Supplement to Mohist Canons
Pronunciation Guide
The following is a very rough guide to the pronunciation of some of the Chinese terms used in the article. A question mark indicates a rising tone, an exclamation point a falling tone. (Caution: Some of the suggested English equivalents approximate the Chinese sounds only vaguely.)
| Chinese Term | Approximate English Pronunciation |
| Bi (other) | “be” as in the verb “to be” |
| Bian (disputation) | “be-yen!” pronounced as a single syllable |
| Ci (expressions) | “tsuh?” as in “catsup,” dropping the initial ‘ca’ and final ‘p’ |
| Da Qu (“Big Selection”) | “da!” “chew” |
| Fei (not-this, wrong) | “fey” |
| He (matching) | “her?” without the final ‘r’ |
| Jian ai (inclusive concern) | “jee-yen,” pronounced as a single syllable; “I!” as in “I do” |
| Ke (admissible) | “ker” without the final ‘r’ |
| Li (benefit) | “lee!” |
| Mou (drawing parallels) | “moe?” |
| Mozi (classical text) | “mwo!” followed by “dz” |
| Pi (analogy) | “pee!” |
| Qi (breath, energy) | “chee!” as in “cheese” |
| Quan (weighing) | “ch” as in “cheese” followed by “when?” |
| Shi (this, right) | “shr!” or “sher!” as in “Sherlock” |
| Shí (reality, things, objects) | “shr?” or “sher?” as in “Sherlock” |
| Shuo (explanation) | “shwo” |
| Tian (heaven) | “tee-yen,” pronounced as a single syllable |
| Tong (same, similar) | “tohng?” (“toe” plus an “-ng?” ending) |
| Tui (extending) | “tway” |
| Xi (happiness) | “shee” as in ‘banshee’ |
| Xiao Qu (“Small Selection”) | “sheow” (rhymes with “meow”) “chew” |
| Xing (shape) | “sheeng?” “shee” as in ‘banshee’ plus an “-ng?” ending |
| Xu (empty, hollow) | like “issue” without the initial ‘i’ |
| Xunzi (classical Confucian text) | “issue,” without the initial ‘i’ and adding a final ‘n?’, followed by “dz” |
| Yi (thought, intention) | “e!” (a clipped pronunciation of the letter “e”) |
| Yi (duty, morality) | “e!” |
| Yuan (citing) | “yoo-wen?,” pronounced as a single syllable |
| Zhi (knowledge) | “jr!,” roughly like “jerk” without the final ‘k’ |
| Zhi (intention) | “jr!” |
| Zhuangzi (classical Daoist text) | “joo-wong” pronounced as one syllable, followed by “dz” |