Supplement to Formal Learning Theory

Long descriptions for some figures in Formal Learning Theory

Figure 1 description

A vertical arrow pointing up to the text “all ravens are black”. Along the arrow are three equidistant dots and to the left of each dot is a black raven and to the right a white raven. A gray fan linked to each dot has the text “not all ravens are black”. At the top of the arrow just before the arrowhead is an ellipsis.

A legend for the diagram depicts a dot with a black raven on the left and a white raven on the right and the explanation “at this point either a black or a nonblack raven is observed”.

Figure 2 description

The two parts of this figure each contain as a base the image in figure 1. The legend for the whole is also from figure 1 and has in addition a question mark with the explanation “no conclusion yet”.

The left part which is captioned “the generalizing method” has to the left of each black raven the text “all ravens are black”.

The right part which is captioned “the skeptical method” has to the left of each black raven a question mark.

Figure 3 description

The caption is “the conjecture of the natural projection rule”. The diagram is a a vertical arrow pointing up to a text stating “all emeralds are green”. This arrow has three equidistant dots on it.

For each dot on the vertical arrow, to the left and slight above is an outlined green emerald and to the left of that is the label “all green”; to the right and slightly below the dot is a solid blue emerald.

Also from each dot on the vertical arrow, a horizontal arrow points right with another dot just before its arrow head. Below each of these dots is a solid emerald. The text by the arrowhead of the lowest horizontal arrow is “all emeralds are grue(1)”. The next up horizontal arrow has “grue(2)” instead of “grue(1)” and the last has “grue(3)” instead. On the lowest horizontal arrow near the vertical line is the text “all grue(1)”; this is repeated on the same arrow just above its dot. The same on the second and third arrows with “grue(2)” and “grue(3)” substituting for “grue(1)”. In addition on the upper two arrows there is the text “First mind change” with a small arrow pointing to the first block of text.

The legend has

  • “all grue\((t)\)” = “all emeralds are grue\((t)\)”
  • “all green” = “all emeralds are green”
  • a dot with to the left and slight above an outlined green emerald and with to the right and slightly below a solid blue emerald. The explanation is “At this stage, either a green or blue emerald may be observed”

Figure 4 description

The figure shows the gruesome projection rule. The figure contains as a base the image in figure 3. The legend for the whole is also from the grue part of figure 3.

To the left of each of the three green diamonds, the three dots along the vertical arrow are labelled in order with the text items “all grue(2)”, “all grue(3)”, “all grue(4)”. The text items represent the sequence of conjectures made by the gruesome projection rule. The remainder of the figure is the same as figure 3.

Figure 5 description

The figure illustrates how identifiable hypotheses are structured as disjunctions of refutable hypotheses. The caption of the Figure reads “Both swan hypotheses: Decomposition into refutable hypotheses.”

The left half of the figure shows the decomposition of the hypothesis “Almost all swans are black”. It shows three nested circles. The innermost circle contains one black swan to represent the hypothesis “at most one black swan” shown as a label. The middle circle contains two black swans to represent the hypothesis “at most two black swans” shown as a label. The outermost circle contains six black swans to represent the hypothesis “at most n black swans” shown as a label.

The right half of the figure shows the decomposition of the hypothesis “Almost all swans are white”. It shows three nested circles. The innermost circle contains one white swan to represent the hypothesis “at most one white swan” shown as a label. The middle circle contains two white swans to represent the hypothesis “at most two white swans” shown as a label. The outermost circle contains six white swans to represent the hypothesis “at most n white swans” shown as a label.

Figure 6 description

The figure illustrates the decomposition into verirefutable hypotheses.

The caption of the left half of the figure is “Almost all swans are black”. It shows three disjoint boxes. The leftmost box contains one black swan to represent the hypothesis “exactly one black swan” shown as a label. The middle box contains two black swans to represent the hypothesis “exactly two black swans” shown as a label. The rightmost box contains four black swans to represent the hypothesis “exactly n black swans” shown as a label.

The caption of the right half of the figure is “Almost all swans are white”. It shows three disjoint boxes. The leftmost box contains one white swan to represent the hypothesis “exactly one white swan” shown as a label. The middle box contains two white swans to represent the hypothesis “exactly two white swans” shown as a label. The rightmost box contains four white swans to represent the hypothesis “exactly n white swans” shown as a label.

Figure 7 description

The figure illustrates in a typical case how an unnatural projection rule may have to change its mind twice or more. The figure contains as a base the image in figure 3. We repeat some of the description for clarity and convenience.

The diagram is a a vertical arrow pointing up to a text stating “all emeralds are green”. This arrow has four equidistant dots on it.

For each dot on the vertical arrow, to the left and slight above is an outlined green emerald; to the right and slightly below the dot is a solid blue emerald. The four dots along the vertical arrow are labelled in order with the text items “all grue(3)”, “all grue(3)”, “all green”, and “all green”. The text items represent the sequence of conjectures made by an unnatural projection rule. For the third vertical dot, an arrow points from the text “first mind change” to the conjecture label “all green”.

Also from each dot on the vertical arrow, a horizontal arrow points right with another dot just before its arrow head. Below each of these dots is a solid emerald. The text by the arrowhead of the lowest horizontal arrow is “all emeralds are grue(1)”. The next up horizontal arrow has “grue(2)” instead of “grue(1)”. The third arrow has “grue(3)”, and the last has “grue(3)” also. On the lowest horizontal arrow near the vertical line is the text “all grue(1)”; this is repeated on the same arrow just above its dot. The same on the second and third arrows with “grue(2)” and “grue(3)” substituting for “grue(1)”. The fourth arrow also substitutes “grue(1)”. In addition on the fourth arrow there is the text “Second mind change” with a small arrow pointing to the first block of text.

The legend has the explanation “The conjectures of a reliable projection rule that fails to minimize mind changes.” In addition the legend repeats the information from figure 3 as follows.

  • “all grue\((t)\)” = “all emeralds are grue\((t)\)”
  • “all green” = “all emeralds are green”
  • a dot with to the left and slight above an outlined green emerald and with to the right and slightly below a solid blue emerald. The explanation is “At this stage, either a green or blue emerald may be observed”

Figure 8 description

A chance reversal corresponds to a failure to replicate a true result. A chance reversal is illustrated in the Figure above, where the chance of conjecturing the true hypothesis is smaller for 2 samples than for 3.

The figure is an \(x\)-\(y\) plot. The \(x\)-axis is labelled “Sample Size”, the \(y\)-axis is labelled “Probability that Method conjectures true hypothesis that the coin is fair”. To the left of the origin the value 0% marks the minimum \(y\)-value. The top of the \(y\)-axis is labelled with the maximum value 100%. The \(x\)-axis is labelled with sample values \(x = 1, 2,3\) evenly spaced out. The legend of the plot is “\(p=0.5\)”.

The body of the plot shows 5 dots, the first three at locations 1,2,3, followed by 2 more dots at roughly equal distance along the \(x\)-dimension. Along the \(y\)-dimension, the dot for \(x= 1\) has the least \(y\)-value at roughly \(y= 10\)%. Dot 2 has a higher \(y\)-value than Dot 1 and Dot 3 has an intermediate \(y\)-value between Dot 1 and Dot 2. Dot 4 has a higher \(y\)-value than Dots 1 through 3 and Dot 5 the highest \(y\)-value of all dots. All successive dots are connected by directed arrows.

Copyright © 2022 by
Oliver Schulte <oschulte@sfu.ca>

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