Marsilius of Padua

Marsilio de’ Mainardini, also known as Marsilius of Padua (c. 1275–1343), was one of the greatest political theorists of the Middle Ages. Born in Padua, he led a dynamic life that took him to Paris, then back to Italy, and ultimately to Munich, where he spent his final years. Active as a philosopher in Paris, Marsilius became deeply involved in the political conflict between Ludwig the Bavarian—the elected candidate for Holy Roman Emperor—and Pope John XXII. Aligning himself with the imperial cause, Marsilius became a close advisor to Ludwig and accompanied him on his expedition to Italy. There, in 1328, Ludwig was crowned emperor in Rome by Nicholas V, an antipope whom he had appointed in opposition to Pope John XXII in Avignon. Marsilius’s most significant work, Defensor Pacis (The Defender of Peace), is a complex and sophisticated philosophical-political treatise that rejects the papal doctrine of plenitude of power—the claim that all temporal rulers should be subject to papal authority. In this extensive work, Marsilius draws on philosophical, theological, ecclesiological, and political arguments to challenge the legitimacy of papal supremacy. As a result of the ideas advanced in this treatise, he was excommunicated by Pope John XXII in 1327.

• 1. Biography
• 2. The Defender of Peace
• 3. The Relationship between Theory and Practice
• 4. Marsilius’ Philosophical Method
• 5. First Discourse.
  • 5.1. The Relationship with Aristotle
  • 5.2. The Human Legislator as the People
  • 5.3. Collective Prudence
  • 5.4. The Body Politic and the Human Body
• 6. Second Discourse.
  • 6.1. Divine/Human Laws and Human Acts
  • 6.2. Evangelical Poverty and the Notion of “Right”
  • 6.3. The Idea of Natural Right
  • 6.4 Ecclesiology: Spiritual and Temporal Power
  • 6.4. Heresy, Excommunication and Marsilius’ Conciliarism
• 7. The Defensor Minor and De Translatione Imperii. Marsilius’ Political Theory of Empire
• 8. Marsilius’ Reception
• Bibliography
  • Works by Marsilius
  • Other Primary Sources
  • Secondary sources
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Biography

The information on Marsilius’ life is scarce, as are the dates of his birth and death. His birth can likely be placed between 1275 and 1280, and his death in or before 1343. Marsilius’ earliest training took place in a rich and lively cultural environment in Padua between the late 13th and early 14th centuries. Starting in the 13th century, Padua had emerged as a significant intellectual center, witnessing the rise of two major developments (Collodo and Simonetti 2012; Hyde 1973). First, figures such as Lovato Lovati and Albertino Mussato—the latter being very close to Marsilius—had initiated a pre-humanist literary movement that placed the relationship between the present and classical antiquity at the forefront (Billanovich 1976). Second, there was a growing engagement with Aristotelian natural philosophy, which, from the 13th century onward, shaped significant studies in medicine, astrology, and natural philosophy at the University of Padua. A significant representative of this tradition was Peter of Abano, who was likely one of Marsilius’ teachers and whose medical ideas would later exert a profound influence (Siraisi 1973).

Albertino Mussato reports that, for some time, Marsilius had sought his advice, uncertain whether to pursue the study of medicine or law; he ultimately chose medicine (Godthardt 2006; 2012: 45–49). It is likely that Marsilius began his studies—perhaps in medicine—in Padua, and subsequently continued them in Paris, although scholars disagree on the exact date of his relocation (Godthardt 2006, 2012; Courtenay 1999). The first reliable evidence of Marsilius’s presence in Paris is his tenure as rector of the Faculty of Arts, held between December 1312 and March 1313. This position suggests that he may have already been in Paris earlier, first as a student and later as a master (magister), most likely between 1310 and 1315—and possibly even as early as the beginning of the fourteenth century, according to Courtenay (1999). It is worth noting that during this period, the University of Paris was one of the most prominent intellectual and cultural centers in Western Europe, exposing Marsilius to a wide range of traditions and influential figures teaching there at the time.

In the years following his rectorate, Marsilius travelled repeatedly between Paris and Padua. There is evidence that he was in Padua in 1315, where he served as a witness to the orthodoxy of Peter of Abano during his trial for heresy (Pesenti 1980). Similarly, in March 1319, Marsilius acted as an envoy and ambassador for the pro-imperial Ghibelline league led by Cangrande della Scala and Matteo Visconti, a coalition formed in Northern Italy in opposition to papal authority. At some point prior to 1321, Marsilius appears to have returned to Paris. According to John of Jandun—an Averroist philosopher and close associate—Marsilius brought with him from Padua a manuscript of Peter of Abano’s encyclopedic Expositio on the Pseudo-Aristotle Problemata, which Jandun is known to have consulted (Siraisi 1973: 164).

Perhaps after returning to Paris in 1321, Marsilius started working on his masterpiece, the Defender of Peace, which, as several manuscripts of this text indicate, must have been completed on 24 June 1324. At some point after the composition of this work, Marsilius left Paris with John of Jandun (though scholars are divided on whether he left immediately, in 1325, or in 1326, see Godthardt 2006, 2012; Courtenay 1999) and went to the court of Ludwig the Bavarian in Munich to seek protection. From that moment onwards, Marsilius’ fate became intertwined with that of Ludwig. He accompanied him on his expedition to Italy, during which Ludwig was to be crowned Holy Roman Emperor in Rome in 1328 by Sciarra Colonna, a prominent member of the Roman aristocracy, and by Nicholas V, an anti-pope created by Ludwig himself. For his authorship of the Defender, Marsilius was excommunicated by John XXII in 1327 along with John of Jandun. In the final part of his life, evidence regarding Marsilius becomes even more fragmented, and we only know that he died at some point before or in 1343 in Munich.

It is well established that Marsilius composed three principal writings: Defensor Pacis (his magnum opus and by far his most extensive work), Defensor Minor (a more concise reiteration of many ideas from the former, with a stronger pro-imperial stance, likely written in 1340), and De translatione imperii (which reproduces Landolfo Colonna’s treatise Tractatus de statu et mutatione imperii, with some minor yet meaningful modifications). His involvement in a few additional texts, mostly unrelated to political matters, remains disputed in most cases (Mulieri, Masolini and Pelletier 2023, 13).

2. The Defender of Peace

The Defender of Peace is Marsilius’ most important work and the one that has received the most attention among modern scholars. At the very outset, Marsilius clearly explains the purpose of his work. As he states, he wrote the Defender because the peace and political tranquillity of all human communities were threatened by a “perverted opinion” (The Defender of The Peace, Brett translation, 9, henceforth DP) upheld by certain Roman pontiffs. This opinion—the idea of the plenitude of power—is the true guiding theme of all of Marsilius’ work: the belief that the legitimacy of all temporal rulers’ power on earth should depend on the papacy. Marsilius describes this erroneous and condemnable view as a “singular cause of strife” (DP, 9), which leads to division and factionalism in every political community and must therefore be rejected.

The Defender is a lengthy work divided into three Discourses (dictiones), each based on the type of sources or knowledge that, as Marsilius states, will be used to support his main arguments. In the first part, he argues against the plenitude of power based on “sure methods discovered by human rationality” (DP, 9); in the second, he writes that he will “corroborate what I shall take myself to have demonstrated with testimonies of the truth founded upon eternity, and also with authoritative passages of the saints, its interpreters, and other approved doctors of the Christian faith, so that this book should stand by itself, needing no extrinsic proof” (DP, 9). In the third, he summarizes the arguments presented in the previous two sections drawing “a number of conclusions or lessons of the utmost utility”, to “all citizens – those in the position of prince as much as those who are subject” (DP, 9). Given that Marsilius states in the first Discourse that he will rely more on arguments grounded in human reason, whereas in the second he will draw upon the language of Revelation, scholars have long debated how this distinction aligns with the overarching argument of the Defender. In the scholarly literature, there has been a prevailing tendency to characterize the first Discourse of the Defender as predominantly philosophical, while the second Discourse is generally seen as more theologically and ecclesiologically oriented. Broadly speaking, contemporary scholars have devoted greater attention to Marsilius’ philosophical-political ideas in the first Discourse (Ottaviani 2018; Syros 2012), with a particular focus on his concepts of republicanism, representation, and the role of the people (already noted in Lagarde 1934, but further explored in Skinner 1978).

By contrast, early modern readers were primarily engaged with the ecclesiological and political-theological arguments of the second Discourse, especially during the Protestant Reformation and the era of religious wars, when Marsilius’ anti-papal views attracted significant interest among Protestant authors (Piaia 1999). Some contemporary researchers have also undertaken specific studies on the ecclesiological arguments of the second Discourse, such as the notions of the Church and the Council (Battocchio 2005; Garnett 2006). More recently, the specific practical role of the third Discourse in the overall structure of Marsilius’ work has also been underlined (Brett 2005; Moreno-Riaño 2008). Surely, in the first Discourse, Marsilius explains how it is possible to institute a perfect secular polity in which there is no room for papal interference, whereas in the second Discourse, he rejects the key principles of the monarchical theory of the papacy in order to present his own original conciliar theory of ecclesiology. However, there is a certain consensus among contemporary scholars that the distinction between the different Discourses should not be overstated, as Marsilius’ goal remains the same throughout: rejecting the “perverted” idea of the plenitude of power (Briguglia 2013; Brett 2005; Mulieri, Masolini and Pelletier 2023; Nederman 1995a). In a manner that closely reflects a characteristic pattern of medieval political disputation, all three Discourses of the Defender consistently integrate philosophical, theological, and ecclesiological ideas.

3. The Relationship between Theory and Practice

Marsilius’ Defender is, therefore, a hybrid work in which philosophical, theological, and ecclesiological arguments are combined with militant political positions. At times, these positions are expressed in a pamphlet-like style, taking a firm stance on several sensitive political questions of the time, all of which relate in some way to the plenitude of power. At the beginning of the first Discourse, Marsilius immediately explains how he will proceed throughout his work. He notes that Aristotle had analyzed the different causes of political dissolution. However, he adds, “neither Aristotle nor any other philosopher of his time” could have examined a specific cause of dissolution—the plenitude of power exercised by the popes— or “could have recognised the origin and species of this cause” (DP, 6) because it did not exist in his time. Following in Aristotle’s footsteps, Marsilius seeks to fill this gap and uses Aristotle’s authority to reject what he sees as the “perverted opinion” (DP, 6) of the plenitude of power.

Scholars have been divided on how to interpret the complex relationship between political action, philosophy, and Revelation in the Defender. Some have emphasized the militant nature of Marsilius’ message. For example, Conal Condren explains that the presence of Aristotle, along with other philosophical sources such as Averroism in the Defender does not necessarily indicate that Marsilius was concerned with philosophical problems (Condren 1977, 213). Others have pointed out that while the Defender undoubtedly functions as a political treatise, its philosophical underpinnings add depth to its argumentative structure. For instance, Cary Nederman cautions against an approach that reduces Marsilius’ philosophical perspective solely to a practical and polemical intention that motivates the Defender (Nederman 1995a, 24). Another way to understand the practical function of Marsilius’ political theory is by situating it within the Ciceronian tradition. As Cary Nederman has pointed out, “Cicero looms large in Marsiglio’s thought: De officiis is among the most frequently cited pagan texts in the Defensor.” (Nederman 2020: 108) In fact, Cicero takes a highly pragmatic approach—one that closely resembles the clear “call to action” characteristic of Marsilius’ “militant” theory in the Defender (Nederman 1990; 1995a: 14).

In recent scholarly literature, there is broad consensus among Marsilius scholars that the Defender should be interpreted as a work of political philosophy in which Marsilius combines theory and practice, adopting philosophical and theological ideas to provide a theoretical foundation for his pragmatic “call to action” (Briguglia 2013; Godthardt 2006; Moreno-Riaño 2008; Mulieri 2023a; Nederman 1995a; Syros 2012).

4. Marsilius’ Philosophical Method

Marsilius’ methodology is shaped by the complex interplay between action and theory, as reflected in the Defender. In the first Discourse, he identifies two distinct approaches to investigating the purposes of “living” and “living well,” which he regards as the principal ends of social life within a perfect political community. One approach considers these purposes from an “eternal” or “heavenly” perspective, while the other views them through a “temporal” or “worldly” lens. According to Marsilius, philosophers “could not convincingly demonstrate the second mode, sc. the sempiternal”, whereas “on the subject of living and living well or the good life in its first mode, sc. the worldly, and those things that are necessary for it, the glorious philosophers grasped almost the entire matter by demonstration” (DP, 19). In his view, philosophers have thoroughly understood the principles of “living” and “living well” insofar as they pertain to the earthly realm. This distinction between “living” and “living well” assigns philosophy two central roles in the Defender of Peace.

The primary task of philosophy in the Defender is to address the practical concern of investigating the divisions caused by the doctrine of the plenitude of power. This is accomplished by identifying the conditions necessary for the establishment of a perfect human community capable of achieving self-sufficiency and maintaining political stability. Marsilius distinguishes his political reflections from the “natural science of plants and animals” (DP, 24). Nevertheless, he develops a political theory that—drawing on Aristotle and other philosophical sources—proceeds by analogy, comparing the political body to the biological functions and mechanisms of the human body. Scholarly literature has highlighted the influence of Peter of Abano and other natural philosophical texts on Marsilius’s method (Marangon 1997; Quillet 1970; Shogimen 2012; Syros 2012). Marsilius’s effort to analyze thoroughly the various semantic implications of the terms and concepts he employs in both Discourses—aimed specifically at uncovering the causes of political stability and instability—also reflects his academic training and intellectual activity at the University of Paris in the fourteenth century (Courtenay 1999, 70).

There is also a second task for philosophy in the Defender, which preserves an autonomous role for theory in Marsilius’ inquiry. Although Marsilius does not appear solely interested in an abstract metaphysical treatment of his subject, in paragraph 4 of Chapter 30 of the second Discourse, the Paduan writes: “no dispositions to action, other than faith, nor any action that results from them, is equally perfect as the disposition of the first philosopher or of the action that results from him” (DP, 537). Here, Marsilius defends the idea of the perfection of philosophy—a view widely held among Parisian philosophers of his time (Bianchi 1990; Costa 2012)—and argues that first philosophy, or metaphysics, constitutes the highest form of human perfection, alongside faith. His conception of metaphysics in this context clearly also shows that, for Marsilius, philosophy is not conceived in opposition to Revelation.

Marsilius’ position on the perfection of philosophy also sheds light on several genuinely philosophical claims advanced in the Defender. For instance, when explaining that the final cause of the polity is not merely “to live” but also “to live well,” he characterizes the latter as “having leisure for the liberal activities that result from the virtues both of the practical and of the theoretical soul” (DP, 18). This idea echoes the views of Aristotle (Nicomachean Ethics, Books I and X) as well as those of the Averroist philosopher John of Jandun, who, drawing on Jewish-Islamic sources (Brenet 2003, 2006; Lambertini 2013; Syros 2011), argued that one of the principal duties of rulers in a political community is to promote wisdom and philosophy among all citizens (Brenet 2003, 2006; Lambertini 2013). Additionally, Marsilius frequently equates the dispositions of prudence and science, ultimately articulating an epistemic theory of prudence as the foundation of human laws (Mulieri 2018). It should be noted, however, that the concept of “living well” does not refer solely to the cultivation of the soul’s practical and intellectual virtues; it may also encompass the pursuit of activities aimed at ensuring the polity’s stability and its freedom from interference by the plenitude of power—elements that, in Marsilius’ view, already render a community self-sufficient and perfect.

5. First Discourse.

5.1. The Relationship with Aristotle

The relationship between Marsilius and the Aristotelian tradition warrants particular attention, given that Aristotle is the most frequently cited secular author in the Defender. Beginning in the 1260s, following William of Moerbeke’s Latin translation(s) of Politics, medieval thinkers increasingly engaged with this text, alongside the Nicomachean Ethics, to address ethical and political questions (Flueler 1992; Nederman 1996). Although the Politics was not part of the standard university curriculum (see entry on Medieval Political Philosophy), numerous scholars commented on the text and incorporated its passages into their political writings, either to provide a robust philosophical and theoretical foundation for their reflections or to engage with political issues relevant to their historical context (Lanza 2020; Toste 2020). Marsilius, particularly in the first part of the Defender (though not exclusively there), follows this intellectual tradition, referring to Aristotle as “the best of philosophers” (DP, 5). Indeed, the Defender is replete with references to various Aristotelian works, primarily the Politics, but also the Nicomachean Ethics, the Metaphysics, the Rhetoric, and others. Marsilius’ reading of the Politics has attracted particular attention not only because the Defender contains roughly one hundred references to this text but also because, as explained by Lambertini, “Marsilius emerges as an attentive and knowledgeable reader of the Politica” (Lambertini 2023, 42).

Scholars have long debated the role of Aristotelianism in Marsilius’s work, as this question is closely tied to the broader and complex issue of defining “political Aristotelianism” in the late Middle Ages (Briguglia 2013; Nederman 1996; Quillet 1970; Syros 2012). Cary Nederman argues that in the Defender, Aristotelianism is mainly “window dressing” used to attract support from Marsilius’ audience (Nederman 1996: 572). Other authors have stressed the “ideological” or rhetorical function of Aristotelianism in this text (Condren 1977; Piaia 1999). A crucial aspect of Marsilius’s engagement with Aristotle is his willingness—like that of many medieval thinkers—to modify or reinterpret Aristotelian principles when he deems it necessary. Furthermore, Marsilius systematically integrates Aristotle’s ideas with those of Cicero, Augustine, and Ibn Rushd (Black 2008; Nederman 1990, 1995a; 1996; 2020; Mulieri, Masolini and Pelletier 2023; Syros 2012), creating a distinctive synthesis of philosophical, Roman, Christian, and Islamic thought. As explained by Syros, Marsilius’ political theory “draws on various traditions of learning that extend beyond the Aristotelian heritage” (Syros 2012: 5).

Marsilius’ idea of political reflection, as well as his discussion of the origins of human societies, exemplifies these two tendencies: both his reliance on Aristotelian concepts and his readiness to modify or reinterpret them in light of other intellectual traditions. For example, Marsilius’ appropriation of Aristotle’s thought as a theoretical framework for understanding the plenitude of power diverges from Aristotle on one important point. While, for Aristotle, practical sciences such as ethics and political science do not proceed in a demonstrative manner (Nielsen and Devin 2015), Marsilius explicitly states that his analysis will proceed with “sure methods” (viis certis). In other words, Marsilius ascribes to politics the same epistemological certainty that can be attributed to metaphysics, possibly echoing— in an original way—positions he encountered in certain commentators on the Politics, such as Peter of Auvergne (Petrus de Alvernia QS: 235).

Marsilius primarily addresses the question of the origin of human societies, as well as the division of the polity into its components, in the opening chapters of the first Discourse. However, he approaches these issues in a manner that is relatively original compared to Aristotle. The latter had distinguished three stages in the development of human societies: the household, the village, and the city-state (the polis) (Aristotle, Politics, 1252a24–1254a13). Marsilius, however, reinterprets this scheme in two distinct and original ways. First, his treatment entirely omits Aristotle’s notion of natural slavery, which plays a specific role within the household, where slaves—like women and children—are under the father’s authority. Second, Marsilius pays particular attention to the distinction between the powers of the head of a household and those of the chief of a village, a topic to which Aristotle devotes little attention. As Marsilius explains, while in the case of the household, it is clear that the “head of the single household” can “pardon or punish domestic wrongdoings entirely at his wish and pleasure,” in the case of the village, this “would not have been licit for him as the chief of the first community called the village” (DP, 16). Marsilius argues that while the head of a household can legitimately exercise power according to his own will, this is not the case for the head of a village, since the village possesses characteristics that align it more closely with the political community. He clarifies this by stating that in the village, “it was necessary for the elder to dispense what was just and advantageous by some reasonable ordinance or quasi-natural law,” (DP, 17) suggesting that a form of political order already exists within the village.

This position becomes even more evident in the second Discourse, where Marsilius supplements Aristotle’s account with Cicero’s explanation of the origins of human societies. Drawing on Cicero’s De Inventione, Marsilius describes a group of “wise and resourceful men” whose “inclination, persuasion, and encouragement led the rest to form a fully developed political community” (DP, 402, 461). Ultimately, Marsilius’ integration of Aristotle’s account of the origins of human society was already implicit in his reinstatement of the Augustinian paradigm (based on Genesis 1:26), which holds that the formation of human societies and “the institution or differentiation of civil functions” became necessary to compensate for the fall of human beings due to original sin (DP, 31). This blending of different sources in reconstructing the origins of human societies underscores the heterogeneous genesis of Marsilius’ ideas on the subject and his significant independence from Aristotle on these and other themes.

5.2. The Human Legislator as the People

At the core of Marsilius’ political theory in the Defender is the notion of the human legislator, who makes the laws, deposes the government (pars principans) in case the latter acts against the common good, and possesses supreme coercive power (potentia coactiva) in all matters pertaining to civil affairs as well as the concrete implementation of ecclesiological decisions. In Chapter 12 of the first Discourse, Marsilius argues that the legislator, which he defines as “the primary and proper efficient cause of the law,” is

The people or the universal body of the citizens, or else its prevailing part, when, by means of an election or will expressed in speech in a general assembly of the citizens, it commands or determines, subject to temporal penalty or punishment, that something should be done or omitted in respect of human civil acts. (DP 66–67)

As no comparable emphasis is placed on the legislator in Aristotle or in any other Aristotelian commentator on Politics in the late medieval context (Mulieri 2021b; Nederman 1995a), the significance of this concept in Marsilius’ work serves as further evidence of his conceptual originality as well as his highly independent engagement with his sources.

Three aspects of Marsilius’ notion of the legislator must be emphasized. First, his theory of the legislator should primarily be understood as a theoretical construction that serves as the fundamental source of the legitimacy of power in the political community he envisions in the first Discourse (Mulieri 2023a; Nederman 1995a). In this sense, as argued by Nederman, popular consent plays a crucial role in Marsilius’ theory of the legislator and his description of the political community (Nederman 1995a). For the community to function properly, all members of the legislator and, more broadly, of the polity must agree on the human laws that are enacted, the division of the polity into its various parts, and the election of a particular government (see the entry on Medieval Political Philosophy). Second, Marsilius’ description of the legislator and the lawmaking procedure in certain chapters of the first part of Defender also reflects the functioning of lawmaking in the Italian city-states of his time (Briguglia 2013; Mulieri, Masolini and Pelletier 2023). In fact, in Chapter 13 of the first Discourse (especially I.13.8), he distinguishes different stages of the lawmaking process and describes a continuous relationship between the prudent men and the general populace in the proposal, discussion, and approval of laws. Third, Marsilius’ concept of the human legislator also echoes legal theories of the legitimacy of power that were prevalent in the medieval period (Quillet 1970: Rubinstein 1965). For example, his depiction of the legislator as the people mirrors the idea, implicit in the lex regia de imperio, that the legitimacy of the emperor’s legislative or executive power derives from the Roman people (Lee 2018; Ullmann 1961).

Marsilius’ notion of the legislator has been interpreted in various ways by different scholars. Some, particularly in 20th-century scholarship, viewed his endorsement of the people as lawgivers as evidence that he was a precursor of modern ideas of democracy and liberalism or, more simply, a republican theorist (Gewirth 1951; Lagarde 1934; Skinner 1978). Other scholars have emphasized that Marsilius’ formulation of the human legislator as the people should be understood as a reaffirmation of the lex regia de imperio, a point he makes clear in the Defensor Minor (Piaia 1999; Quillet 1970; Rubinstein 1965). More recently, several scholars, from different perspectives, have argued that Marsilius’ theory of the human legislator is merely a generic theoretical construction that he strategically advances to gain support from as many temporal rulers as possible in opposition to the idea of the plenitude of power (Briguglia 2013; Condren 1977; Nederman 1995a). In this regard, it is also worth noting that, unlike Dante Alighieri (see entry on Dante Alighieri), Marsilius does not adhere to a universalist conception of empire. Rather, he believes that different types of political regimes can coexist (for example in DP, 496–497).

5.3. Collective Prudence

If Marsilius’ concept of the human legislator is primarily articulated in Chapter 12 of the first Discourse of the Defender, its philosophical foundations must be traced back to Chapter 11 (Mulieri 2023a; Gilson 1948; Nardi 1960). In Chapter 10, reflecting debates common among 13th- and 14th-century commentators on the Politics and the Nicomachean Ethics (Costa 2023; Lewis 1963), Marsilius outlines four distinct meanings of human law before isolating the definitions most central to his political system. In its third definition, “law” pertains to the norms of a religion and is defined as a “rule containing admonitions for those human acts that result from an imperative, insofar as they are ordered toward glory or punishment in the world to come” (DP, 52). In this definition, Marsilius includes all “religious followings” that are considered laws “either wholly or in part”, with the Mosaic and evangelical laws containing the full truth, in contrast to “those of Mohammed or the Persians” (DP, 53). Finally, in his fourth and most significant definition, Marsilius asserts that law can be understood in two ways: as a “science or doctrine of right” (DP, 53) when considered in terms of its content, and as a rule that must be enforced when viewed in terms of its implementation. For Marsilius, a proper human law must integrate both perspectives, such that a “perfect law” necessarily combines “justice” with “coercive power” (DP, 53). In Chapter 11, Marsilius situates this notion of perfect law within the framework of political prudence, drawing on a well-established idea among commentators on the Nicomachean Ethics that law requires prudence, which in turn depends on “long experience” (Costa 2023). However, Marsilius’ perspective on this topic is particularly original.

He begins by explaining that:

no one, however virtuous, can lack perverted passion and ignorance in the same way as the law. And therefore it is safer for civil judgements to be regulated by law than committed to the discretion of a judge, however virtuous. (DP, 59)

Then Marsilius adds:

Since, therefore, the law is an eye resulting from many eyes, i.e. an understanding forged from the understanding of many, for the purpose of avoiding error with regard to civil judgements and of judging correctly, it is safer for those judgements to be made in accordance with the law than at the judge’s discretion. (DP, 59)

According to Marsilius, the best way to ensure this impartiality is to minimize the subjective interpretations of judges and instead ground human laws in an adequate theoretical framework—one that consists of a collective theory of knowledge and experience. This is where Marsilius develops what is arguably one of the most original aspects of his political theory (Mulieri 2023b; Nardi 1960): a collective theory of prudence with no clear antecedents in medieval political philosophy. In his view, the “long experience” necessary to acquire prudence must not derive from the knowledge of a single generation alone but must instead be the cumulative result of the experiences and insights of many successive generations over the course of history. As he writes:

what one man discovers or can know by himself, both in the science of what is just and beneficial in civil terms and in the other sciences, is little or nothing. Going further, what men of one era observe is an imperfect thing in comparison with that which is observed as a result of many eras (DP, 59)

Marsilius thus formulates a collective and trans-generational theory of experience and prudence as the necessary foundations of just human laws. The terms “experience” and “prudence” carry complex meanings in Marsilius’ thought (Mulieri 2023c). Following Aristotle, he presents prudence as a dianoetic virtue—one that requires cultivation through extensive practice, training and experience. For Marsilius, as for Aristotle, “experience” is the basis of prudence, which in turn serves as the grounding for human laws and ensures their impartiality. However, since human law is a collective enterprise—given that the legislator is “the people” or “the universal body of citizens”—Marsilius connects it to a collective notion of prudence. While Aristotle typically conceived of prudence as a dianoetic virtue pertaining to individual ethical action, in the Politics he also alludes to a collective form of prudence (Politics III.11–15, 1282a14–16), which can be exercised by the many through the ex post evaluation of magistrates within the polity. Some medieval commentators, such as Peter of Auvergne, briefly acknowledged this collective dimension of prudence, though without attributing to it significant importance. By contrast, also drawing on ideas rooted in the Latin Averroist tradition (Brenet 2006, 2019; Nardi 1960; Tabarroni 2019), Marsilius places the concept of collective prudence at the core of his political theory, treating it as the very foundation of human law (Mulieri 2023c). Moreover, Marsilius uses the concepts of experience and prudence interchangeably with scientia (science), implying that they share the same degree of epistemic certainty.

5.4. The Body Politic and the Human Body

Another important theme in the Defender is the presence of medical metaphors and concepts in Marsilius’ work. Of course, metaphors of the human body used to describe political problems already appear in Aristotle’s Politics and were also present in several medieval commentaries on this text. However, Marsilius’ training as a physician—attested by Mussato—his documented practice as a physician in Paris before leaving the city, as well as his closeness to Peter of Abano, likely played a role in his knowledge of this topic, which he drew from various medical and natural philosophy sources (Marangon 1997). Some scholars have rightly compared Marsilius’ attention to medical metaphors to that of John of Salisbury (Aichele 2012; Briguglia 2013; Nederman 1995a; Shogimen 2012), who draws similar comparisons in Books 5 and 6 of his Policraticus (see Stanford Entry on John of Salisbury). While the latter draws anatomical parallels between the various parts of the city and the various parts of the human body, Marsilius primarily employs the medical concept of complexion—that is, the Galenic notion of the proportional balance among the body’s various humors—to draw an analogy between the human body and the body politic (Kaye 2014). As Marsilius writes:

An animal which is in a good condition in respect of its nature is composed of certain proportionate parts arranged in respect of each other, all communicating their actions between themselves and towards the whole; likewise too the city which is in a good condition and established in accordance with reason is made up of certain such parts. A city and its parts would therefore seem to be in the same relation to tranquillity as an animal and its parts is to health. (DP: 12)

In Marsilius’ view, one of the main ways human beings can achieve a self-sufficient life is by ensuring that the actions and passions of the polity are proportionate, just as they are in a state of good health in the human body. Marsilius’ theory of government is based on the idea of complexion and on the premodern medical concept of the proportionate harmony of the body’s different humors as a necessary condition for achieving peace in the body politic (Shogimen 2012; Nederman 1995a).

Another important theme in Marsilius’s work is the Aristotelian notion of the heart as the central organ of the body and the source of blood circulation. Peter of Abano argues that the heart is the principal organ of the human body because it houses both the soul and human intellect (Petrus de Abano 1504, f. 56v, Shogimen 2012: 104). The traditional idea that the heart is the governing center of the body, along with the comparison found in Peter’s Conciliator between this theme and the function of the ruler in the political regime, also appears in Marsilius (Shogimen 2012). However, in the Defender, Marsilius presents a more nuanced position on the political implications of the medical-anatomical metaphor of the heart. In Chapter 15 of the first Discourse, he defines the human legislator or “universal body of citizens” as the “soul” (anima) of the political community (DP, 92). From this soul, he claims, one part is or should be “formed first within it, which is analogous to the heart” (DP, 91).

As in the case of Peter of Abano, Marsilius shows a slight preference for identifying the government, or the heart, with the non-hereditary and elective monarch—a clear allusion to the imperial office and the position of Ludwig the Bavarian. In fact, Marsilius argues that the government, or pars principans, is, like the heart, the noblest part among all the other parts of human and animal bodies. At the same time, Marsilius occasionally employs corporeal metaphors to represent different components of the political community described in the Defender, one of which is that of the human law as “an eye resulting from many eyes” (DP, 60). Joel Kaye has examined in detail the significance of Galen’s two different models of equalization in the Defender, particularly in determining the complex relationship between the government and the legislator. According to Kaye (2014), Marsilius appears to oscillate between a clear and unequivocal recognition of the legislator’s importance as a horizontal decision-making body and a more hierarchical, top-down model—one that, like Peter of Abano’s, tends to view the government (represented by the heart in the human body) as the directive principle of the political community, conceived by analogy to the human body

6. Second Discourse.

Marsilius’ ecclesiological arguments in the second Discourse have generally attracted less attention among contemporary scholars compared to the Paduan’s philosophical and political ideas. Michael Sweeney’s claim that “the secondary literature on Marsilius’ spiritual theology is one of the least developed areas of his thought” (Sweeney 2012, 184) aptly describes a prevailing prejudice that has even led some scholars to argue that, for Marsilius, Christianity was merely a “social problem” to be solved (Pincin 1967). This view fails to do justice to the fact that, in the second Discourse, Marsilius’s rejection of the plenitude of power is rooted in a highly innovative ecclesiological theory and a theory of the general council, to which, as we shall see, he gives a notably original definition. Two key aspects must be considered when assessing the second Discourse and its relationship to the first Discourse of the Defender. First, several scholars have emphasized that the second Discourse should be read as a consistent and logical continuation of the first, in which Marsilius presents his arguments based on human reason (Brett 2005; Briguglia 2013; Nederman 1995a). In the second Discourse, he revisits some of these arguments but recasts them in theological and ecclesiological terms. In both Discourses, his primary objective remains the same: to refute the doctrine of the plenitude of power, albeit through different modes of reasoning. Second, for this reason, it is misguided to interpret the relationship between the two Discourses through the lens of the so-called “double truth” doctrine, which earlier scholars associated with the Averroist tradition (Condren 1977; Gilson 1948)—although the very notion of double truth has increasingly been challenged in recent scholarship (Bianchi 2008; Landucci 2006). In the Defender, there is no opposition between reason and Revelation in the way Marsilius deploys arguments from both domains to critique the plenitude of power. Rather, he treats them as complementary, placing them on equal footing rather than in conflict

6.1. Divine/Human Laws and Human Acts

An indication of continuity between the two Discourses of the Defender appears in Marsilius’s theory of human acts and its relation to human, divine, and natural law. As discussed, in Chapter 10 of the first Discourse, Marsilius offers multiple definitions of law. In Chapter 8 of the second Discourse, he expands upon these distinctions in light of his theory of human acts. In this context, he slightly revises the fourfold model of law introduced in I.10 and proposes two additional typologies based on their relation to coercive power (potentia coactiva). He distinguishes laws that consist merely of admonitions without coercive force—such as those found in the “active or productive” disciplines (e.g., the arts)—from those, primarily human and divine law, that possess coercive power, meaning their observance or transgression may be “subject to penalty or reward being meted out to those who do or omit them through the coercive power of another agent” (DP, 215). Marsilius emphasizes that coercive power is applied differently across distinct domains. In the case of human law, rewards and punishments are enacted in this life; in contrast, divine law is concerned exclusively with rewards and punishments in the afterlife.

This revised classification of law is related to a complex theory of human acts. Marsilius begins by distinguishing between acts that are “capable of being ordained to the end of this world, sc. the sufficiency of worldly life,” and those ordained “to the end of the world to come, which we call eternal life or glory” (DP, 213). He then classifies human acts into two main categories. The first, “non-commanded acts” (DP, 214), refers to “involuntary acts” (Costa 2023: 110), which occur “apart from the empire of the mind” (DP, 213), such as sensory perceptions and affective emotions—for example, desires caused by perception. The second category, which Marsilius names “commanded acts” (DP, 214), includes “imperative acts” (Costa 2023), which result “from the empire of the human mind” (DP, 213); that is, acts deliberately governed and commanded by the intellect, or rational part of the soul. Examples of the latter include deliberate decisions to fulfil or resist involuntary desires. “Commanded acts” are further divided into “immanent” and “transitive”. For Marsilius, “immanent” acts are those that do not extend beyond the subject “producing them” (DP, 214). These include internal acts—habits or operations of knowledge and desire—that hold moral significance but lack external consequences (Costa 2023: 108). By contrast, “transitive” acts are performed through “some exterior organ of the body” (DP, 214) and represent the externalization of “immanent” acts in their effect upon other subjects. As such, “transitive” acts are those that extend beyond the agent and acquire both moral and juridical significance, insofar as they have the potential to cause harm or confer benefit upon others (Costa 2023).

The different models of law that Marsilius presents in II.8 regulate human acts in distinct ways. Marsilius argues that human laws do not concern themselves with involuntary or “immanent” acts; rather, they apply only to “transitive” acts, that is, acts with a practical bodily manifestation (DP, 215). When Marsilius claims that human laws regulate “transitive” acts, he means that such laws are capable of rewarding or punishing individuals who perform “transitive” acts within the framework of human jurisdiction and during this life. In contrast, Christian divine law—or evangelical law—applies to all deliberate acts, both “immanent” and “transitive”. It governs not only those acts that affect others but also those internal to the agent. However, the coercive power of divine law is limited to the afterlife. As a result, its rewards and punishments cannot be implemented in the present world by human authorities; they are reserved solely for Christ, the legislator of the life to come. This implies that, according to Marsilius, the law of Christ possesses no coercive force in the temporal realm. Only the human legislator—that is, “the people” or “the whole body of citizens”—may determine whether someone is to be punished or rewarded in this life, including for actions considered sinful under divine law. Therefore, Marsilius insists that divine and evangelical law lack any coercive power in the present life. Iacopo Costa highlights the anti-Thomistic nature of this position. In his comparison of Marsilius and Aquinas on the relationship between divine and human law, Costa describes Marsilius’ view as “probably one of the most revolutionary ideas that a medieval author put forward” (Costa 2023: 120).

6.2. Evangelical Poverty and the Notion of “Right”

A further indication of continuity between the two Discourses of the Defender appears in Marsilius’ discussion of evangelical poverty in the second Discourse, which includes a highly original theory of natural right. In Marsilius’ time, a heated debate took place between certain factions within the Franciscan order and the clergy of the Roman Church over whether Christ and the Apostles had observed the vow of highest poverty, and what implications this had for the contemporary Church. While the former argued that Christ and the Apostles had embraced the ideal of highest poverty and that the Church should follow their example, the Roman Church rejected this position. Marsilius engages with the principal arguments in this debate and takes a clear stance. Scholars have noted that his treatment of the topic in the second Discourse closely resembles the structure of a quaestio, the traditional method of argumentation in medieval universities (Lambertini 2012). Indeed, Marsilius discusses in detail many of the technical terms associated with the question and aligns himself with the Franciscans, affirming the view that Christ and the Apostles had renounced the property (dominium) of both individual and common possessions (DP, 262–286).

In II.8, the Paduan distinguishes between two principal meanings of the concept of “right”. One, which is central to Marsilius’ technical discussion of evangelical poverty, defines “right” as a “human act, power or acquired disposition that issues from an imperative of the human mind” (DP, 253). This conception has led some scholars to characterize this meaning of “right” as “subjective” (Brett 2006; Tierney 1991), in the sense that it refers to an individual’s capacity or entitlement to act. This meaning serves Marsilius’ purpose of isolating an idea of right that can be used to ground the legal idea of property (dominium), the definition of which is essential to any discussion of evangelical poverty. Marsilius also distinguishes another meaning, more typical of medieval thought, and identifies “right” with the third and fourth definitions of “law” presented in DP I.10. In this sense, “right” is essentially synonymous with law, understood either as a religious set of norms (such as Mosaic law or evangelical law) or as human law. It is this latter notion of right that proves crucial for understanding Marsilius’s discussion of natural right.

In fact, even if Marsilius takes the floor in the debate about apostolic poverty, upholding a conclusion that formally concurs with that defended by the Franciscans, he does so by subscribing to “a quite different theoretical framework, both on the level of ecclesiology and of political theory in general” (Lambertini 2012: 263). Marsilius’ position on natural right, which closely echoes Aristotle, is a typical example of this same attitude. Marsilius does not accept the distinction between positive law and natural right, a distinction common in the Franciscan tradition (Lambertini 2012, 261). As Lambertini points out, his silence on this topic “is telling and reveals once again his mistrust toward the notion of natural law” and his intention to defend Franciscan ideas without any recourse to Franciscan notions of natural law (Lambertini 2012, 262).

6.3. The Idea of Natural Right

Marsilius’ theory of natural right reflects his radically distinctive understanding of the relationship between divine and human law and human acts, as previously discussed. In Chapter 12 of the second Discourse, Marsilius provides two different definitions of natural right. He first argues that natural right is something “upon which almost all agree as something honest that should be observed” (DP, 253). According to a second account, however, natural right is a “dictate of right reason” that falls under divine law. Marsilius clearly rejects the first account of natural right, writing that he considers it “equivocal” because “natural” in this context means “conventional” (DP, 254). As for the second view of natural right, Marsilius’ position is more ambiguous. Although he appears to suggest that, in this case as well, the phrase natural right could be considered equivocal—presenting something conventional as natural—he immediately adds that natural right as a “dictate of reason” is useful in distinguishing between what is licit and illicit “in absolute terms” (DP, 254). Marsilius defines “licit” as “everything that has been done according to a command or permission of the law or omitted according to a prohibition or permission of the law” (DP, 252), while “its contrary or opposite” is termed “illicit”. To illustrate this view, Marsilius refers to cases in which prohibitions and permissions deemed licit under human laws are patently illicit under divine law. In such cases, he explains, “what is licit and illicit in absolute terms should be understood according to divine law rather than human”. In fact, Marsilius acknowledges that absolute notions of “licit” and “illicit” play an important role in assessing moral behavior in earthly life. However, unlike Aquinas, Marsilius strips the idea of natural right of any decisive role in the formulation of human laws (Costa 2023). For him, an extra-juridical standard for judging human action holds only limited political significance. This is because—just as in the case of Christian law’s judgment concerning deliberate “immanent” and “transitive” acts—punishments for transgressions and prohibitions grounded in natural right, and therefore in absolute notions of “licit” and “illicit,” can be enforced only in the afterlife by the supreme judge, Christ (Brett 2006; Costa 2023). This position makes clear that such punishments cannot be carried out in earthly life unless they are authorized by the human legislator (Lewis 1963; Nederman 1995a), which, as Marsilius explains in Chapter 12 of the first Discourse, is “the people” or the “universal body of citizens”.

Marsilius’ position is particularly original within the context of medieval political thought (Brett 2005; Hamilton-Bleakley 2007). Yet, interpreters have disagreed on the sources of Marsilius’ position. For some, the roots of this position are to be found in Aristotle’s thought (Brett 2005). Cary Nederman has emphasized the link between Marsilius’ ideas on natural right and Cicero’s views on the subject, also connecting it to Marsilius’ evocation of a “quasi-natural” law, which consists of a “certain duty of human society” (DP, 16), in the first part of the Defender (Nederman 2020: 111–112). Other interpreters have studied the complex relationship between Marsilius and Aquinas’ positions on natural law (Brett 2006; Costa 2023; Hamilton-Bleakly 2007). The strong similarities between Marsilius’ position and Averroes’ ideas in his commentary on the Nicomachean Ethics have also been underlined (Mulieri 2023a; Strauss 1953). This commentary had been translated into Latin by Hermannus Alemannus in the 13th century, and there is evidence of its presence in 13th-century Paris (Gauthier 1959: 117 and 123; Costa 2008).

Regardless of its origins, Marsilius’s position on natural right must be understood in relation to his theory of collective prudence. As we have seen, in the Defender, he asserts that the theoretical foundation of human laws lies in a collective and epistemic conception of prudence (Mulieri 2023b; Nardi 1960; Syros 2007a; 2007b). Interpreting this claim in light of his stance on natural right—particularly his assertion that natural right has limited or no value in determining what is licit and illicit within the polity—further clarifies his broader legal and political framework. Indeed, Marsilius replaces natural right with his theory of collective prudence, which he regards as the sole source of legitimacy for human laws. This move may have been politically motivated. As Mulieri explains, “grounding human laws on natural law (which so often depended on divine law) could easily lend itself to being used as an argument in favour of the relevance of ecclesiastical power for the determination of temporal power”, thereby indirectly supporting claims in favor of the plenitude of power (Mulieri 2023: 556). Conversely, by basing the legitimacy of human laws on a collective theory of prudence rather than on natural right, Marsilius provides an entirely human foundation for political authority and legal legitimacy in the polity he describes in the Defender.

6.4 Ecclesiology: Spiritual and Temporal Power

Marsilius’ attack on the plenitude of power leads him to develop highly original ideas regarding the concept of the Church and the role of the Council in the second Discourse. When discussing the Church, he begins by conducting a complex semantic analysis of the various meanings of this notion that were prevalent in his time. He argues that, based on its original Greek meaning, in its first and second senses, the term Church refers to “a gathering of a people contained under one single government” (DP, 144) and a “temple or house in which the faithful worship God as a community and most often pray to him” (DP, 144–145). A third meaning identifies the Church with “all the priests or bishops, deacons, and other ministers of the temple or church in the previous signification,” (DP 144) while a fourth meaning more specifically refers to the ecclesiastical ministries of the Church of Rome, including the Pope and the cardinals. Finally, Marsilius provides his own definition of the Church, which he describes as the “truest and most proper of all according to the original application of the term or the intention of those who originally applied it” (DP, 144). According to this definition, the Church is the “universal body of faithful believers who call upon the name of Christ, and of all the parts of this body within any community, even the household” (DP, 144). With this formulation, Marsilius presents a vision of the Church that is not hierarchical but horizontal, as it centers on the community of the faithful rather than the traditional ecclesiastical structures of the Roman Church in his time, with the Pope as its head. In fact, George Garnett has argued that Marsilius’ definition reflects the Church as it existed before Constantine’s conversion and demonstrates a “selective” use of Canon Law sources to show that, even after Constantine, the Church had not become a “papal monarchy,” as it became at a later stage (Garnett 2006: 189). This aligns well with Michael Sweeney’s characterization of Marsilius’ Church as an entity that, although it exists in the earthly world and maintains some relationship with temporal power, has its ultimate purpose in the heavenly world. (Sweeney 2012: 181).

To better situate these positions, Marsilius examines the question of what kind of power Christ, who first established the Church in earthly life, granted to Peter and the Apostles at the very beginning of Christian history. Drawing on various arguments traditionally used by both sides in earlier disputes over the political characterization of ecclesiastical power (Briguglia 2013), Marsilius asserts that Christ explicitly subjected himself to the jurisdiction of civil power, as made clear by several Scriptural passages. According to Marsilius, Christ also submitted to the civil jurisdiction of Pilate’s trial. In fact, as explained by him, “Christ in his purposed intention, words and actions wanted to and did exclude himself and the apostles from the office of prince or of contentious jurisdiction, government or coercive judgement of whatever sort in this world” (DP, 161). Therefore, Christ never granted civil or coercive jurisdiction to the Apostles, Peter, or any other priest or bishop. This means that the power Christ conferred upon the Apostles and the early Church was not coercive in temporal terms but purely spiritual. As a result, the canonical laws of the Church and the decisions made by priests, bishops, and other ecclesiastical ministers hold only consultative, not binding, authority over civil and political matters. As he had already explained in the first Discourse (Chapter 6), Marsilius reiterates in the second Discourse that priests and members of the clergy fulfil an important moral and public function by guiding believers on the path to salvation. The Paduan describes priests as “physicians of the soul” and claims that “by analogy” with the physician, a “priest judges and exhorts concerning those things that lead to the eternal health of the soul or to its eternal death or temporal penalty for the status of the world to come. But he neither can nor should hold anyone to such things by coercive power in this world” (DP, 211). Therefore, punishments related to sins, stemming from the moral counsel of priests, are akin to a physician’s recommendations for healing—they are advisory rather than politically binding unless explicitly adopted and enforced by a civil or political authority.

6.4. Heresy, Excommunication and Marsilius’ Conciliarism

The same reasoning can be applied to how Marsilius theorizes heresy and excommunication. According to him, while ecclesiastical authorities certainly have a say in determining who counts as a heretic or who should be excommunicated, it is up to the civil and political authority to confirm and enforce this decision (DP, 455–459). Without this civil and coercive endorsement, decisions of the clergy on excommunication and heresy remain ineffective and politically irrelevant. In fact, as shown by Bettina Koch, while in Defender heresy remains a crime that can be punished, clergymen may participate in a trial for heresy only as advisors and experts, while final judgments can be passed only by the coercive secular judge, namely the legislator or the prince mandated by the legislator (Koch 2012: 165). Moreover, Canon Law, for Marsilius, does not come with coercive power unless the human legislator decides to grant it such power, because it is not a set of laws that have been established by the human legislator. For Marsilius, insofar as we can speak of a priestly power, this is the “the power of performing the sacrament of the eucharist or body and blood of Christ, and also the power of binding or loosing men from their sin” (DP, 312). This power should instead be distinguished from the jurisdiction that certain bishops or ecclesiastical authorities exercise over a particular territory. While at the beginning of Church history these two powers were not clearly differentiated, over time they became entirely distinct, and the power of priests to perform the sacrament of the Eucharist no longer bore any direct relationship to jurisdictional authority.

At the core of Marsilius’s ecclesiological theory in the Defender lies a particularly original conception of the Council. Traditionally, the Council was understood as a gathering of bishops and other ecclesiastical authorities convened to decide matters of doctrine and church administration. In contrast, Marsilius envisions the Council as a “general assembly” of all the Christian faithful, representing “through succession, the gathering of the apostles and other elders of the faithful at that time” (DP, 361). The starting point of Marsilius’ reflection on this issue concerns the correct interpretation of the Holy Scriptures. Marsilius asserts that this interpretation should rest with the general Council of human believers—an assembly first convened by the Council of Apostles at the beginning of Christian history and which should continue to serve as the ultimate reference point for decisions regarding the interpretation of the Holy Scriptures. This assembly, which is “the general Council” of the faithful (DP 203; 358) rather than the Pope or the Roman clergy, must also have the authority to decide on complex ecclesiastical matters such as heresy, excommunication, and similar issues. Marsilius further states that “the provinces and communities of the world elect this Council” but “in accordance with the decision of their human legislator (be it single or several)” (DP 134). According to him, all the provinces of the world should elect a number of notables, priests, and laymen, who would then convene in a designated location to discuss what is necessary, appropriate, or uncertain regarding divine law. The members of the Council can make decisions concerning divine law. However, it would once again fall to the human legislator to transform the decisions of the Council into human laws and enforce them. This mechanism should not be interpreted through the lens of modern concepts of the separation of Church and State, but should instead be understood within the context of late medieval thought. In fact, as explained by Bettina Koch, Marsilius’ conciliarism “is not concerned to introduce a clear separation between Church and state, to use modern terminology. Indeed, he wants to integrate the Church into the secular state” (Koch 2012: 171).

7. The Defensor Minor and De Translatione Imperii. Marsilius’ Political Theory of Empire

Marsilius also authored a short treatise of 12 chapters called De translatione imperii. He announces the composition of this work in the last chapter of the second Discourse of the Defender (DP, 540). This treatise deals with a question that was quite typical in Marsilius’ context, i.e., the theme of the transfer of empire from the Romans to the Byzantines and then to the Franks and the Germans. The text largely reflects Landolfo Colonna’s pro-papal treatise Tractatus de statu et mutatione imperii, which was a work that Landolfo wrote in support of the role of the papacy in this transfer of empire (Briguglia 2012; Nederman 1995b). Marsilius’ text modifies Landolfo’s in some key passages with the aim of turning his treatise into a defence of the prerogatives of the empire. Marsilius’ presentation of this problem aims to defend the idea that none of the transfers of empire took place because of decisions of the clergy or the papacy but were the result of decisions made by human legislators.

Another work by Marsilius is the Defensor Minor, the composition date of which is likely 1340, though this remains a subject of scholarly debate. This short treatise reiterates some ideas that he had already explored in the Defender of Peace (with numerous quotations from the latter work). However, in this treatise, Marsilius’ pro-Empire stance becomes even more pronounced compared to the Defender (Briguglia 2012; Nederman 1995b). There are three main differences between the Defensor Minor and the Defender of Peace. First, in the former, Marsilius explicitly interprets his theory of the legislator as echoing the idea of the lex regia de imperio, referring to the legislator not simply as the people or the whole body of citizens but specifically as the Roman people (populus romanus). Second, unlike in the Defender, in Defensor Minor Marsilius appears to conflate the concepts of the legislator and the emperor (Briguglia 2012). In fact, according to him, it is not the legislator, as in the Defender, but the emperor who has the authority to convene the Council. Third, and perhaps most importantly, the Defensor Minor may also serve as a response to William of Ockham’s ideas on the Council (Briguglia 2012). While the latter denied the infallibility of the Council, Marsilius regarded this body as infallible, arguing that Truth emerges through dialogue among individual believers of the same faith and as a result of the workings of the Holy Spirit.

8. Marsilius’ Reception

The spread of Marsilius’ ideas was considerable, especially during the age of the Wars of Religion, when his anti-papal message—particularly in the second Discourse—was adopted by several Protestants who were attacking the political and theological prerogatives of the Roman Church and the Pope. It is no accident that the first edition of Defensor Pacis was published in Basel in 1522, with several other editions following during the 16th and 17th centuries, notably in Germany. An English translation was completed by William Marshall for Thomas Cromwell in 1535. Several papalist Counter-Reformation texts attacked Marsilius’ doctrine in the Defender (often without reading it), and by 1559, the text had been placed on the Index of Prohibited Books (Index Librorum Prohibitorum) in Rome. During the 19th and 20th centuries, some scholars were primarily interested in the political ideas contained in the first Discourse of the Defender, sometimes interpreting Marsilius’ concepts of the people, representation, government, and human law through modern and anachronistic lenses. More recently, the study of Marsilius’ reception has experienced a revival. Scholars have examined the influence of his thought in 16th- and 17th-century England (Izbiky 2012; Simonetta 2000a,b), in Althusius and Hobbes (Koch 2005, 2006; Simonetta 2000a,b), in Italian Renaissance and early modern political thought (Condren 1980; Masolini 2023; Piaia 1977), as well as his presence in contemporary contexts—for example, in the Third Reich (Godthardt 2023) or in contemporary political theory and philosophy (Mulieri 2021a; Nederman 2023; Piaia 2023; Vatter 2020). Nevertheless, the influence of Marsilius’ ideas remains a decidedly underdeveloped area of research that deserves more attention compared to other topics in Marsilius studies.

Bibliography

Works by Marsilius

• Marsilius von Padua, 1932–33, Defensor pacis, Richard Scholz (ed.), 2 volumes, Hanover: Monumenta Germaniae Historiae, Fontes iuris Germanici antiqui in usum scholarum seperatim editi, 7. Translations include:
  • Marsilius of Padua, 1928, Defensor pacis, C.W. Previté-Orton (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 1956 [2001], Defensor pacis, Alan Gewirth (trans.), New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Marsilio da Padova, 1960, Il Difensore della pace, Cesare Vasoli (ed.), Turin: Unione tipografico-editrice torinese.
  • Marsile de Padoue, 1968, Le Défenseur de la paix, Jeannine Quillet (trans.), Paris: Vrin.
  • –––, 1970, Le Defensor Pacis, Louvain–Paris: Nauwelaerts.
  • Marsilio da Padova, 2001, Il Difensore della pace, 2, Mariateresa Fumagalli Beonio Brocchieris (Introduction), Mario Conetti, Claudio Fiocchi, and Stefano Radice (trans.), Milan: BUR.
  • Marsilius of Padua, 2005, The Defender of the Peace, Annabel Brett (trans.), Cambridge Texts in the History of Political Thought, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Marsilius of Padua, 1993, Defensor Minor, Cary J. Nederman (ed.), Marsilius of Padua: “The Defender Minor” and “De Translatione Imperii”, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. Other translations include:
  • Marsilio da Padova, 1975, Il Difensore Minore, Cesare Vasoli (ed.), Naples: Guida.
  • Marsile de Padoue, 1979, Oeuvres mineures: Defensor minor and De translatione Imperii, Colette Jeudy and Jeannine Quillet (trans.), Paris: Éditions du CNRS.
  • Marsílio de Pádua, 1991, Defensor menor, José Antônio de Camargo Rodrìgues de Souza (ed.), Vozes: Petrópolis.

Other Primary Sources

• Peter of Auvergne, 2021, Scriptum super III–VIII libros Politicorum Aristotelis, Lidia Lanza (ed.), Wiesbaden: Reichert.
• Petrus de Abano, 1504, Conciliator differentiarum philosophorum et precipue medicorum, Venice: Leonardo Lauredano.
• Petrus de Alvernia, [QS] 2022, Questiones super I–VII libros Politicorum, Marco Toste (ed.), Leuven: Leuven University Press.

Secondary sources

• Aichele, Alexander, 2012, “Heart and Soul of the State: Some Remarks Concerning Aristotelian Ontology and Medieval Theory of Medicine in Marsilius of Padua’s Defensor Pacis”, in A Companion to Marsilius of Padua, Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition, 31, Gerson Moreno-Riaño and Cary J. Nederman (eds.), Leiden–Boston: Brill, 163–186.
• Battocchio, Riccardo, 2005, Ecclesiologia e politica in Marsilio da Padova, Fonti e ricerche di storia ecclesiastica padovana, 31, Padova: Istituto per la storia ecclesiastica padovana.
• Bianchi, Luca, 1990, II vescovo e i filosofi: La condanna parigina del 1277 e l’evoluzione dell’aristotelismo scolastico, Macerata–Bergamo: Pierluigi Lubrina.
• –––, 2008, Pour une histoire de la “double vérité”, Paris: Vrin.
• Billanovich, Giuseppe, 1976, “Il preumanesimo padovano”, in Storia della cultura veneta, vol. II: Il Trecento, Gianfranco Folena (ed.), Vicenza: Neri Pozza, 19–110.
• Black, Anthony, 2008, The West and Islam: Religion and Political Thought in World History, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Brenet, Jean-Baptiste, 2003, Transferts du Sujet: La Noétique D’Averroès Selon Jean de Jandun, Paris: Vrin.
• –––, 2006, “Théorie de l’intellect et organisation politique chez Dante et Averroès”, Rivista di filosofia neo-scolastica, 98(3): 467–487.
• –––, 2019, “Multitude et bene esse chez Averroès et Dante. Retour sur la Monarchie I, 3”, in Dante et l’averroisme, Alain de Libera, Jean-Baptiste Brenet, and Irène Rosier-Catach (eds.), Paris: Les Belles Lettres, 357–383.
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Other Internet Resources

• Entry on Marsilius of Padua, Catholic Encyclopedia.
• Entry on Marsilius of Padua (in French), Arlima.
• Entry on Marsilius of Padua (in Italian), Treccani.
• Text of The Defender of Peace (in Italian translation, Il difensore della pace), full online text, trans. Cesare Vasoli (archived on the Internet Archive).
• Marsilius of Padua, The Defender of Peace, vol. I: “Marsilius of Padua and Medieval Political Philosophy”, full online text of the introductory study by Alan Gewirth (archived on the Internet Archive).

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