers reject Weak Propositionality and maintain that a thinker’s evidence supervenes upon the thinker’s non-factive mental states because the thinker’s evidence consists of the thinker’s mental states (Conee and Feldman 2008; Turri 2009; Mitova 2017; Gibbons 2010). This approach conflicts with the idea that a thinker’s evidence should include the kinds of things that figure as premises in inferential reasoning, but it at least preserves some connection between evidence and that which figures in reasoning in some sense. (Neta (2008) and Williamson (2000) provide defences of Weak Propositionality.) Some object to this psychologised approach to evidence on the grounds that it deprives us of too much evidence to make sense of our ordinarily optimistic assessments of the things we have justification to believe when we lose our original evidence (Goldman 1999). This problem might seem particularly pressing for views that identify a thinker’s evidence with her experiences and conscious states as it seems to suggest that we lack justification for our beliefs when dreamlessly sleeping (Moon 2018).

An alternative strategy for developing the evidential internalist view is to embrace Weak Propositionality and allow that a thinker’s evidence includes propositions about things external to the subject and her perspective on the world but allow that this evidence might be constituted by false propositions (Comesana and McGrath 2016; Fantl and McGrath 2012). On this proposal, a thinker who sees a red thing in her surroundings might have this in her evidence: that this object is red. If some second thinker has a similar conscious experience but sees a non-red object that appears red, she might still have this in her evidence: that this object is red. The fact that this proposition is false in the second scenario does not prevent that proposition from being included in this thinker’s evidence (e.g., the contents of experiences that we have no reason to distrust might be part of our evidence whether they happen to be true or false). Thus, we might agree with Williamson that what a subject knows directly (e.g., via perception) is included in her evidence but then insist that if we hold fixed certain subjective aspects of a second thinker’s mental life and subtract away external conditions (e.g., accuracy, a non-accidental connection between our mental states and the facts) this second thinker’s evidence remains the same. Some object to the introduction of false reasons or false evidence on broadly linguistic grounds (Unger 1975). One might also worry that the introduction of false evidence might require a revision to some standard assumptions about the way rational thinkers update their beliefs in light of new evidence. When thinkers conditionalise on their evidence, the evidence that they update on is learned with certainty and will remain certain as new evidence is acquired. It is difficult to see why something would have this status when conceptually sophisticated thinkers would be cognisant of the fact that the evidence they acquire and update on might be false. Alternative update rules and the costs and benefits of their adoption have been explored in the literature (Das 2022; Gallow 2021; Schoenfield 2017). One further worry concerns the problem of inconsistent evidence (Littlejohn and Dutant 2022; Williamson 2000). It is not clear how the defenders of the non-factive view can rule out the possibility of inconsistent evidence, but it is also not clear how an inconsistent body of propositions might support some things and not others if this body of evidence entails everything.

A third option (which preserves Weak Propositionality and Factivity) is to introduce a restriction that in effect precludes the possibility that a thinker’s evidence includes any propositions that pertain to external objects or events. If a thinker’s evidence consisted entirely of propositions about the thinker’s present mental life, the problems from above might not arise. This view might seem to be overly sceptical to some. It also might be objected that this view gets the subject matter of our evidence wrong as it often pertains to external things and their properties rather than things internal to the thinker (Comesana and McGrath 2016). Given the weak assumption that that which is known directly is part of our evidence, this view forces us to either deny that knowledge of the external world is possible or insist that it is only made possible via inference. It might seem particularly difficult to see how we can make sense of optimistic claims about the possibility of knowledge of the past if the evidential basis for all beliefs about history consist of things we can know immediately about our present mental lives. It should also be noted that this picture of evidence is the target of McDowell’s (1994; 1995) critique of the ‘hybrid’ view of knowledge. McDowell rejects the idea that a suitable theory of the knowledge relation will describe knowledge as a combination of independent factors where part of standing in that relation is a matter of having adequate reason and part of it has to do with accurately matching the world. For further discussion of McDowell’s epistemological disjunctivism, see Conee and Feldman 2008 and Pritchard 2012.

2.4 The New Evil Demon Objection

The new evil demon objection was initially used to show that the connection to the truth that justification provides should not be understood in terms of reliability (Lehrer and Cohen 1983; Cohen 1984; Foley 1985). Consider the reliabilist view that says that justification requires, inter alia, that the processes that produce our beliefs are sufficiently reliable in the environments in which they produce our beliefs (Goldman 1979). We assume that those processes are reliable in the environments in which they are actually used, but let’s imagine a subject internally like us who comes to believe what they do because a Cartesian demon has manipulated things so that the internal states that dispose this subject to believe what we do are not connected to the external realities that these beliefs concern. The internalists think that it is intuitive to say here that the deceived subject is just as justified as we are in forming the beliefs that they do.

One conclusion that might be taken from this is that justification does not require reliability where reliability is understood in terms of the ratio of success to failure in the environments in which the processes were operative. Some externalists say that their views are immune to these examples (Bergmann 2006), but we might draw a more general lesson from this example; namely, that justification supervenes upon the internal factors that are common to subjects in good cases (i.e., subjects who acquire knowledge by relying on accurate observations and memories) and the bad cases (i.e., subjects who cannot acquire knowledge because appearances are not connected to reality in the right way and consequently will either get things wrong systematically or only get things right by luck) (Wedgwood 2002). Because of this, it is not clear whether externalists can remain true to their views while promising to vindicate the intuitive verdicts that internalists appeal to. (For an argument that this thought experiment needs to be formulated with care to test externalist theories, see Gerken 2018).

The argument against externalism about justification might be stated like this:

The new evil demon argument

P1. When we compare subjects who know or justifiably believe to their internal duplicates stipulated to be systematically deceived, these subjects seem equally justified.

P2. On externalist views, some external condition that is supposed to be necessary for justification is missing in the situations where our duplicates are systematically deceived.

C. Thus, these externalist views are mistaken because they mistakenly imply that these internal duplicates of ours are not justified in their beliefs.

Externalists typically respond by denying that the deceived subjects have justification, trying to formulate views that accommodate the intuitions that underwrite the objection, or by conceding that the internalist is right about something whilst insisting that there is some important notion that depends upon external factors.

Some reliabilists respond by saying that justification requires reliability but then offering an account of reliability according to which a reliable process does not necessarily produce a sufficiently high ratio of true to false beliefs in the environment in which it is operative. Goldman, for example, has suggested that to test whether a belief is justified, we should see whether the processes that produced it would be reliable in ‘normal’ environments, ones that fit with our general beliefs about how our world works (Goldman 1986: 107). The situation in which the demon is operative is not normal, but it might be that the processes operative would produce more desirable outcomes in normal environments. Majors and Sawyer (2005) suggest that justification requires reliability in ‘home worlds’ (i.e., environments in which the contents of our thoughts are determined). (For further refinements of the simple construal of reliability, see P. J. Graham 2017; Henderson and Horgan 2011; Sosa 1993.) While these responses retain a role for some notion of reliability in the theory of justification, internalists might wonder whether these views do justice to internalist intuitions if, in the end, the view denies that the conditions necessary for justification supervene upon internal factors. Externalists might wonder whether these reliabilist views stay true to the considerations that made reliabilism attractive (Lyons 2013). Not all reliabilists agree we should modify the notion of reliability to accommodate the intuitions that support (P1) (Bach 1985; Engel 1992b).

Some externalists reject (P1) because they think that only subjects in the good case have adequate reasons for their beliefs. This position is often associated with epistemological disjunctivists. Some such disjunctivists would argue that the reasons we acquire when we have genuine perceptual contact with our surroundings are different from and superior to the we might acquire when hallucinating (Brewer 1997; McDowell 1995; Neta and Pritchard 2007; Schellenberg 2016).

Typically, externalists who reject (P1) agree that it is important to say something to accommodate or explain away the intuitions that seem to support (P1). Some have suggested that internalists who accept (P1) are conflating two kinds of epistemic evaluation and, relatedly, two notions of justification. Just as some ethicists think that the evaluations of agents and their actions ought to be carefully distinguished, some epistemologists suggest that we should take care to distinguish the evaluation of belief from the evaluation of the believer (Bach 1985; Engel 1992b; Lowy 1978). If even the most conscientious, capable, and careful believer might form an unjustified belief (e.g., in particularly challenging situations), it might be fitting to positively evaluate the believer without positively evaluating the believer’s belief. Critics say that this response fails because ascriptions of personal and doxastic justification are more intimately connected than these authors suggest (Kvanvig and Menzel 1990).

Externalists have also claimed that internalists are conflating justification (which is not an internalist notion by their lights) with some other epistemic notion that might be an internalist notion. For example, some epistemologists will say that internal duplicates are alike in terms of what is rational for them to believe, reasonable to believe, or responsible for them to believe while allowing or insisting that these judgments might not imply that the relevant beliefs would be justified (Bach 1985; Engel 1992b; Sutton 2007; Wedgwood 2002). Relatedly, some have argued that internalists are mistakenly classifying excusable norm violations as justified (Littlejohn 2012; Williamson forthcoming). There is considerable controversy about how we should draw the distinction between justification and excuse and apply that distinction in an epistemic setting (Boult 2017; Brown 2018; Fantl and McGrath 2012). Internalists often claim there is no difference between thinking of beliefs as justified and thinking of them as rational, reasonable, or responsible (Gibbons 2010; Langsam 2008; Naylor 1988). As Cohen remarked in one of the earliest presentations of the example:

… ‘reasonable’ and ‘rational’ are virtual synonyms for ‘justified’. But we need not quibble over semantics. If the Reliabilist wants to distinguish ‘justified’ from ‘reasonable’ or ‘rational’ he may do so. But clearly the important epistemic concept, the one epistemologists have been concerned with, is what the Reliabilist would call ‘reasonability’ or ‘rationality’. (Cohen 1984: 284)

3. Arguments for Externalism

We will examine some of the most influential arguments for externalism about justification.

3.1 The Truth-Connection

An early argument for externalism about justification appealed to observations about the connection between justification and truth (Alston 1988a; Engel 1992b; Goldman 1986; Swain 1985; Vision 2005). Consider three observations about justification:

… cognitive justification is the sort of justification which distinguishes true belief that is knowledge from true belief that is little more than a lucky guess. This being so, such justification could not possibly turn out to be a property that a belief might possess in complete independence of the truth of its object. (Sosa 1985: 13)

One is justified in believing that p only if that belief was formed in such a way as to make it at least very likely that the belief is true … or … in a ‘truth-conducive’ way. (Alston 1988b: 285)

If epistemic justification were not conducive to truth … if finding epistemically justified beliefs did not substantially increase the likelihood of finding true ones, then epistemic justification would be irrelevant to our main cognitive goal and of dubious worth. (BonJour 1985: 8)

We might appeal to these observations to try to motivate externalism. A kind of objective connection between belief and truth (e.g., that the objective probability of a belief being true given the presence of justification-conferring factors is greater than it would be in their absence) is either necessary for justification to have value or required for justification to play its designated role in turning true belief into knowledge. We might think of these as the evaluative and epistemicising arguments respectively.

The evaluative argument assumes that justification is always valuable from the epistemic point of view and that its value is due to its truth-conducivity. The idea that the value of justification is variable (i.e., that some but only some justified beliefs are epistemically valuable) might be difficult for some epistemologists to countenance, but perhaps there are reasonable grounds for doubting that the value that justification always has derives from its (alleged) truth-conducivity. Some of the intuitions from discussions of the swamping problem might matter here (Zagzebski 1996; 2004). Suppose true belief is inherently epistemically good. Is it plausible that true beliefs are epistemically better if they are also justified if being justified is just understood in terms of truth-conducivity? It might seem that the epistemic value of a true belief is not increased just because the means by which it was formed were reliable. (This point, of course, is not wholly uncontroversial (Pettigrew 2019; Dutant 2013).) It might also seem that if the value of justification derived from truth-conducivity, its presence in the case of false belief might ‘turn out’ to add nothing of value to the belief in question. (If the value of justification derives from the fact that it is conducive to something further that is desirable, does it retain its value when we know that this further thing does not obtain?) It might be said that justification is always of epistemic value because it is inherently valuable, but if we adopt a pluralism about epistemic value (DePaul 2001; Kvanvig 2005), truth-conducivity might play little role in explaining why the value justification has is realised. It might also be thought that the best account of justification’s (alleged) inherent value derives not from truth-conducivity but from the normative character of justification. There might be some sense in which it is better to do one’s duty or fulfil one’s obligation than not, but the sense in which this is true might itself be understood in normative terms (i.e., the sense in which it is better is precisely that a duty was fulfilled) instead of evaluative terms (Foot 1985).

Looming over this discussion is the new evil demon problem. Some would argue that the evaluative argument fails on the grounds that we know already that justification is only contingently connected to truth-conducivity (Madison 2017). Some might cite intuitions about cases of error and deception to try to turn the tables on the externalists by arguing that some internalist alternative provides a better understanding of the connection between justification and truth. This might be done in terms of some notion of evidential fit (Conee and Feldman 2004), an internalist-friendly notion of epistemic probability (Fumerton 2004a), expected epistemic value (Dorst 2019; Easwaran 2016; Dutant and Littlejohn 2024), or the responsible pursuit of truth (Naylor 1988).

The epistemicising argument for externalism about justification appeals to claims about the role that justification plays in our theory of the difference between knowledge and true beliefs that fail to constitute knowledge. One challenge to this style of argument emerges from reflection on Gettier cases (Cruz and Pollock 2004). A standard response to Gettier’s (1963) cases is to say that the thinker has justification but not warrant. It is warrant (rather than justification) that is supposed to eliminate the accidental connection between the factors that justify and the truth so that a true belief held with justification amounts to knowledge (Zagzebski 1994).

3.2 Explanatory Challenges

When Goldman proposed his reliabilist theory of justification, his aim was to give an explanatory theory of justification, a theory that:

… explains in a general way why certain beliefs are counted as justified and others as unjustified … I do not try to prescribe standards for justification that differ from, or improve upon, our ordinary standards. (Goldman 1979: 89)

He offered a reliabilist theory that was meant to state the truth-conditions for claims about justification in non-epistemic terms much in the way that ethicists often try to state the necessary and sufficient conditions for an act being right (Goldman 1979, 80). The explanatory argument for externalism can be stated as follows:

The Explanatory Argument for Externalism

P1. A theory of justification should explain why certain beliefs are justified (or unjustified) according to our ordinary standards.

P2. Externalist theories (e.g., reliabilism) better explain why the beliefs that are justified (or unjustified) according to these standards attain that status.

C. So, we should prefer an externalist theory to its internalist rivals.

Consider some claims about justification that we might want our theories to explain:

Storage: Much of what we know and justifiably believe are things we continue to take to be true even though we have lost the grounds that initially convinced us that these things are true.

Starting Points: Small children learn quite a lot by relying on the testimony of adults.

Epistemic Poverty: A thinker who was brought up in an isolated culture and believes unhesitatingly the traditions of their group will not necessarily have justification to believe the things they are told (e.g., about witchcraft, creation, the afterlife) even though they might have no access to evidence that would correct their erroneous beliefs.

Generality: Not only do epistemic facts supervene upon non-epistemic facts, there seem to be general principles that connect non-epistemic facts to epistemic facts that identify important patterns of dependence.

For each of these claims, an externalist has argued that some externalist view provides the best (or only) explanation.

In connection with the knowledge and justified beliefs stored in memory, we might find two closely related challenges to internalist theories of the latter. First, there is the issue that much of what we know and come to justifiably believe on the basis of evidence is retained in memory. If our initial evidence for this belief is lost to time and no new evidence is acquired, we can present this argument against standard internalist views. The thinker knows now what she learned earlier without now having evidence that supports her beliefs. Thus, the thinker has justification to believe what she now believes without supporting evidence (Pappas 1980; 1983). The best explanation as to why this thinker now justifiably believes what she does will appeal to external factors (e.g., the reliability of her memory and facts about the adequacy of her evidence when she originally formed her beliefs). To this, internalists might say that if justification is understood in terms of responsibility, the internalist might say that the relevant beliefs can be justified on the grounds that it is not irresponsible to rely on memory in the absence of reasons to doubt its reliability or accuracy (McGrath 2007). Alternatively, internalists might say that we do have evidence now that supports these beliefs in the form of the apparent memory (e.g., perhaps the truth of the relevant belief is part of the best explanation as to why it now seems we remember this) (Frise 2017).

The second challenge arises for internalists who want to offer some story that purports to explain how it is possible to have persisting justification given the loss of original supporting evidence (Goldman 1999; Greco 1990). Suppose there are adequate internal factors that explain how a thinker who learned initially that, say, broccoli is good for heart health is justified now in believing this. Whatever these factors are (e.g., the feelings of conviction that accompany the belief, the impression that the thinker must have read or heard this before), the internalist thinks these presently obtaining internal factors (‘pi-factors’) suffice for justification. Imagine a second subject who came to believe the same proposition but initially believed it for reasons that were inadequate (e.g., they relied on a notoriously unreliable source when they formed the belief but forgot their original grounds). This subject forms an unjustified belief initially, but at this later time has a belief accompanied by the same pi-factors as the subject who has a justified belief. The second subject’s belief at this later time is either justified or not. If the internalist says that an unjustified belief remains unjustified at this later time despite the fact that this subject is now internally like the subject who has a justified belief, the view might seem somewhat externalist since facts about the past that do not supervene upon the pi-factors distinguish the justified from the unjustified belief. If, however, the internalist says that the pi-factors are sufficient to justify the beliefs of both subjects, the internalist has to defend the controversial idea that a belief can enjoy an epistemic upgrade, turning from unjustified initially to justified later, by losing the grounds that initially supported the belief.

Internalists can respond to these challenges by trying to defend the view that these subjects have adequate evidence presently that justifies beliefs presently held (even if, perhaps, they lacked adequate evidence initially) (Conee and Feldman 2004). They might also question the insistence that the internal is limited to the present (BonJour 2001; Fantl 2020). The force of the challenge will depend upon whether losing information over time can improve the epistemic status of our beliefs (Lackey 2005a; 2007; Senor 2007).

Consider the problems presented by children. Observations about the things that small children are purported to know loom large in debates about testimonial knowledge and justification (Lackey 2005b). In this setting, there is disagreement about whether attributing testimonial knowledge to small children is a problem for reductionist views about testimonial justification according to which testimonial justification requires supporting evidence that the recipient of testimony can rely on to confirm the reliability of the source or of this piece of testimony (Fricker 1995; P. J. Graham 2018; Goldberg 2008).

Internalists might respond by arguing that, properly understood, children might meet the conditions imposed by their theories of justification on the grounds that those requirements are relatively lightweight (P. J. Graham 2018). Alternatively, internalists might suggest that the beliefs of children can attain an important kind of positive status that merits the label ‘justified’ even if it differs significantly from the kind of justification that attaches to the beliefs of mature and responsible adults (Leite 2004) or that there is a kind of ‘sliding scale’ that can be used to evaluate the beliefs of children and adults so that it is relatively easy for children to acquire justification and knowledge given that they cannot be expected to scrutinise reasons in the way that we can (Smith 2002).

There are more general problems associated with general epistemic rules or principles. These principles identify conditions that (defeasibly) confer justification upon our beliefs. Externalists and internalists might generally agree that (in the absence of defeaters) a belief can be justified if formed in response to experience, the promptings of memory, introspection, proprioception, and so on. It seems that some sources give us beliefs that are justified, some do not, and one might hope there is a unifying explanation that explains the difference between good and bad sources or grounds for belief.

Following Goldman (1986), the externalist might suggest that a set of rules (‘J-rules’) identifies features that can help confer justification upon our beliefs and that beliefs are justified when permitted by the right system of J-rules. If the factors cited by such rules are internal factors (e.g., we specify them with reference to experience, apparent memory, etc.), this set-up might seem to favour the internalist, but Goldman notes that there is a question about the criteria of rightness that ultimately determines which (putative) J-rules belong to this system. His proposed criterion of rightness fits with the reliabilist vision in that conforming to the genuine J-rules results in a sufficiently good ratio of true to false beliefs. Structurally, this is similar to a rule-consequentialist picture in ethics where acts are evaluated in light of rules which, in turn, are seen as conferring positive status upon acts because conforming to them promotes something of value (Hooker 2000). Even if the rules mentioned only internal factors, the view of justification would be externalist because external conditions ultimately determine which J-rules belong to the system that confers justification.

The explanatory argument for externalism appeals to two key ideas. The first is that some externalist theories (e.g., reliabilism) can explain why some collection of J-rules have that status (i.e., being the rules that determine which beliefs are justified) when alternative descriptions of belief-forming processes do not capture J-rules. The second is that internalist theories do not have the resources to explain this. Other things equal, we might prefer explanatory theories to theories that do not explain the relevant observations. Critics might say that not all is equal, however. The reliabilist must acknowledge that it is a contingent fact about the J-rules that conforming to them is truth-conducive, but many internalists seem to think that there is a necessary connection between, say, believing with justification and believing the things that our experiences or apparent memories indicate (Cohen 1984). Moreover, the internalist can say that there is an explanation as to why the factors cited in the J-rules confer justification when others do not, by arguing that there is an apriori connection between believing in response to the presence of such factors and pursuing epistemic goals in rational ways (Cruz and Pollock 2004; Enoch and Schechter 2008; Kelley 2024; Wedgwood 1999).

3.3 Epistemic Norms

Some externalists about justification argue for their view by appealing to the idea that belief is governed by epistemic norms that have external conditions in their application condition (Littlejohn 2012; Sutton 2007; Williamson 2007). Much in the way that there might be a legal norm that says, inter alia, that a person should not enter another person’s home without the owner’s consent, there might be an epistemic norm that enjoins us not to believe or assert falsehoods (McHugh 2012; Steglich-Petersen 2013; Whiting 2013) or things that we do not know (Sutton 2007; Williamson 2000). These externalists maintain that the existence of such norms supports externalism about justification:

The Argument from Externalist Epistemic Norms

P1. A thinker has justification to believe p only if she can believe p without violating any epistemic norms.

P2. Among the norms she must conform to are externalist norms (i.e., norms with external application conditions).

C. Thus, among the conditions that can determine whether a thinker has justification to believe p are external conditions.

The proponents of this argument will need to defend the position that justification requires norm conformity. If, say, there is a norm that requires us to refrain from believing when the evidence is insufficient, we conform to this norm iff we do in fact avoid believing when the evidence is insufficient. It might seem that the point of justification is that the justified response is one that violates no norm. (Or, at any rate, if the norm states some pro tanto ‘ought’, does not violate such a norm unless some second norm requires it, as we find when a person’s decision to miss a meeting is justified thanks to the fact that they needed to intervene in some emergency.) Additionally, they will need to show that there are indeed norms that have application conditions that are not internal.

Critics of this kind of argument challenge both premises. While there has been a considerable amount of work done to try to show that the best explanation of a range of data about proper belief and warranted assertion invokes a knowledge norm, many have argued that the norm does not need to be formulated in such a way that it has an external application condition. Consider the observation that we should not assert or believe that the ticket we hold for a fair lottery has lost (Nelkin 2000). We might explain this by noting that we cannot know lottery propositions (e.g., because they do not satisfy a safety (Williamson 2000) or sensitivity (Dretske 1971; Nozick 1981) condition on knowledge). Whilst the knowledge norm is indeed an externalist norm (e.g., among other things, brains in vats that are internally similar to us will violate it if they believe the kinds of things that we know to be true), some will say that a rational belief norm properly formulated will also handle the case (e.g., Smithies (2012b)).

3.4 Morally Loaded Cases

One final argument for externalism about justification appeals to observations about ‘morally loaded cases’. The proponents of this kind of argument offer it in the hopes of shoring up support for the key assumptions in the argument from externalist epistemic norms (i.e., that there are, in fact, externalist epistemic norms and that a belief’s being justified depends upon conforming to them) (Littlejohn 2012; Williamson 2019). They think we can find support for externalism about the justification of belief by thinking about the ways in which external conditions might have a bearing on the justification of action.

In one version of the argument, the externalist alleges that internalist theories of justification must allow that it is possible for a thinker to have justification to believe morally abhorrent things. Consider a simplified version of the phenomenal conservative’s view according to which we can have justification to believe something if it seems true and there are no available defeaters (Huemer 2007). On this view, it seems we cannot rule out the possibility that a coherent Nazi, cannibal, terrorist, or abusive partner has morally abhorrent beliefs that are, by the lights of this internalist theory, justified (Littlejohn 2011; Srinivasan 2020b; Williamson 2019). Once this is granted, the internalist then has to say whether such agents could be required not to act on such beliefs. Suppose the internalist agrees that the agent has justification to do what she justifiably believes she must do (Gibbons 2009; Littlejohn 2012; Kiesewetter 2016; Way and Whiting 2016). At this point, it seems the internalist’s view must be mistaken since, by the lights of the objector, the view implies that agents have justification to do things that are abhorrent and so unjustifiable. If, however, the internalist denies that an agent is justified in doing something when she justifiably judges she must, she runs the risk of violating (putative) norms that internalists appeal to in trying to motivate their view if not the spirit of the internalist enterprise. For example, Huemer (2006) is critical of internalist views that imply that there can be normative differences between cases when there is nothing about those cases that would seem different to the individuals in such cases. If an agent is, say, required not to press a button but is required to ring a bell when she justifiably believes that she is required to do both, this seems to run afoul of his principle.

The Argument from Morally Loaded Cases

P1. By the lights of the internalist, there is no principled reason why an agent could not justifiably believe that they were required to do things that were morally abhorrent.

P2. If someone justifiably believes they are required to do something, they cannot be required to do otherwise.

C. So, the internalist must admit that there is no principled reason why the agent could not be justified in doing morally abhorrent things.

P3. However, by hypothesis, these things are abhorrent and so cannot be justified.

C2. So, the internalist theory must be mistaken.

Besides accepting externalism, what can be said in response to this argument? First, some authors have suggested that there might be actions that are, in some sense, morally evil or abhorrent even if it is wrong to say that an agent ought not perform them (Zimmerman 2008). Second, some might argue that if we allow for dilemmas of a certain kind, the internalist might say that the relevant agents might be required to act on beliefs and do things we regard as abhorrent and required not to act on such beliefs. (For a sympathetic discussion of epistemic dilemmas, see Hughes 2019.) Third, the internalist might say that the bridge principles needed to connect the justification of action to the justification of beliefs that guide action are mistaken and should be rejected (Field 2019). Fourth, internalists might try to show that (P1) is false and that there are internalist theories of justification according to which we could never have justification to believe the problematic propositions that get the problem started. In a related context, some have suggested that when bridge principles akin to (P2) hold, this is because a thinker’s evidence must always provide support for certain principles that an ideal thinker could know a priori much in the way that every body of evidence, according to the Bayesian, provides maximal support for certain logical truths (Titelbaum 2015; Wedgwood 2019).

4. Conceptions of Justification

One obstacle to resolving the disagreements between internalists and externalists stems from an apparent lack of agreement on what justification’s theoretical role might be. To make progress, epistemologists might try to identify some neutral characterisation of the notion of justification and evaluate the arguments that purport to tell us whether it would be possible for internalist or externalist notions to play this role, or pick specific theoretical roles that justification might play and try to determine whether an internal or external condition is best suited to play that specific role.

First, it is often said that justification plays some role in transforming true belief into knowledge or distinguishing knowledge from (mere) true belief (Conee and Feldman 2004). Does this conception of justification favour internalism or externalism? While it is generally agreed that the conditions that distinguish knowledge from (mere) true belief include some external conditions (Zagzebski 1994), it is unlikely this approach will advance the debate. The main difficulty is that most epistemologists agree that if we define ‘warrant’ as the thing that distinguishes (mere) true belief from knowledge (Plantinga 1993), justification is not the same thing as warrant. This is evidenced by a common reaction to cases drawn from or inspired by Gettier’s (1963) discussion. Consider a Gettier-type case:

Fake Barn: While driving through the country, Henry sees all the sorts of things one might expect to see on such a drive (e.g., tractors, farm animals) and now sees a barn in good viewing conditions. In this area, most of the apparent barns are really just carefully constructed barn façades, but he happens to be looking at the one genuine barn in the area. (Goldman 1976)

A standard response is to say that Henry does not know that this is a barn even if he forms the true belief that it is one. As such, his belief would not be warranted. Nevertheless, many think that Henry is justified in his beliefs. Thus, it seems there is a kind of justification that is not sufficient for warrant and so the fact that warrant involves external conditions is no reason to think that this notion of justification does, too.

If cases like Fake Barn make it intuitively plausible that a kind of justification is distinct from warrant, might we find support for internalism about justification? It might seem that there is a kind of epistemic luck (e.g., so-called ‘environmental’ luck (Engel 1992a; Pritchard 2012)) that threatens warrant but not justification. A possible explanation for a difference in this kind of liability might be that warrant depends upon external conditions whereas the relevant kind of justification does not.

A second approach might be to characterise justification as a property that a belief potentially has when there is an available reason, ground, or process that secures the right connection to something epistemically desirable like truth. Externalists might suggest this understanding of justification supports their preferred approach. They might think, for example, that the right connection between justification and truth must eliminate accidental connections between belief and truth so that a justified belief is somehow better from the epistemic point of view than a lucky guess (Sosa 1985). Internalists might say, in keeping with the points above, that the kind of justification they want to characterize is one that shows that justified beliefs differ from lucky guesses in only certain respects. For example, some epistemologists with sympathy for internalist approaches think that a belief has the property of being justified when it has properties that can be cited in a process of responding to a challenge (Audi 1988b). If addressing such challenges is a matter of showing that a thinker is not at fault or does not deserve criticism, it might seem that the conditions that matter to justification are all internal given the assumption that thinkers that are perfectly alike internally are equally faultless in believing what they do (Audi 2001). Externalists might be unmoved by this line of argument because they reject the idea that internally similar thinkers are always equally faultless (Greco 2005) or because they reject the idea that justification should be understood in terms of faultlessness (Goldman 1988; Littlejohn 2012; Wedgwood 2002).

Third, we have seen that justification has been understood in terms of (or linked to) rationality, responsibility, and propriety. The connections between these overtly normative conceptions and other conceptions (e.g., that which distinguishes between knowledge and some true beliefs that fail to constitute knowledge) is unclear as it is arguably the case that there can be propositional knowledge even when a subject does not display a high degree of rationality, or an impressive measure of responsibility, or perhaps should not hold the belief in question (Engel 1992a; Pritchard 2012). The connections between rationality, responsibility, and propriety themselves are contested.

Fourth, justification has been said to play a role in ‘traditional’ epistemological projects. Externalist theories have been criticised for failing to offer theories of justification that, inter alia, provide a philosophically satisfying response to sceptical challenges or give us a philosophically rich explanation of how it is that we can have knowledge in some general domain (Fumerton 1995; 2004b; Stroud 2002). Some early critics seemed to agree that the notions that answered to some of the ideas above (e.g., the transformative conception according to which justification helps turn true beliefs into knowledge, or the idea that a justification requires the presence of a truth-conducive ground or process) could be understood along externalist lines, so this criticism suggests that epistemologists on different sides of the internalism-externalism debate might be working with very different conceptions of what justification is supposed to be.

The apparent failure to find a suitably neutral characterisation of justification might warrant scepticism about finding a substantive resolution of the internalism-externalism debate. It has driven some prominent epistemologists to say that it is “thoroughly misguided” to think that ‘justified’ singles out an important objective feature of belief (Alston 2005: 11). Epistemologists who think that we can have substantive disagreements about justification might devise strategies for dealing with the plurality of the different conceptions of justification discussed in the literature.

One way to implement this idea is to focus on the link between justification and ‘ought’ and the possibility that ‘ought’ might be read in different ways. Suppose a thinker has justification to believe p when it is not the case that the thinker should not believe p (Beddor 2017). If ‘ought’ can be read subjectively (e.g., what is best in terms of expected value) and objectively (e.g., what is best in light of all of the facts), a distinction between subjective and objective justification might be introduced. Externalist theories could be seen as theories of the attitudes a thinker objectively ought to have and internalist theories could be seen as theories of the attitudes a thinker subjectively ought to have. Conflicting responses to thought experiments like the new evil demon thought experiment could be seen as tracking these different notions of justification. Should a thinker believe the falsehoods that appear true thanks to the interventions of a powerful deceiver? Objectively speaking, no. Subjectively speaking, perhaps they should, depending upon the details of the case.

The proposal to recognise different notions of justification where some fit better the theories of externalists and some the theories of internalists might be attractive to (so-called) ‘dividers’ but not to ‘debaters’ (Sepielli 2018). Dividers recognise different ways of understanding talk of normatively significant notions (e.g., that there are objective and subjective reasons, objective or subjective readings of ‘ought’, objective and subjective notions of justification, etc.), allowing that the claim that an individual ‘ought’ to believe or act might be acceptable on one reading (e.g., one that ranks options in terms of the agent’s information) but not on other admissible readings (e.g., one that ranks options in terms of all the facts) (Carr 2015). Debaters either think there is only one significant notion to understand (e.g., they might think that the only reading of ‘ought’ that captures something of normative significance focuses on an individual’s evidence) or they propose that one such notion is of primary importance (e.g., that the reading of primary importance is an objective one that is potentially sensitive to all the facts even if there are derivative readings that focus just on things like the thinker’s evidence). Some resist the debater’s intervention on the grounds that there is only one reading of the ‘ought’ that matters to epistemology (e.g., some have argued that, ‘We ought to fit our beliefs to the evidence’ is true when we read this as pertaining to an epistemic reading of ‘ought’ and there is no reading of this that uses an epistemic reading of ‘ought’ on which it is false) (Feldman 1988). There is also widespread scepticism about the idea that ‘ought’ can be read objectively and subjectively (Gibbons 2013; P. A. Graham 2021; Thomson 2003; Zimmerman 2008) as well as scepticism about the idea that on an objective reading, ‘ought’ has anything to do with our concept of justification (Huemer forthcoming). There is also the worry that this kind of pluralism undermines the idea that there is a substantive disagreement or debate to be had between the internalists and externalists (Chalmers 2011; Jenkins 2014; Kopec 2018).

To someone convinced that there is a plurality of notions with no interesting connection between them, it might seem that pursuing the debates further is fruitless and that energies might be better directed at different questions (Alston 2005). Some debaters adopt that view because they reject the idea that there are non-defective and normatively significant readings of ‘ought’ that abstract away from the perspectives of rational thinkers (Gibbons 2010; Muñoz and Spencer 2021; Zimmerman 2008). A divider might see some disagreements between debaters as substantive since the disagreements are, inter alia, disagreements about whether such a reading of ‘ought’ picks out anything of normative significance. Such dividers might recognise, for example, that internalist norms capture something of normative significance while insisting that there are further externalist norms (Littlejohn 2024; Whiting 2022). The character of these externalist norms might explain why the norms that internalist theories posit focus on certain kinds of conditions: e.g., the hypothesis that belief is governed by a knowledge-norm is used to explain why rational thinkers do not believe outright lottery propositions (Sutton 2007; Williamson 2000), or why rational thinkers believe outright in some preface-type cases but not in lottery cases (Dutant and Littlejohn 2024), or why it is not rational to believe Moorean ‘absurdities’ such as ‘Dogs bark, but I don’t know if they do’ (Huemer 2000).

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