Notes to Ludwig Andreas Feuerbach

1. See Harvey, 1995, where Harvey seeks to describe and evaluate a theory of projection contained in Feuerbach’s later writings on religion that he regards as incompatible with the account contained in The Essence of Christianity before going on (cf. pp. 229–280) to compare the former with several contemporary theories of religious projection.

2. For analyses of this influence, see Brudney 1998 and Gooch 2019.

3. In this connection, see the discussion of the parallelism between the structure of The Essence of Christianity and The Critique of Pure Reason found in the introductory chapter of Arndt 2020.

4. For analyses of philosophical developments in Germany during this period, see Gedö 1995 and Löwith 1964.

5. Cf. Levitt and Turgeon, 2009; Buber, 1965: 118–205, esp. 148, where Buber writes that, in his youth, he “was given a decisive impetus by Feuerbach”; Löwith, 1981; Deranty, 2015; and Schmidt, 1973.

6. After his brother Anselm’s unexpected death, Ludwig assumed the responsibility of editing for publication his father’s Nachlass and selected correspondence. These were published in 1852 under the title, Paul Johann Anselm Ritter von Feuerbachs Leben und Wirken, which reappears as Vol. 12 of the critical edition of Feuerbach’s Gesammelte Werke edited by Schuffenhauer. The preceding quotation is from a brief lexicon article authored by Ludwig that summarizes the accomplishments of the distinguished jurist and his sons, and can be found on pp. 324–332 in v. 10 of the same critical edition. For a good recent biography of Feuerbach, see Winiger 2004.

7. Schott, 1973, analyzes Feuerbach’s early intellectual development up to the time of this transfer.

8. For a recent discussion of these publications, see Tomasoni 2015: 148–180.

9. An illuminating discussion of the issues involved in the disintegration of the Hegelian school in to Right, Left, and Center camps is to be found in Toews 1980: 201–369.  See also Jaeschke 1990: 349–421.

10. Cf. Heinrich Heine, Zur Geschichte der Religion und Philosophie in Deutschland (1835), in Die romantische Schule und andere Schriften über Deutschland, Werke, v. 3, ed. Rolf Toman (Cologne: Könemann, 1995), 242.

11. For analyses of Feuerbach’s early pantheistic idealism, see Wartofsky 1977: 28–48, Cornehl 1969, Gooch 2013 (from which some of the paragraphs in this section have been adapted), and Tomasoni 2015: 74–104.

12. A translation of the letter is included in Hegel 1984: 547–550. The significance of this letter for understanding important differences between Feuerbach’s position and Hegel’s is emphasized by Dickey in Dickey 1993. For a reply to Dickey, see Gooch 2013b. For a recent discussion of Feuerbach’s inaugural dissertation, see Tomasoni 2015: 61–73.

13. For discussions of Feuerbach’s approach to the history of philosophy, see Wartofsky 1977: 49–134 and the essays collected in Jaeschke & Tomasoni 1998.

14. Another recent account of Feuerbach’s critique of Christianity in this work can be found in Tomasoni 2015: 203–247. Analyses produced by various authors of different sections of this work can be found in Arndt 2020.

15. In the second edition of The Essence of Christianity (1843), Feuerbach renamed the two parts of his book “The True or Anthropological Essence of Religion” and “The False or Theological Essence of Religion”, respectively. Eliot’s translation is based on this edition.

16. Here Feuerbach follows Hegel. Cf. Hegel [EPS]: 56–63 (Enc. § 24).

17. Feuerbach makes this point most explicitly in an unpublished draft of the foreword to The Essence of Christianity, which is quoted at length in Ascheri 1969. See esp. p. 20.

18. Cf. Feuerbach’s preface to the second edition (1843) of The Essence of Christianity, where he specifically mentions Jacobi and Schleiermacher, and remarks that

“whoever is unfamiliar with the historical presuppositions and stages of mediation of my book lacks the [necessary] points of access to my arguments and thoughts” (WC 24/xliii).

19. For more recent analyses of Feuerbach’s “new” philosophy, see Tomasoni 2015, 248–305; Brudney 1998, 58–108; the editorial introduction to Feuerbach 1996; Braun 1990; the essays collected in Braun, Sass, Schuffenhauer, and Tomasoni 1990; Reitemeyer 1988; Wartofsky 1977, 341–431; and von Gagern 1970.

20. This break is discussed by Ascheri in Ascheri 1969. See also the editorial introduction to Feuerbach 1996.

Copyright © 2023 by
Todd Gooch <todd.gooch@eku.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free