Leibniz on the Problem of Evil

First published Mon Jan 12, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Thomas Feeney replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Leibniz was and is well known for his effort to answer the philosophical and theological problems posed by evil. Already in his own day he was gratified that his Theodicy (1710), a book-length treatment of “the goodness of God, the freedom of man, and the origin of evil,” had “pleased excellent theologians of all three main confessions” (Antognazza 2009, 482–3). Voltaire’s popular play, Candide (1759), features Dr. Pangloss, whose refusal to acknowledge the badness of things seems to caricature Leibniz’s optimism. More recently, scholars have given the problem of evil a central place in Leibniz’s thought (Rutherford 1995; Antognazza 2009). Major projects have provided access to key texts (CP; LGR; DPG), insight into the Theodicy itself (Rateau 2011; Jorgensen & Newlands 2014), and a synthetic understanding of Leibniz’s developing views (Rateau 2019).

This entry follows Leibniz’s effort to credit God for good while excusing God of evil, beginning with his first attempts in the early 1670s and culminating in his most extensive and popular published work, the Theodicy (Antognazza 2009, 480). The first section outlines Leibniz’s understanding of why evil presents a problem for his conceptions of God, freedom, and creation. The second section presents Leibniz’s first attempt at a complete answer, and the final section focuses on the emergence and coherence of Leibniz’s mature view.

1. How Leibniz Understood the Problem of Evil

The full title of the Theodicy is Essays on the Goodness of God, the Freedom of Man, and the Origin of Evil [Essais de Théodicée sur la bonté de Dieu, la liberté de l’homme et l’origine du mal]. Similarly, Leibniz’s early account of evil in the Confessio philosophi (1672–73?) begins by establishing an equivalence between “the happiness of the mind” and the “contemplation of God,” and only then raises questions about the origin of evil and the degree of human responsibility for evil within a world created and governed by God (CP, 31). Indeed, it is impossible to separate Leibniz’s treatment of evil from his broader understanding of divine goodness and human freedom. This section explains why Leibniz took evil to be a threat to the goodness of God. The following section explains how Leibniz’s earliest attempts to defeat that threat seem to undermine human freedom and moral responsibility.

Leibniz consistently maintained that God is worthy of love and praise, and that God’s worthiness may be discerned by studying creation. As he put it, “the excellence of God’s works can be recognized by considering them in themselves” and “by considering his works we can discover the creator” (AG, 36). This reasoning served a dual purpose: it provided an argument for the existence of God and challenged theological voluntarism (H, 130), the view that good and evil are determined by arbitrary divine decrees. Theological voluntarism implied that anything God had willed would have been “good” by fiat, and hence that created things in themselves provide no reason to praise and love their creator (Nadler 2011, 176). Leibniz countered that “even God discovers that some things are good, or better than others […] for God is endowed with will [and] the will is under the rule of the good” (SLT, 193). By “discovers,” Leibniz meant that the nature of goodness precedes God’s will and is grounded in “the ideas exhibiting the essences of things, which are found in [God]” (SLT, 194), analogous to how the geometrical features of circles are “discovered” in God’s ideas, not arbitrarily decreed. These ideas are necessary and eternal products of God’s own self-understanding (Nachtomy 2007, Chs. 1–2). God freely manifests God’s inherent goodness by creating a world. Within this creation, some beings (minds) possess “reason to examine good and evil, and to choose between them” (SLT, 92), enabling them to recognize the goodness in creation and respond with love and praise for God. The good exists originally in God, is expressed through God’s free act of creation, and finally is recognized and admired by human intellect and will (H, 240).

As Leibniz acknowledged, the prevalence of suffering, imperfection, and injustice in the world poses a significant challenge to his view that creation is an expression of God’s goodness (H, 100; Rateau 2019, 1–5). How could the providential sponsor of every creaturely action (Section 3.2.2) deserve love and praise if creatures sin? If “the excellence of God’s works” allows us to “discover the creator” (AG, 36), does the evil in God’s works allow us to discover faults in the creator? Under pressure from everyday interlocutors, from the works of Pierre Bayle under discussion at court in Hannover (Antognazza 2009, 382 & 480), and from his own critical reflection, Leibniz saw the need to defend God from two charges. The first charge was that God, as creator and preserver, bears direct moral responsibility for evil. This has been called the author of sin problem, following Leibniz’s own terminology (CP, xxi), but has also been called the “physical problem of evil” (McDonough 2007, 33–34) and the “holiness problem” (Murray and Greenberg, 2016). The second charge was that God should have done better, even if God is not directly responsible for sin and evil. This charge takes as a starting point the common intuition, which Leibniz shared, that the world could have been different, and specifically that it could have contained less evil (H, 380). Whereas the modern problem of evil focuses on the existence of an omnipotent, omniscient, and perfectly benevolent God (see the entry on the problem of evil), Leibniz’s effort in the Theodicy was a defense of God’s worthiness: if God truly deserves praise and love for creation, God must be somehow excused for the degree and the fact of evil in creation (Horn 2024, 8–10).

In a succinct early statement of the author of sin problem, Leibniz wrote: “He who knowingly permits sin, creates all the opportunities for sin, and brings it about that the agent can do it, indeed, provokes the will of the agent itself, and brings it about that he wants to do it—while he nevertheless could hinder the sin, indeed, could refrain from creating the opportunities and provoking the will—is to be considered the author of sin” (CP, 21). Leibniz returned to the problem in the Theodicy, where he promised to “show how it is possible for everything to depend upon God, for him to co-operate in all the actions of creatures, even, if you will, to create these creatures continually, and nevertheless not to be the author of sin” (H, 63). Leibniz considered various strategies that would distance God from evil. For example, he first rejected and then carefully reconsidered the traditional claim that evil is nothing in itself, so that God may create everything positive and real in a sinful action and even concur with a sinful agent without thereby creating evil (Section 2.1; see also McDonough 2007, 46). Another strategy, from the early theodicy, allowed a more robust ontology of evil and instead nearly eliminated the divine will’s role in creation, thereby undercutting God’s moral responsibility for evil. The mature theodicy attempted a synthesis: evil can only exist as a local imperfection in some encompassing good; God permits the local imperfections while positively willing the underlying and encompassing goods.

Leibniz states the second charge succinctly in the Theodicy itself: “one must confess that there is evil in this world which God has made, and that it would have been possible to make a world without evil or even not to create any world, since its creation depended upon the free will of God” (H, 380; see also CP, 21). With the further, plausible assumptions that God should do what is best and that a world with less evil would have been better, it follows that God should have done better. If the charge holds, then there is a symmetry between good and evil in creation, the latter reflecting badly on God just as former reflects well. Leibniz’s answer developed significantly. In his early theodicy, Leibniz denied that God could have done better, holding instead that evil and good follow together and inevitably from God, who generates or emanates all finite things as aspects of a single overarching harmony. As already noted, this answer also helped Leibniz to answer the charge that God is an author of sin, because what follows inevitably or necessarily from God need not follow voluntarily. Section 2.2 on the Confessio philosophi will more fully describe this tandem answer to both charges.

Eventually, Leibniz came to recognize that this answer is not compatible with human freedom and moral responsibility, because it is not compatible with their prerequisite, contingency (but see Sleigh 1996, 492; CP, xxxv; Lærke 2007; Lærke 2008). If all things follow necessarily and inevitably from God’s nature, then human actions cannot be considered free in any meaningful sense. It also threatened the idea that God is the author of anything (let alone sin), rather than a mere “metaphysical something, imaginary, incapable of thought, will, action, as some make out, so that it would be the same as if you said that God is nature, fate, fortune, necessity, the World” (DSR, 29; see also CP, 3 where Leibniz only five years earlier had associated God with fate). The mature theodicy took a different approach, by denying that a world “without sin and suffering […] would have been better” (H, 131; see also H, 380). That is, Leibniz argued that God should have created exactly this world, despite having the power to create a different world with less evil, because this world taken as a whole, sin and all, is better than any alternative. Leibniz defended this new reply a priori, by returning to his argument that a perfect being would only have chosen the best world, and a posteriori, by suggesting ways in which sin, suffering, and evil might characterize the world less deeply than it seems and may even make an indispensable contribution to the world’s excellence and to the happiness of individual minds.

Leibniz’s mature answer to the charge that God should have done better is the famous doctrine that this world is the best of all possible worlds—the world that expresses God’s goodness to the greatest extent possible. Whether this doctrine succeeds, on Leibniz’s own terms, depends on whether God’s free choice to create a world marked by evil makes God into the author of sin. The challenge was to allow enough contingency for divine and human freedom, thereby preserving divine providence and the possibility of human sin, without transferring any moral responsibility for evil all the way back to the creator. To meet this challenge, Leibniz developed sophisticated accounts of good and evil, of necessity and contingency, and of freedom and providence. These will be discussed in Section 3 of this entry.

2. Leibniz’s First Theodicy

This section sets the stage by considering two early works, On the Omnipotence and Omniscience of God and the Freedom of Man (1670–71?) and the Letter to Magnus Wedderkopf (1671), and then more closely examines Leibniz’s first developed theodicy in the Confessio philosophi (1672–3?). These works are translated in Robert Sleigh’s extremely helpful, dual-language volume, Confessio Philosophi: Papers Concerning the Problem of Evil, 1671–1678, cited below as CP.

2.1 Early Works (Before 1672)

Leibniz’s first known attempt to resolve the problem of evil is an incomplete German language work now called On the Omnipotence and Omniscience of God and the Freedom of Man (1670–71?). The work begins by distinguishing two questions: “how the free will of man, punishment, and reward can exist, given the omnipotence and omniscience of an all-ruling God,” and how divine predestination is compatible with the “misery of the pious” (CP, 5). This distinction corresponds to the two charges mentioned in the previous section. The all-ruling God seems to be the author of creation, the party ultimately responsible, and so it is questionable for God to hold created beings accountable. Likewise, it seems God could have protected the innocent from suffering.

Leibniz dismissed the second question by appeal to a final judgement that permanently relieves the pious and damns the wicked. Unfortunately, the appeal to damnation only makes the first question—the author of sin problem—more difficult to answer. If God is ultimately responsible for creation, the damned are in a sense predestined, and this seems to be an especially great miscarriage of justice if, as Sleigh writes, “the ultimate grounds for creaturely behavior that allegedly merits reward or punishment are beyond the control of the person so rewarded or punished and, in fact, reside in the one who rewards or punishes” (CP, 145). Rateau agrees: “predestination is the heart of the problem. It is the central question to which all the others—human freedom, divine providence, moral and physical concurrence with evil, divine justice—are connected” (Rateau 2019, 37).

For Leibniz, this was a first-order philosophical and theological problem, but also a source of enormous political and psychological strife. Previous efforts to address the problem, from the patristic period through the Reformation, confused the intellectual issues, “awakened so many sects,” and made God into a “pretense” for political cruelty and private moral laziness (CP, 6–7). Solving this problem in a manner “sufficient to explain the issue that nevertheless cannot be contradicted by anybody” would restore God’s honor and also eliminate a great source of human suffering (CP, 9). Leibniz aimed to provide just such a popular solution, which goes some way toward explaining why On the Omnipotence was written in an informal German, the Confessio philosophi was written as an engaging dialogue, and the Theodicy was seen through to publication (Antognazza 2009, 480–482).

Nevertheless, this solution proved hard to find. In On the Omnipotence, Leibniz tried to resolve the problem by adopting what Rateau (2019, 39) calls a “strictly juridical point of view.” Under this approach, the divine judge, like a human judge in a criminal trial, only asks whether the defendant acted deliberately, and whether the action was illegal. If both conditions are met, then the defendant is culpable, regardless of any extenuating circumstances. In a human court, a judge is not held responsible for various contributing factors, like poverty, upbringing, or even coercion, so long as the defendant’s will is not completely overridden. Similarly, Leibniz argued, God is only concerned with whether a creature deliberately willed an action that violated divine law. If so, then the creature is guilty and deserves punishment. The fact that God foresees the sin does not relieve this culpability, because God also foresees that it is the sinner’s fault: “if God has foreseen the end, he has also foreseen the means” (CP, 17). This juridical solution appears theologically inadequate, however, because, unlike most human judges, God “creates all the opportunities for sin, and brings it about that the agent can do it, indeed, provokes the will of the agent itself, and brings it about that he wants to do it” (CP, 21).

Leibniz could see the need to further distance God from evil, but before ending abruptly mid-sentence, the remainder of On the Omnipotence rejected two traditional ways of supplying this distance. The first is the Augustinian position that “sin is a nothing,” a mere “lack of the appropriate perfection,” such that God could be credited with creating everything and every perfection, including the sinful will and its effects, without thereby creating the sinfulness of either. Leibniz attacks this position with uncharacteristic sarcasm, on the ground that the position is absurd and, if true, would absolve sinner and God alike, leaving no one responsible for sin (CP, 23). It is absurd to claim credit for two bowings of the violin but not for the resulting dissonance, and were that allowed, no one could be held responsible. The second is the broad family of attempts to preserve divine foreknowledge while giving the human will complete causal control over its own determinations. Leibniz mentioned the Jesuit theologians, Luis de Molina (1535–1600) and Pedro da Fonseca (1528–1599), famous for the theory of middle knowledge on which God knows, prior to any act of creative will, how potentially existing creatures would freely behave in various circumstances. Even this subtle theory is lacking, Leibniz claimed, because counterfactual conditionals of creaturely freedom cannot be derived from God’s attributes and yet remain contingent (CP, 27; see also CP 130; Murray 1995; Sleigh 1994; and the entry on foreknowledge and free will). As the piece breaks off, the reader is left to conclude that sin cannot be reduced to nothing and cannot be neatly severed from God’s own being and activity—leaving only the unsatisfying juridical solution in place.

Another work, likely postdating On the Omnipotence by some months (A II.i.117–8), shows that Leibniz continued to experiment with solutions. Writing to Magnus Wedderkopf, Leibniz reiterated the juridical view that the sinner (as the proximate cause of sin) deserves punishment even though the omnipotent and omniscient “God is the author of absolutely everything” (CP, 3; see also Sleigh’s interpretive note at CP, 144). So, Pilate deserved damnation because he lacked faith, even though he lacked faith because he did not understand its value and this in turn for reasons that trace back to God. Here, however, Leibniz defended a novel version of the Augustinian view. Rather than accept that sin is nothing (and so never created), he claimed instead that “nothing is to be considered absolutely evil.” Whether something counts as an evil depends, in part, on how broadly it is considered. So, Pilate wills a sin and deserves punishment, but God wills Pilate’s sin together with its punishment and deserves praise: “[t]aken together with punishment or atonement, sins are good, i.e., harmonious. For there is no harmony except as a result of contraries.” Considering things in the broadest way possible, God brings about “the most perfect harmony” and could not have done any better (CP, 3–5).

As in On the Omnipotence, Leibniz did not claim to have met his goal to quiet the distress caused by predestination in words “sufficient to explain the issue that nevertheless cannot be contradicted by anybody” (CP, 9). Rather, he described his solution as “harsh” and asked Wedderkopf not to share it with anyone (CP, 5).

2.2 The Confessio philosophi (1672–73)

The most complete, early attempt to resolve these problems is the Confessio philosophi, a Latin dialogue between a philosopher who voices Leibniz’s views and a theologian who raises robust objections and concerns. The manuscript history is complex, and interested readers should turn to Sleigh’s translation and commentary (CP, xv–xxiv). For example, there is a revised version of the last quarter of the dialogue. There is also a written “Conversation with Steno” and marginal comments to the Confessio in the handwriting of Nicholas Steno (1638–86), a Danish scientist and Catholic theologian present with Leibniz at the court of Johann Friedrich (Antognazza 2009, 202). Steno’s comments, Leibniz’s handwritten replies, and the original conversation with Steno likely occurred in late 1677 and early 1678, around the time Leibniz revised the dialogue’s end (CP, xxiii–xxiv). Leibniz’s thinking about evil developed significantly during these years, and these later manuscripts sometimes reflect views more characteristic of his mature theodicy. This section focuses on the original version from 1672/3, in which Leibniz worked out a solution to the problems raised in On the Omnipotence and the Letter to Wedderkopf.

The Confessio continues Leibniz’s focus on the author of sin problem, which the dialogue presents forcefully in an extended passage on Judas and his motivational state before suicide. The psychological realism of this passage is driven by a commitment the philosopher and theologian share, that “nothing exists without a reason” (CP, 35). For example, having noted that Judas came to recognize his own evil before dying, the theologian asks: “You could say more briefly that he was at the same time penitent and in despair. But what is the source of this state of his soul?” (CP, 35). The philosopher acknowledges that such questions will continue indefinitely, moving from cause to cause, and that only a “self-sufficient” being could ultimately satisfy the demand for reasons. Since the pair have already accepted a demonstration that God exists as the ultimate ground of everything (CP, 35), they are driven to admit that God is also the ultimate ground of Judas’s final despair: the “ultimate ground for sin, like everything else, and hence even for damnation, is God” (CP, 38-39).

After a long pause, the philosopher proposes a novel argument: God can be the ground of sin without being the author of sin so long as God’s will is not involved in the grounding story. God does not cause mathematical truths to be true by willing them; rather, they are true simply because God understands them, and God understands them simply because God exists (CP, 43). In the same way, God is the ground of sin through the divine intellect, but in no way wills that there be sin. “Sins,” the philosopher explains, “are not due to the divine will but rather to the divine understanding or, what is the same, to the eternal ideas or the nature of things” (CP, 41).

The argument is at least initially puzzling, because mathematical truths are necessary, eternal, and abstract—whereas sin seems to be contingent, temporal, and concrete. Leibniz admitted this by having the theologian answer: “I see, but I await your reply avidly and with wonder concerning in what light can sins be viewed” (CP, 41). The novelty of the solution, it turns out, consists in holding that truths about sin are themselves quasi-mathematical, akin to the necessary relationships that govern musical harmony. Just as a musical piece may contain dissonant chords that, when properly resolved, contribute to the beauty of the composition, the existence of sin is a local discord that contributes to “a universal harmony of things, thus distinguishing the light by means of shadows” (CP, 43–-45). Somehow, the temporal and concrete reality of sin is assimilated to the eternal and abstract realm of harmonics. As the theologian summarizes, “the universal harmony is a result not of the will of God but the intellect of God, or of the ideas, that is, the nature of things. Therefore sins are to be ascribed to the same thing; accordingly, sins follow from the existence of God, not the will of God” (CP, 45).

We can make sense of this solution by returning to the original problem, as outlined in Section 1. Creation, including sin and punishment, continue to express God’s goodness if sin and punishment are not blemishes in God’s work, but instead mutually complementary parts of a larger harmony. Arguments for the existence of God that begin with creation would still lead to the existence of a perfectly good God. Moreover, God is relieved of direct moral responsibility for sin if God never wills that sin occur, and God need never will that sin occur if the universal harmony follows from the mere existence of God. The will’s activity is situated posterior to the divine intellect that grounds the existence of finite things (Rateau 2019, 65–67; Feeney 2020, 11), and so the will may respond selectively, delighted by the universal harmony and its harmonious parts, but not by the dissonant parts taken separately: “to will in favor of something is to be delighted by its existence” (CP 55). That is, God grounds everything just by knowing the universal harmony, but authors nothing, because “[t]o be the author is by one’s will to be the ground of something else” (CP, 55).

This solution also addresses the charge that God could have done better and the lingering question of whether evil itself is nothing (see Section 1 and Section 2.1). God could not have done better if creation directly expresses God’s grasp of a universal harmony: there are no better alternatives, and even the framing in terms of “alternatives” seems inappropriate if God does not exercise the divine will to choose. As to whether evil is nothing, Leibniz combined his attack from On the Omnipotence with his more conciliatory line in the letter to Wedderkopf, writing: “I suppose that this is what is meant by those who have said that the substance of the act, but not the evil, is from God, although they have been unable to explain how it is that the evil does not result from the act. They would have said more correctly that God contributes everything to sin except will, and accordingly he does not sin” (CP, 41). With On the Omnipotence, there is no way to bring about a sin without bringing about its evil, but with the letter to Wedderkopf, God never wills sin on its own and for its own sake. God wills sin only as part of a larger whole, and even then without creative force.

As signaled already in the dialogue, this is an extreme answer to the charges. For example, it seems to imply that everything is necessary, for there is no room left in the divine intellect for alternative creations and no will left that could have chosen them instead. The very distinction between creatures and God is weakened if God does not author anything: “to exist is nothing other than to be harmonious” and “[…] to exist is nothing else but to be understood to be good” (DSR, 25 & 67).

This has generated some controversy in the literature. Robert Sleigh, in his indispensable work on Leibniz’s early theodicy, sketches an interpretation of the early theodicy in the Confessio philosophi that commits Leibniz to a broadly Spinozistic necessitarianism (Sleigh 1996, 492; CP, xxxv; also Lærke 2007, 8 & 20–1; Lærke 2008, 380–381, 547–551 & 795–796). Sleigh rejects this interpretation, however, because it does not fit with Leibniz’s later rejection of necessitarianism, and does not seem to fit with Leibniz’s efforts, already in the Confessio, to carve out a sense in which created things exist contingently (CP, 55–59). In contrast, Rateau (2019, 72) and Feeney (2020, 1–2) emphasize that Leibniz’s efforts to resist necessitarianism in the Confessio do nothing to strengthen the divine will or rescue human freedom, aims that emerge fully only later, after Leibniz’s decisive encounter with Spinoza in 1676 (see also Nachtomy 2008). It may be helpful to recall that Leibniz wrote the first version of the Confessio in his mid-20s, shortly after writing other, shorter works that experiment with strong replies to evil. Leibniz himself may have been drawn in multiple, irreconcilable directions.

3. Leibniz’s Mature Theodicy

Leibniz’s mature theodicy emerged gradually over several decades through the effort to reconcile evil, divine providence, and creaturely freedom. Key texts after Leibniz’s arrival in Hannover in 1676 and before the Theodicy (1710) reveal a sustained effort to move beyond the necessitarian implications of his early attempts. This section will note important philosophical developments along the way and present the Theodicy itself. The following subsections will present the view that book contains: Leibniz’s “best possible world” solution to the charge that God should have done better (Section 3.1) and the distinctions that relieve God of moral responsibility for evil (Section 3.2). Finally, the entry will close with Leibniz’s views on redemptive suffering, or how humans should approach being a finite and vulnerable part of the best world (Section 3.3).

The revisions to the Confessio, along with the notes connected with Nicholas Steno (both dated to 1677/8), already show important developments. Recall that in the original Confessio, the existence of sin seemed to follow directly from God’s own existence (CP, 45). In the revisions, however, Leibniz bolstered his rejection of necessitarianism by distinguishing between per se and hypothetical necessity. This distinction allowed him to argue that something could follow necessarily from God’s nature, yet not be necessary per se (in itself, or absolutely) (CP, xxiv–xxv & 55–7). For instance, in the revised conclusion of the dialogue, Leibniz stated that sins are “not necessary, even if they follow from something necessary—the existence of God or the harmony of things” (CP, 59). The existence of the world might be a necessary consequence of God’s nature (hypothetical necessity), but not a consequence of its own nature (per se necessity). Likewise, the specific features of the world, including the occurrence of sin, are not themselves absolutely or per se necessary. Crucially, limiting the created world to hypothetical necessity allowed him to consider other worlds as possible in themselves. Furthermore, in his replies to Steno’s comments, Leibniz defended a more active role for the divine will in creation. He wrote that “the series [i.e., the actual world] is not posited because God is posited, except for the fact that God, who is the most-wise being, wills nothing but the best. All possible series are in the idea of God, but only one under the aspect of the best” (CP, 47). This represented a significant departure from the earlier Confessio, where the divine will played a minimal role, limited to mere approval of a pre-existing harmony. By assigning a more active role to God’s will, Leibniz could maintain that other worlds were not only possible in themselves, but also within God’s power to create. This opened room for Leibniz to argue that God exercised agency and could not have done better, having chosen the best world.

Many writings from 1680s and 1690s laid further philosophical groundwork for Leibniz’s mature theodicy. The Discourse on Metaphysics (1686) provided a detailed exposition of the complete concept doctrine of substance (AG, 40–42), and a series of works from 1689 introduced infinite analysis to explain contingency within the framework of complete concepts (A, VI.iv.1649–1664; AG, 28 & 96–97). These developments allowed Leibniz to maintain that God eternally grasps the complete concept of each possible individual substance and that finite deduction cannot demonstrate all the predicates in a given complete concept. Some features of finite substances are contingent, because there would be no (provable) logical contradiction in holding that a particular substance could have been different (see McDonough & Soysal, 2018). This supplemented the distinction between per se and hypothetical necessity. The world and all its parts are at most hypothetically necessary and any particular substance could have developed differently without contradiction (for orientation on Leibniz’s modal theories, see the entry on Leibniz’s modal metaphysics). These two levels or sources of contingency were crucial for escaping the necessitarianism of Leibniz’s earlier efforts, and they provided metaphysical context for Leibniz’s mature account of moral agency (Jorati 2017). They also supported Leibniz’s claim that God foreknows and even foreordains creaturely actions without thereby necessitating them (H, 150).

The New System (1695) publicly articulated Leibniz’s account of substance, mind-body interaction, and pre-established harmony as a test for the eventual release of his views on evil, fate and contingency (G, I.423; cited at Rateau 2019, 143). Drawing on his philosophy of science and his mathematical doctrine of optimal form, On the Ultimate Origination of Things (1697) provided a model of what it means for this world to be best (McDonough 2022, 142). This work also argued that the mathematical optimality of the world, on display in its physical principles, makes this world morally perfect as well, because “moral perfection is in reality physical perfection with respect to minds” (AG, 152–3). That is, the best world for an intelligent being is the most intelligible world. After acknowledging that experience often runs counter to this conclusion, Leibniz tested some a posteriori defenses of the “best world” thesis. These works, alongside exchanges with Arnauld, Bayle, Des Bosses and others, prepared the ground for Leibniz’s eventual account of evil, divine creation, and human freedom in the Theodicy.

The direct impetus for writing the Theodicy came from conversations at the Prussian court with Sophie Charlotte and others concerning Bayle’s Dictionnaire historique et critique (2nd edition, 1702). Leibniz, eager to defend religious truth and the conformity of faith with reason, saw an opportunity to refute Bayle’s objections and to clarify his own views on God’s justice in a world marked by evil. These courtly exchanges, later “stitched together” and expanded at the urging of friends, formed the basis for the published Theodicy (Antognazza 2009, 382 & 421). The book was finally published by Isaac Troyel of Amsterdam in 1710 under the title Essais de Théodicée sur la bonté de Dieu, la liberté de l’homme et l’origine du mal. Written in French, the work sought a wider audience than a Latin text would have, and it was the most substantial philosophical work that Leibniz published during his lifetime. Nevertheless, Leibniz chose to publish anonymously, claiming authorship only in the second edition in 1712 (Lodge 2020, 173). The term “theodicy” was Leibniz’s own coinage, derived from the Greek words theos (God) and dike (justice), and intended to signify “the doctrine of the right and justice of God” (G, II.428; cited at Lodge 2020, 173). He had first used the term in its French and Latin forms in the mid-1690s, in letters and fragments that attest to his ongoing desire to establish and communicate clear metaphysical foundations for the reunification of Christian churches (Antognazza 2009, 480–1).

The Theodicy itself is divided into three main parts, preceded by a substantial “Preliminary Dissertation on the Conformity of Faith with Reason” and followed by several appendices. The first part addresses the problem of evil in general, laying out Leibniz’s fundamental principles and arguments. The second and third parts revisit these themes in an ongoing dialogue with Pierre Bayle (Lodge 2020, 174 & 183). The appendices are titled, “Summary of the Controversy, Reduced to Formal Argument,” “Reflections on the Work that Mr. Hobbes Published in English on Freedom, Necessity and Chance,” and “Observations on the Book Concerning the Origin of Evil, Published Recently in London.” Finally, a condensed, Latin summary of the main arguments, titled “A Vindication of God’s Justice Reconciled with His Other Perfections and All His Actions,” now commonly called the Causa Dei, was added to the second edition (Lodge 2020, 174–5). E. M. Huggard published an English translation from the French in 1952, using Gerhardt’s edition from the late 19th Century. This is the only complete English translation of the Theodicy. It leaves some Latin quotes untranslated, lacks a scholarly apparatus, and omits the philosophically rich Causa Dei—which may be found in Monadology and Other Philosophical Essays (S).

The Theodicy directly addresses “the great question of the Free and the Necessary […] in the production and the origin of Evil” (H, 55) in a manner that attempts to preserve God’s goodness as creator, preserver, and providential governor of a world replete with moral evil, suffering, and imperfection. Leibniz aims to absolve God and hold human beings appropriately responsible for sin, but in a way that is ultimately consoling, reassuring his readers that they are integral parts of a world that richly expresses God’s goodness, and that they may find genuine happiness and tranquility in the love of God (H, 53–57).

3.1 The Best of All Possible Worlds

Leibniz’s argument that God could not have done better, or that we inhabit the best of all possible worlds, is mostly a priori and grounded in God’s nature. As a supremely perfect being, God is both perfectly wise and perfectly good. Wisdom enabled God to recognize the most perfect world among all possible combinations of substances (H, 271), and goodness morally necessitated God to choose that world (H, 239–240). As Leibniz stated, God “would reproach himself for the slightest actual defect there were in the universe, even though it were perceived of none” (H 282). Since any choice other than the best would indicate a defect, a perfect God must select the best.

The argument so far assumes there is a best possible world, rather than an infinite series of ever better worlds (see Adams 1972). Leibniz defended this assumption by appeal to this world’s existence. God would have chosen not to create at all had there been no best world, because there would have been no sufficient reason to pick any world over its better. The existence of this world proves there is a best world, and God’s nature proves that this world is the best world. As Leibniz put it in the Theodicy, “a lesser good is a kind of evil” and “if there were not the best (optimum) among all possible worlds, God would not have produced any” (H, 131 & 252–253).

Despite their apparent simplicity, Leibniz’s arguments require a sophisticated metaphysical foundation. For example, Leibniz associated optimality with metaphysical perfection (AG, 39), metaphysical perfection with unity (A, VI.i.484–5; SLT, 191–2), and this in turn with substances (ARN, 171 & 181–211). Since a world is an aggregate of substances and not one substance, finding its degree of perfection and choosing it above all others requires the many substances to be reckoned as one, as a unit: “I call ‘World’ the whole succession and the whole agglomeration of all existent things, lest it be said that several worlds could have existed in different times and different places. For they must needs be reckoned all together as one world or, if you will, as one Universe” (H, 131 & 271; see also A, VI.iv.559–60). This requires Leibniz to specify a function or reckoning from possible substances to collections of possible substances (possible worlds), and another function from these possible worlds to values, with one collection coming out as best. The simplest candidate functions treat any set of possible substances as a possible world and find the value of a possible world by summing the value of its substances. These do not work for Leibniz, because they imply that the best possible world contains absolutely all possible substances. There is considerable discussion in the secondary literature around these functions, the first under the heading of “compossibility” (Messina & Rutherford 2009; Feeney 2016; Rutherford 2021) and the second under “harmony” and “metaphysical perfection” (Gale 1976; Carlin 2000; Glowienka 2016; Newlands 2018, 33–41).

Most of these foundations did not appear in the Theodicy, which “was already a very cautious work, targeted to a broad public which Leibniz did not want to upset with his potentially most controversial philosophical views (Antognazza 2009, 482).” He did, however, include a metaphysical account of evil. Moral and physical evils, like sin and suffering, are grounded in what he called “metaphysical evil” (H, 139 & 279; CD, 29–32). In the clearest definition, “metaphysical good and evil is perfection and imperfection in general,” whereas “physical good and evil [are] the conveniences and inconveniences of intelligent substances,” and “moral good and evil concerns their virtuous and vicious actions” (G, VI.32 cited in Antognazza 2014, 119). As Antognazza (2014, 125–133) persuasively argues, metaphysical evil is the “original imperfection or limitation connatural to all creatures” (AG, 62) that Leibniz had already mentioned in the Discourse on Metaphysics, where he wrote that “the root of evil is in nothingness, that is to say, in the privation, or limitation of creatures, which God graciously remedies by the degree of perfection it pleases him to give” (AG, 62). No matter how excellent the best possible world may be, its inhabitants are inevitably less than God, and so originally imperfect. Once more revising the Augustinian privation theory of evil (see Section 2.1), Leibniz used finitude itself to explain why creatures are vulnerable to suffering (physical evil) and “liable to sin” (moral evil) (AG, 62; see also H, 139). Leibniz, then, advocated a unified account of this world’s goodness: metaphysical perfection is the source of moral goodness (AG, 152) and metaphysical evil is the condition for the possibility of moral evil. A world’s value depends on its metaphysical foundation, but also on its physical and moral aspects: “it will prove that [God] has attained the utmost good possible, provided one reckon the metaphysical, physical and moral goods together” (H, 282; see also Newlands 2014).

The most pressing objection to the best-possible-world view is that some things in the world could be better, which motivates the thought that there could be a better world. Leibniz admitted this objection and provided answers informed by recent scientific discoveries and by his supposition that God fills every potential gap in creation with life (ARN, 203–205). For example, there may be incomparably happy creatures beyond the stars or inhabiting other planets: “It may be that all suns are peopled only by blessed creatures” (H, 138). He also appealed to the afterlife or the final judgement: “Here on earth we see apparent injustice, and we believe and even know the truth of the hidden justice of God; but we shall see that justice when at last the Sun of Justice shall show himself as he is” (H, 122). We are not situated to observe the net goodness and happiness of our world, and so the dismal state of our neighborhood does not license conclusions about creation as a whole. Moreover, appealing to his underlying metaphysics of evil, Leibniz argued that the world is biased toward good: “perfection is positive, it is an absolute reality; defect is privative, it comes from limitation and tends towards new privations” (H, 146). There is no upper bound to the positive—one could always know and be more—but there is a lower bound to the negative set by nonexistence. In theological terms, “God is infinite, and the Devil is finite; good can and does go on ad infinitum, whereas evil has its bounds” (H, 381).

Nevertheless, these replies miss the core of the objection, which is that our world could be better, not that it is overall bad. To answer this, Leibniz needed to show that, possibly, improving the neighborhood would not improve the world, or that local badness contributes to global perfection. For this, Leibniz returned to a theme present since his earliest theodicy, that the world is an integral and harmonious whole no part of which may be changed without disruption (see Section 2.2). “God’s pronouncement,” Leibniz wrote, “concerns the whole sequence at the same time; he simply decrees its existence. In order to save other men, or in a different way, he must needs choose an altogether different sequence, seeing that all is connected in each sequence” (H, 171). Individual substances may be really independent metaphysical units, but they all reflect each other and each displays a single overarching plan or idea, and so no part of a world may be swapped for something better without destroying the metaphysical perfection of the world (AG, 47 & 219–220). Moreover, the evils we perceive contribute to a greater good: “A little acid, sharpness or bitterness is often more pleasing than sugar; shadows enhance colors; and even a dissonance in the right place gives relief to harmony. […] And is it not most often necessary that a little evil render the good more discernible, that is to say, greater?” (H, 133). Here, Leibniz continues a Platonic tradition that includes Aquinas, who wrote that the “universe, the present creation being supposed, cannot be better, on account of the most beautiful order given to things by God. … For if any one thing were bettered, the proportion of order would be destroyed; as if one string were stretched more than it ought to be, the melody of the harp would be destroyed” (Aquinas, Summa Theologiae, I.25.6.ad3 as quoted in Pruss 2020, 206–7; see also Mercer 2008).

In Leibniz’s mature theodicy, God’s wisdom and goodness collaborate to create the best possible world. The role of wisdom is to grasp eternal, necessary truths, the possible essences of all things, and compile these into an array of possible worlds ranked by their degree of perfection. God’s goodness dictates that God will the best, the world that achieves the greatest overall harmony and reflects that harmony in its constituent parts. The parts themselves, especially intelligent and free creatures, contribute positively to that harmony by adding physical and moral good to the whole. Evils are inevitable, because even the best world falls short of divinity and because this falling short allows suffering and sin as the shadow of physical and moral good. Even these evils, however, enrich the whole and contribute to its perfection, and God would not have done better by eliminating them.

3.2 Who is the Author of Sin?

Since the best possible world contains moral evils, Leibniz also addressed the charge that God is the author of sin. Leibniz’s mature account of divine and creaturely freedom generated this charge in three ways, which appear already in the opening paragraphs of the Theodicy:

The foreknowledge of God renders all the future certain and determined, but his providence and his foreordinance, whereon foreknowledge itself appears founded, do much more: for God is not as a man, able to look upon events with unconcern and to suspend his judgement, since nothing exists save as a result of the decrees of his will and through the action of his power. […] it appears that man is compelled to do the good and evil that he does, and in consequence that he deserves therefor neither recompense nor chastisement: thus is the morality of actions destroyed and all justice, divine and human, shaken. (H, 126–127)

First, it seems God chose a world in which there is sin and suffering and thereby wills sin and suffering. Second, it seems God did not merely will these evils but actually concurred or cooperated with them, “through the action of his power.” Finally, it seems there is no room left for human agency robust enough to support moral responsibility for sin. Leibniz addressed these tensions between divine providence and creaturely culpability by distinguishing antecedent from consequent will, physical from moral concurrence, and efficient from deficient causation.

3.2.1 Moral Necessity, and God’s Antecedent and Consequent Will

Leibniz rejected the following, plausible conditional: if God chose freely and morally to actualize a world that contains sin and suffering, then God is responsible for evil. His rejection involved a distinction between God’s antecedent and consequent wills. However, before describing this distinction, it will be helpful to see how Leibniz defended the antecedent. Leibniz appealed to “moral necessity” to explain how God created the best world freely and morally, despite being in a sense compelled by goodness.

Leibniz was concerned to clear up what he considered a terminological confusion: if necessarily, God wills the best and necessarily, there is one world which is best, viz. our world, then necessarily, our world exists—or in Leibniz’s statement, “there is nothing possible except that which actually happens” (H, 232; argument summary from Murray 2014, 154). The terminological confusion is not between hypothetical and per se necessity, because God’s own nature appears to preclude the existence of sub-optimal worlds, even if these worlds are possible in themselves (see Section 3). Instead, the confusion is between metaphysical necessity and “moral necessity,” a necessity grounded in practical wisdom and moral perfection (see Rateau 2019, 203–215). Just as we are confident that a wise person will forego real but extremely foolish options (H, 302), we may also be sure that God, though free, is “morally necessitated” to choose the best. This is a subtle point about practical reason: even unthinkable deeds are doable, and the choices that spring automatically from settled character are nevertheless free and have genuine moral significance. The argument above is a mere terminological confusion, because the first premise involves moral necessity, while the second premise involves metaphysical necessity. This appeal to moral necessity runs exactly counter to Leibniz’s early answer to the author of sin problem, which had relied on the metaphysical necessity of the best to shield God from fault for willing evil (see Section 2.2). However certain the choice, God did freely and morally create a world marked by sin and suffering.

Having defended the antecedent, Leibniz challenged the conditional by distinguishing between God’s antecedent and consequent wills (see Echavarría 2014; Murray 2014; Schmaltz 2014). The antecedent will is an interior recognition of possible goods as good. God is inclined to the good and so has a reason to create everything that would be good if it existed. As Leibniz stated,

will consists in the inclination to do something in proportion to the good it contains. This will is called antecedent when it is detached, and considers each good separately in the capacity of a good. In this sense it may be said that God tends to all good, as good […] He is earnestly disposed to sanctify and to save all men, to exclude sin, and to prevent damnation. (H, 139–140)

Leibniz even ventured that God’s antecedent will would be efficacious if it were unimpeded, and since the only available impediment is God’s own will, it must be that the will to create some finite substances is not compatible with the will to create certain others, as suggested already in Section 3.1. The many antecedent wills—one for each potential good—must then compose themselves into a single, unified act of will that the overall best should exist. This unified act of will is God’s consequent will, which is “final and decisive” (H, 139–140). With this distinction in hand, Leibniz could claim that God antecedently wills all goods, even those not actualized like universal salvation. He could also recast God’s will to create evils as a byproduct of the contest among antecedent wills, which “produce effects […] restricted by the concurrence of other antecedent acts of will” (CD, 26–27).

God is not responsible for evil because God has no antecedent will for evil, and a consequent will for evil only insofar as evil is inextricably part of the best. Specifically, God wills physical evils like suffering only to maximize the good and never for their own sake; moral evils like sin are not willed at all, but only permitted to exist (H, 140–1). This fits well with Leibniz’s account of sin as an integral part of a global harmony (as discussed already in Section 2.2), and with his account of moral evil as arising from the inevitable metaphysical imperfections of finite things (as in Section 3.1). In a sense, the reason why the best world contains evil also explains why choosing the best world does not make God morally responsible for its evil. Leibniz answered one charge with a holism about value, and the other with a parallel holism about God’s voluntary response to value.

3.2.2 Concurrence and Divine Permission for Sin

God’s concurrence with every creaturely action raises the author of sin problem again, even given the distinction between antecedent and consequent willing. Suffering may be willed only for the sake of another good, and sin may be permitted only as sine qua non—but God still participates in bringing about these evils “through the action of his power,” and this seems like enough to make God morally responsible. Leibniz offered a comprehensive statement about concurrence in the Causa Dei:

In their actions all things depend upon God, since God concurs in their actions in so far as these actions have some degree of perfection, which must always come from God. God’s concurrence (even the ordinary, non-miraculous concurrence) is at the same time immediate and special. It is immediate since the effect depends upon God not only for the reason that its cause originates in God, but also for this other reason, that God concurs no less nor more indirectly in producing this effect than in producing its cause. The concurrence is special because it aims not only at the existence of the thing and its actions, but also at the mood and qualities of this existence in so far as there is inherent in them some degree of perfection, which always flows from God, the father of light and dispenser of all good. (CD, 10–12)

As Leibniz wrote, God concurs without mediation: God creates the agent who acts and God has a part in that agent’s action. Divine concurrence is also special, or specific. To use McDonough’s toaster analogy, God has a hand in the toasting itself and is not a mere source of generic power enabling the toaster to operate (McDonough 2007, 43). It might seem, then, that God is actively and intimately involved in every detail of every effect, including the evil in sinful actions, “for an action is not, for being evil, the less dependent on God” (H, 127).

Leibniz, however, also wrote that God’s concurrence is limited to the perfection, the goodness, the positivity in any substance or action—which would be enough to show that God does not concur with sin as sin, and so that divine concurrence does not make God the author of sin. The difficulty, then, was to limit concurrence to the perfection in actions while still maintaining that “actual beings depend upon God for their existence as well as for their actions, and depend not only upon his intellect but also upon his will” (CD, 9; see also H, 142–3). How can God be so thoroughly involved in causing every creaturely action, and yet only concur with the good in those actions?

Leibniz answered by dividing God’s concurrence with creaturely action into two types, physical and moral (see Schmaltz 2014, 148–150; Rateau 2019, 241–5). Physical concurrence is God’s active, unmediated, and specific contribution to every creaturely action. This type of concurrence is sufficient to produce every effect, including sins and yet only extends to the good or perfect. Physical concurrence has both features because God’s consequent will is sufficient to produce every effect and yet derives its entire force and intentionality from the antecedent wills, which respond directly and exclusively to the good (CD, 26–27). In a sense, God can be fully involved with the best possible world, evils and all, by decisively carrying through every desire for the good that composes God’s consequent will. As Leibniz wrote, “[…] when it is said that the creature depends upon God in so far as it exists and in so far as it acts, and even that conservation is a continual creation, this is true in that God gives ever to the creature and produces continually all that in it is positive, good and perfect, every perfect gift coming from the Father of lights” (H, 145; see also CD, 9; Rateau 2019, 242). God physically concurs with every action “in so far as these actions have some degree of perfection”—but there is no reality to an action apart from its perfection.

Nevertheless, God knows that some of these actions are sins, because God “acts with perfect freedom and does nothing without a complete knowledge of the thing and the consequences that it may have” (H, 127). God may recognize a privation in some effect arising from disharmony among antecedent wills. When rational beings are involved, the deprived effect may be depraved, and God recognizes this as sin (CD, 96–97). If God persists in physical concurrence anyway (because these antecedent wills are integrated into a consequent will for the best) then God permits the sin (CD, 26–28). As Leibniz wrote, “the consequent will of God, which has sin for its object, is only permissive” (H, 141). God acquiesces, extending permission to the sin as a sin while physically concurring with the very same action in so far as it has some degree of perfection. This acquiescence or permission is moral concurrence. Moral concurrence is therefore unique to sin (but lacks the creative power required to make God the author of sin), while physical concurrence is unique to perfection (and has the creative power to make God the author of all good).

3.2.3 Deficient Causation and Creaturely Culpability for Sin

As Leibniz acknowledged, moral concurrence is the “more perplexing” of the two types of concurrence (H, 142; see Schmaltz 2014, 136), perhaps because an account of how God merely permits sin must come with an account of how creatures commit sin. Here, Leibniz faced two significant pressures. On the one hand, he needed an account of creaturely agency robust enough to make creatures morally responsible for their own actions, even though “the decisive act of will, which results from all inclining acts of will, always produces its full effect, provided the power is adequate to the will, which it certainly is in the case of God” (CD, 27). On the other hand, Leibniz needed to explain how any agent could be responsible for a lack or privation, having already based God’s mere permission for sin on the fact that sin is a lack within some encompassing positive reality that God creates. As described in Section 2.1, Leibniz had already worried that this would make it impossible for any agent to commit a sin, leaving no one responsible (CP, 23). Creaturely agency must hold its own within God’s overarching providential order but also assume responsibility for mere privations.

This entry is not the place for Leibniz’s full account of moral agency. The secondary literature, especially Julia Jorati’s Leibniz on Causation and Agency (2017), contains thoughtful discussions of the underlying psychology and metaphysics. The core of the account is the claim that human beings have the capacity to direct themselves toward goods they perceive as good and in so doing forego other potential actions: “[t]he will is never prompted to action save by the representation of the good, which prevails over the opposite representations. […] For that very reason the choice is free and independent of necessity, because it is made between several possibles, and the will is determined only by the preponderating goodness of the object” (H, 151). Leibniz often presented this conception of agency in terms of three necessary and jointly sufficient conditions: spontaneity, intelligence, and contingency (H, 306; AG, 64)—or self-determination for a known end without logical or metaphysical necessitation. This counts as moral agency, because the end is known as good (CD, 98; Jorati 2017, 181 & 191–3; as Jorati notes, Leibniz employed the concept of moral agency but did not use the term). This model of human moral agency should be familiar, because we have seen it already in Leibniz’s description of moral necessity and God’s consequent will. Human beings are moral agents in the way God is a moral agent, though not to the same degree (H, 150; CD, 98; see also Jorati 2017, 116–7).

This model of moral agency does not, on its own, explain why creatures are morally responsible for what God has willed. Even granting that God is not the author of sin, God’s encompassing and irresistible consequent will still seems to block human culpability. Leibniz did struggle at length in the Theodicy with whether the sinner could really have done otherwise, considering infant culpability for original sin (H, 172), the moral helplessness of adolescents (H, 179), and finally our common impotence before the divine will:

Let us pass on to those who lack not power to amend, but good will. They are doubtless not to be excused; but there always remains a great difficulty concerning God, since it rested with him to give them this same good will. He is the master of wills, the hearts of kings and those of all other men are in his hand. Holy Scripture goes so far as to say that God at times hardened the wicked in order to display his power by punishing them. (H, 181)

Leibniz’s accounts of contingency (see Section 3) offer some insight into how a sin could have been avoided. The per se possibility account secures the possibility that Judas not exist, or that someone very similar to Judas but not a traitor exist instead in a different world (see H, 374–8). These alternative possibilities are internally coherent and so per se possible, but they are outside of Judas’s power (because Judas already exists), and so they are only useful in establishing God’s freedom from metaphysical necessitation. Turning instead to the infinite analysis account of contingency, it may be that no contradiction would follow from Judas not sinning, despite treachery being contained in his complete concept. This is a more plausible precondition for Judas’s own freedom, especially if treachery is contained in his complete concept only because the same complete concept also includes the faulty perception that a treacherous action would be better than any alternative. This was Leibniz’s settled view in the Theodicy, where he stated that all is “certain and determined beforehand in man, as everywhere else, and the human soul is a kind of spiritual automaton” driven not by divine decrees, but internally, by a progressive unfolding of perceptions and appetites, some of which rise to the level of morally free actions. Crucially, this spiritual automaton is what God grasps as a mere possibility, wills with antecedent will, and then integrates into a consequent will, “the all-powerful word Fiat.” As Leibniz concluded, “that which is contingent and free remains no less so under the decrees of God than under his prevision” (H, 154–5). God’s consequent will is then orthogonal to the human will, creating the entire mechanism of human moral agency at once.

Having argued that human moral agency is compatible with God’s ineluctable consequent will, Leibniz’s remaining task was to show how human beings could be morally responsible for the lack or privation that makes an action sinful. The difficulty was that this privative quality played a crucial role in explaining why God is not responsible for evil: God effects what is real but merely permits what is lacking (see Section 3.2.2). How can human moral agents be responsible for a lack, if God cannot?

To address this, Leibniz introduced the concept of a deficient cause (see Schmalz 2014, 149–152; Jorati 2017, 98–108; Rateau 2019, 117–9 & 265–270). As he explained, “the formal character of evil has no efficient cause, for it consists in privation […], in that which the efficient cause does not bring about. That is why the Schoolmen are wont to call the cause of evil deficient” (H, 139). To illustrate this concept, Leibniz offered examples of deficient causes: the river carries a heavy barge more slowly (H, 386) and “water in freezing is capable of breaking a gun-barrel wherein it is confined; and yet cold is a certain privation of force” (H, 222–3). As Leibniz understood the second example, the withdrawal of heat allows another force to act more powerfully than it would have otherwise. It is “by accident” that this privation has a positive effect. Similarly, ignorance, error, malice, and ill will “consist formally in a certain kind of privation” and have their effects accidentally. For instance, ignorance might allow inadequate evidence to carry disproportionate weight, and malice might allow a baser passion to dominate (H, 145). These deficient causes of sin are privations in human moral agency and so depend on the “previous limitations that are originally in the creature” (H, 356), which Leibniz had identified as metaphysical evil (see Section 3.1). Human moral agents are responsible or culpable for a lack because they become its deficient cause.

There is still an explanatory gap between metaphysical evil and moral evils like malice. Could there have been inherently limited moral agents that nevertheless did not become the deficient causes of sin? Filling this gap would involve Leibniz’s treatment of original sin and grace, topics he did address at length in the Theodicy (H, 172–185; see also Rutherford 2014, 78–86). The crucial point here is that finite moral agents, due to their inherent limitations, are disposed to be limited in ways that matter morally, and so to become deficient causes of sin. God permits sin just by knowingly extending physical concurrence to these morally compromised agents, because of their contribution to the best possible world. Therefore, despite God’s encompassing providence, creaturely culpability for sin remains intact, grounded in the creature as an inherently deficient cause.

According to Leibniz’s mature theodicy, God wills every good and nothing evil (antecedently). These wills cannot all be realized, and the best that can be realized contains some contrasts and compromises among antecedent wills. God wills this (consequently) and so creates the best of all possible worlds, which is our world. God constantly maintains this world in being, concurring (physically) with every perfection that makes it real. Nevertheless, the contrasts and compromises among finite things give rise to local privations, or (metaphysical) evils. Some of these are sufferings, or (physical) evils. God is aware of physical evils and wills them only for the sake of a greater good. Some finite beings are like God, created with moral agency, or the ability to determine themselves knowingly for the greatest perceived good. Their inherent lack makes them liable to exercise agency with destructive deficiency. When they do, this is sin or (moral) evil. God knows and physically concurs anyway, without willing the sin as a sin. This is God’s moral concurrence, and why creatures, rather than God, are the authors of sin.

3.3 The Meaning of Suffering

As argued in Section 1, Leibniz believed that God’s worthiness could be inferred from creation. We should love and praise God for God’s intrinsic goodness, but this goodness is conveyed abundantly in creation. Evil presented a problem for this view. If God deserves praise for the good, why not criticism for the evil? The theodicean project aimed to break this apparent symmetry between good and evil. This entry details how Leibniz found fundamental asymmetries, beginning with the distinction between perfection and privation, extending to the distinction between an optimal whole and its deficient parts, and concluding with the distinction between continuous creation and mere permission.

These asymmetries constitute a metaphysical answer to the original problem but not yet a pastoral answer, and a pastoral answer was needed because Leibniz believed that the theodicean project had personal and political import. Individuals and whole societies could be distressed by moral evils, and by the apparently unjust distribution of physical evils (H, 100; see Rateau 2019, 1–3). Inadequate or false responses to evil encourage further evils (H, 55–62) and give rise to warring sects (CP, 6–7). As Leibniz wrote, these are “hard knots, which no sword of Alexander can loosen” and “the stumbling block for the happiness of so many; this is the point of doubt that has brought so many either to despair or wickedness, which until now has never been resolved, as so many poor souls needed it to be” (CP, 21).

It was an important test of his answer, then, whether it could console the suffering and unite the divided. This explains, in part, why the Theodicy was “the most voluminous and intentionally popular philosophical work which Leibniz ever published” (Antognazza 2009, 479–480) and why he had concentrated on its themes for so many decades. It also explains the consoling passages distributed throughout the work, such as the following: “one often suffers through the evil actions of others; but when one has no part in the offence one must look upon it as a certainty that these sufferings prepare for us a greater happiness” (H, 279) and “not only pains and effort but also prayers are effective, God having had even these prayers in mind before he ordered things, and having made due allowance for them” (H, 384). The first passage reassures the reader that God’s providence accounts for human beings and their sufferings, and by extension, that the best world is also just. Since that justice is still hidden (see Section 3.1), God’s providence provides a basis for hope. The second passage suggests that this hope can be agential, a ground for action, because God has ordered the world to make our pain, effort, and prayer have good effects.

In the Theodicy and in earlier works, Leibniz developed these consolations into an ethics of temporal orientation (see Mercer 2012). Toward the past Leibniz counseled a grateful acquiescence not unlike God’s moral concurrence: “it is not sufficient to force ourselves to be patient; rather, we must truly be satisfied with everything that has come to us according to his will” (AG, 37). Even horrible things are to be accepted gratefully, because “afflictions, especially those the good have, only lead to their greater good” (AG, 154). Toward the future, we “must not be quietists and stand ridiculously with arms folded, awaiting that which God will do […] but we must act in accordance with what we presume to be the will of God […] trying with all our might to contribute to the general good […]” (AG, 37). As above, we have actual moral agency and work for a “good master” (H, 57) who takes our efforts into account.

Through his Theodicy, Leibniz offered hope that past sufferings will still bear fruit, and freedom to strive for the good without concern for results, knowing that whatever happens will be for the best. As Leibniz wrote, “these considerations must be held to be not only pleasing and consoling, but most true. I think that in the universe nothing is truer than happiness, nor is anything happier or sweeter than truth” (AG, 154).

Bibliography

Leibniz Texts

A
German Academy of Sciences (eds.), Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz: Sämtliche Schriften und Briefe, Darmstadt and Berlin: Akademie Verlag, 1926–; cited by series, volume and page.
ARN
S. Voss (editor and translator), The Leibniz-Arnauld Correspondence: With Selections From the Correspondence with Ernst, Landgrave of Hessen-Rheinfels, New Haven: Yale University Press, 2016.
AG
R. Ariew and D. Garber (editors and translators), G. W. Leibniz: Philosophical Essays, Indianapolis: Hackett, 1989.
CD
Causa Dei, appended to the Theodicy but not included in H (below); translation in S (where it is titled “A Vindication of God’s Justice Reconciled with His Other Perfections and all His Actions”); cited by paragraph number.
CP
R. C. Sleigh, Jr. (editor and translator, with introduction), Confessio Philosophi: Papers Concerning the Problem of Evil, 1671–1678, New Haven: Yale University Press, 2005.
DPG
M. Murray (editor and translator), Dissertation on Predestination and Grace, New Haven: Yale University Press, 2011.
DSR
G. H. R. Parkinson (editor and translator) G. W. Leibniz: De Summa Rerum: Metaphysical Papers 1675–1676, New Haven: Yale University Press, 1992.
G
C. I. Gerhardt (ed.), Die philosophischen Schriften von Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz, Berlin: Weidman, 1875–1890; cited by volume and page; Volume VI contains the original text of the Theodicy, as translated in H (below).
H
E. M. Huggard (trans.), Theodicy: Essays on the Goodness of God, the Freedom of Man, and the Origin of Evil (Essais de théodicée), La Salle, IL: Open Court, 1985; cited by page number.
LGR
L. Strickland (ed.), Leibniz on God and Religion: A Reader, London: Bloomsbury, 2016.
S
P. Schrecker and Anne Martin Schrecker (eds.), 1965, Monadology, and Other Philosophical Essays, Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill Co.
SLT
L. Strickland (trans.), The Shorter Leibniz Texts, London: Bloomsbury, 2010.

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Other Internet Resources

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