Early Modern Rationalism

The expression ‘rationalism’ is a historiographical category that refers to a set of views more or less shared by a number of philosophers active in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries. This period saw the heyday of metaphysical system-building, but the expression ‘rationalism’, as the term is understood in this entry, connotes primarily epistemological commitments. Since the early twentieth century, ‘rationalism’ has typically been presented in contrast with ‘empiricism’. By contrast to so-called ‘empiricism’, which traces (all) knowledge to sensory experience, ‘rationalists’ tend to rely upon the powers of reason to explain and justify what we know.

This entry provides an account of the traditional narrative of early modern ‘rationalism’ while also extending that narrative to cover figures from typically under-represented backgrounds who hold commitments that can also plausibly be characterized as ‘rationalist’. The entry thus covers René Descartes (1596–1650), Baruch Spinoza (1632–1677), and Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646–1716), alongside Anton Wilhelm Amo (1703–1759), Margaret Cavendish (1623–1673), and Anne Conway (1631–1679). The entry also concludes by briefly suggesting future directions for scholarship on early modern rationalism involving the application of rationalist principles in topics such as social and political philosophy, as illustrated through the writings of Sor Juana Inés de la Cruz (1645–1695) and François Poulain de la Barre (1647–1723).

• 1. Introduction: Conceptualizing ‘Early Modern Rationalism’
  • 1.1 An Instrumentalist Approach to Early Modern Rationalism
• 2. The Traditional Narrative of Continental Rationalism
  • 2.1 Privileging Reason over Sensation
    • 2.1.1 Descartes on the Infallibility of Reason
    • 2.1.2 Spinoza on the Necessity of Rational Knowledge
    • 2.1.3 Leibniz’s Privileging of Reason over Sensation
  • 2.2 Innate Knowledge
    • 2.2.1 Innate Ideas in Descartes (and Cartesianism)
    • 2.2.2 Innateness in Spinoza’s Conception of Adequate Ideas
    • 2.2.3 Leibniz on Innate Ideas as Dispositions
  • 2.3 Certain and Probable Knowledge
    • 2.3.1 Descartes on Moral and Absolute Certainty
    • 2.3.2 Spinoza on the Certainty of Adequate Ideas
    • 2.3.3 Leibniz on Necessary and Contingent Truths
  • 2.4 The Intrinsic Intelligibility of Nature
    • 2.4.1 Descartes on God’s Omnipotence and the Intelligibility of Nature
    • 2.4.2 Spinoza on the Principle of Sufficient Reason
    • 2.4.3 Leibniz’s Core Principles of Intelligibility
• 3. Expanding the Scope of Early Modern Rationalism
  • 3.1 Privileging Reason over Sensation
    • 3.1.1 Amo on Sensation as Bodily, and Reason as Spiritual
    • 3.1.2 Cavendish on Sense and Rational Contemplation
    • 3.1.3 Conway on the Primacy of Rationality
  • 3.2 Innate Knowledge
    • 3.2.1 Amo’s Rejection of Innate Knowledge
    • 3.2.2 Cavendish on Innateness
    • 3.2.3 Conway on the Innate Dictates of Truth
  • 3.3 Certain and Probable Knowledge
    • 3.3.1 Amo on the Certainty of Scientia
    • 3.3.2 Cavendish on Certain and Probable Knowledge
    • 3.3.3 Conway on the Certainty of Objective Truths
  • 3.4 The Intrinsic Intelligibility of Nature
    • 3.4.1 Amo on the Intentionality of Creation
    • 3.4.2 Cavendish on the Order of Nature
    • 3.4.3 Conway on the Scale of Beings
• 4. Conclusion: The Future of ‘Rationalism’
• Bibliography
  • Primary Sources
  • Secondary Sources
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Introduction: Conceptualizing ‘Early Modern Rationalism’

As noted at the outset, ‘rationalism’ is a historiographical category that refers to a set of views more or less shared by a number of philosophers active in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries. The following criteria aim to represent a traditional understanding of rationalism that is mainly satisfied by three figures: René Descartes (1596–1650), Baruch Spinoza (1632–1677), and Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646–1716). It will become clear that these criteria do not apply as straightforwardly to other early modern philosophers, though there is good reason to think that these commitments were shared by more than just three figures. For the sake of narrowing down the scope of ‘rationalism’ to workable parameters, in this entry, to be a rationalist requires at least one of the following commitments:

1. A privileging of reason over sensation, imagination, or experience.
2. A commitment to the existence of innate knowledge/innate ideas.
3. A commitment to an epistemology wherein certain knowledge plays a role.
4. A commitment to the idea that reality is ordered in a rational and necessary way that is accessible to human reason.

These criteria are primarily epistemological in nature, though it is worth noting that metaphysical issues – particularly involving the ontology of substance – also occupy an important place among philosophers traditionally associated with rationalism. While all of the philosophers traditionally associated with rationalism meet several of these criteria, they also share a metaphysical commitment to the reality of substance as an underlying principle of intelligibility. This metaphysical commitment does not by itself sharpen the account of rationalism, however, since it manifests also in medieval metaphysics and, though not uncritically, in figures associated with early modern ‘empiricism’, such as Thomas Hobbes (1588–1679) and John Locke (1632–1704).

Importantly, the traditional division between rationalism and empiricism has been criticized in recent years. For an overview of objections to this distinction, see Dobre and Nydan 2013. Scholars have argued that the labels of ‘rationalism’ and ‘empiricism’ emerged for theoretical and pedagogical ends that are alien to the period they aim to characterize. Theoretically, the division between rationalism and empiricism played an important role in the tradition of German idealism. It provided a simplified narrative of early modern debates in epistemology and metaphysics, which made it possible for followers of Immanuel Kant (1724–1804) to present the critical system as the culmination of modern philosophy (Vanzo 2013, 2016). Pedagogically, the division between rationalism and empiricism presents a simplified template for teaching the otherwise diverse history of early modern philosophy. But it also complicates the investigation of hundreds of figures who do not fit cleanly into this narrative. Given the possibility of such ulterior motives, one might wonder whether the labels of ‘rationalism’ and ‘empiricism’ reflect the commitments of philosophers writing in the early modern period at all. This entry acknowledges that these historical categories are open to questioning and welcomes the idea that they ought to be closely scrutinized.

Scholars have also criticized the geographical divisions invoked to substantiate the theoretical distinction between rationalism and empiricism. While ‘rationalism’ has been associated with thinkers on the continent of Europe, ‘empiricism’ has been associated with British thinkers – in the historical (colonial) sense, including Ireland. Norton (1981) criticizes this geographical division by noting the crucial role that the French philosopher Pierre Gassendi (1592–1655) played in propagating empiricism during the period (see also Loeb 1981). Indeed, philosophical crossings from Britain were frequent and fruitful. Many of the figures associated with British empiricism spent periods of time in different parts of continental Europe, and some of the authors discussed in this entry (such as Margaret Cavendish and Anne Conway) spent a majority of their lives in England. The narrative dividing ‘British’ and ‘continental’ theoretical developments holds some historical basis, as in the famous dispute over the development of calculus between the followers of Isaac Newton and Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (Hall 1980; Guicciardini 2017). Yet, this entry suggests that strict geographical divisions are likely to limit and mislead histories of early modern philosophy. This entry drops the appeal to geography in the remainder of the article given that several of the figures discussed are British.

1.1 An Instrumentalist Approach to Early Modern Rationalism

In recent decades, historians of philosophy have started paying considerable attention to the narratives employed to understand the development of ideas, arguments, and positions over the early modern period. Researchers are becoming increasingly committed to recovering the work of marginalized figures who, due to longstanding narratives originating in the nineteenth and twentieth centuries, are typically overlooked in scholarship. O’Neill (1997) was instrumental in this movement by emphasizing the recovery of women’s contributions to the history of philosophy in particular. It is traditional to tell the story of (European) early modern philosophy in terms of a ‘rationalist versus empiricist’ narrative. Indeed, this narrative is still a dominant one when it comes to teaching early modern (European) philosophy. However, increased scrutiny on this traditional narrative has led many scholars to question the accuracy of terms like ‘rationalism’ and ‘empiricism’ as descriptive labels. Of course, in general scholars have always been aware that thinkers like Descartes, Leibniz, and Spinoza did not label themselves rationalists. Like any ‘ism’-term in the history of philosophy, rationalism is useful insofar as it brings together ideas and thinkers that have important commitments in common (see above for an attempt to identify the criteria for being a ‘rationalist’). Even so, more recent narratives – especially those intended to bring historically under-represented figures (such as women, people of color, and philosophers of non-European descent) into the canon – have placed considerable pressure on whether we ought to continue to talk about ‘rationalists’ at all. An alternative approach might focus on concrete historical connections between early modern philosophers, preferring labels that authors ascribed to themselves (such as ‘Cartesian’).

This entry identifies three main approaches to conceptualizing ‘rationalism’ as a historiographical category: realism, eliminativism, and instrumentalism. The realist approach assumes that the criteria for rationalism strictly define a substantive theoretical trend that was genuinely present during the early modern period. The eliminativist approach, by contrast, suggests that these criteria are either inaccurate or overly restrictive in their representation of early modern philosophy. While there are good reasons to interrogate the scope and accuracy of the label ‘rationalism’, this entry adopts an instrumentalist approach to the concept.

This entry understands the changing attitudes towards categories such as ‘rationalism’ on the model of conceptual fragmentation in the sciences. Taylor and Vickers (2017) identify numerous scientific concepts – such as ‘species’, ‘intelligence’, ‘health’, and ‘chemical bonds’ – about which multiple interpretations have emerged from previously stable definitions (with one underlying meaning). A similar process seems to be underway with traditional historiographical categories. ‘Rationalism’ began as a substantive category that, like a shard of glass placed under increasing pressure, has begun to fragment into new and distinct categories. This pressure might lead to the shattering of the concept altogether, which is suggested by the growing dissatisfaction among teachers and researchers with traditional narratives dividing ‘rationalism’ and ‘empiricism’ (see Gordon-Roth and Kendrick 2015, Vanzo 2015, Shapiro 2016, O’Neill 2019, Detlefsen and Shapiro 2023, and the entry on feminist history of philosophy). Indeed, it may appear to future scholars that an entry on rationalism is outdated and unnecessary. At present, however, the category is still in popular use and requires an explanation of how it is standardly used and why one might be skeptical of its continued usage.

By adopting an instrumentalist rather than realist or eliminativist approach to the concept, this entry acknowledges but hopes to bracket the concern that ‘rationalism’ is descriptively inaccurate as a category of early modern philosophy (for a similar approach to the historiographical concept of ‘Western Philosophy’, see Moravec and West 2024). In other words, one might reject the idea that ‘rationalism’ is akin to a natural-kind term that accurately describes the historical situation and configuration of early modern philosophy in Europe. On this interpretation, we should continue to talk about early modern rationalism only insofar as it is helpful for us to do so – and only because it is helpful. Instrumentalists about the concept of rationalism would thus avoid talking as though ‘rationalism’ picks out a stable set of ideas or thinkers from the early modern period. Instead, they would think of it as just one lens through which we can examine what, from a contemporary perspective, brings groups of ideas and thinkers together. It would be a mistake, according to this instrumentalist approach, to think that, in an objective sense, there was a group of philosophers who were the rationalists. Questions about whether a particular thinker was really a rationalist become less important than questions like ‘why might we call that thinker a rationalist?’ and ‘what is our aim in doing so?’. This is the kind of approach taken in this entry. The criteria identified in the previous subsection are not necessary or sufficient conditions for including a particular philosopher amongst the rationalists. Rather, they should be seen as a cluster of concepts that pick out, at most, a family resemblance between thinkers who share certain metaphysical or epistemological commitments. (As we will find in §3, certain thinkers discussed in this entry do not satisfy some of those criteria.)

This approach fits well with a relatively new movement in the historiography of early modern philosophy which argues that it is necessary to retrieve and reassess the contributions of thinkers who are excluded by standard narratives of early modern philosophy (or who are, at best, recognized by these narratives as being of secondary importance: see, e.g., Rutherford 2006; Haakonssen 2007). This push for a renewal opens up the possibility that the early modern philosophical canon that was consolidated for so long may be modified in terms of its authors, its works, and its themes (Vanzo 2016).

In sum, while the notion of rationalism can be a useful heuristic, especially for teaching and learning, it ought not be construed as a strict set of criteria. A less restrictive conception of rationalism not only supports a more historically accurate and nuanced understanding of philosophical movements in the period but it also enables us to apply the concept of ‘rationalism’ (or ‘being a rationalist’) to a more diverse set of thinkers and ideas. As historians of philosophy have increasingly worked to develop more inclusive canons in the past decades, such a reconceptualization is long overdue.

2. The Traditional Narrative of Continental Rationalism

This section explores how the criteria for rationalism outlined above manifest in the writings of three philosophers who have been associated with the traditional narrative of Continental Rationalism: René Descartes (1596–1650), Baruch Spinoza (1632–1677), and Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646–1716). At times, this entry will also discuss trends in larger intellectual movements such as Cartesianism. Given the broad scope of this entry, each section calls attention to some important themes and passages that are relevant to identifying each author’s relationship with rationalism. Each section also provides references to scholarship that offers readers a deeper investigation of the themes outlined by this entry.

2.1 Privileging Reason over Sensation

The first commitment this entry identifies as a criterion for being considered a rationalist is the privileging of reason over imagination, sensation, or experience. Different authors naturally arrive at different conceptualizations of reason and sensation. To account for this, this section explains how the concepts in question are understood by each author. Additionally, it identifies themes that display how each author assigns an epistemic priority to reason over imagination, sensation, or experience.

2.1.1 Descartes on the Infallibility of Reason

Descartes describes reason as “the power of judging well and of distinguishing the true from the false” (Discourse on the Method, AT VI 2, CSM I 111). Reason is carried out by two main actions: intuition and deduction. Intuition is “the indubitable conception of a clear and attentive mind”, whereas deduction is the “train of reasoning” of “single propositions” acquired through intuition (Rules for the Direction of the Mind, AT X 368–9, CSM I 14­–15). Sensations, by contrast, are perceptions of the mind that occur on account of various motions in the nerves of the body (Principles of Philosophy, AT VIIIA 318, CSM I 282).

Although Descartes identifies reason and sensation as “two ways of arriving at a knowledge of things” (Rules, AT X 365, CSM I 12), he prioritizes reason over sensation with respect to acquiring knowledge for the following reasons. First, reason and sensation hold different purposes. The acquisition of knowledge is the express purpose of reason insofar as it is the power to judge correctly in order to discern the truth. Conversely, the main purpose of sensation is to inform us of what is “beneficial or harmful” to the mind-body composite. Descartes insists that we “misuse” the senses when we extend them beyond this purpose to serve as the (primary) source of knowledge (Sixth Meditation, AT VII 83, CSM II 57–8).

Second, reason is infallible while sensation is fallible. According to Descartes, the proper use of reason allows us “to arrive at a knowledge of things with no fear of being mistaken” (Rules; AT X 368, CSM I 14­). This is because the faculty of reason, when used properly, engenders only clear and distinct perceptions (Principles, AT VIIIA 16–17, CSM I 203; Second Meditation, AT VII 31–4, CSM II 21–3). For Descartes, everything that is perceived clearly and distinctly is true (Discourse, AT VI 18, 33, CSM I 120, 127; Principles, AT VIIIA 21, CSM I 207; Meditations, ‘Synopsis’, AT VII 13, CSM II 9; Third Meditation, AT VII 35, CSM II; Fourth Meditation, AT VII 58, CSM II 41). Therefore, reason is infallible since it produces clear and distinct perceptions that always lead to knowledge of the truth. By contrast, the senses are fallible because they frequently err and deceive us (Principles, AT VIIIA 5–6, CSM I 193–4; Rules, AT X 365, CSM I 12). Descartes even holds that reason is responsible for the “correction” of judgments regarding what is presented via the senses, as in cases of optical illusions (Sixth Replies, AT VII 438–9, CSM II 296; Third Meditation, AT VII 39, CSM II 27).

In Descartes scholarship, Gaukroger (1989) presents a detailed analysis of the relationship between intuition and deduction in Descartes. Loeb (1990) offers a discussion on the normative role of reason in the establishment of knowledge. Frankfurt (1970) examines the limits of reason and its capacity for self-validation. For a contextualization of Descartes’ position among other seventeenth-century figures regarding reason, logic, and knowledge, see Nelson 2018.

Further Reading: the entries on Descartes’ method, Descartes’ epistemology, and Descartes.

2.1.2 Spinoza on the Necessity of Rational Knowledge

Spinoza identifies imagination, reason, and intuition as three modes of cognition. He describes cognition as knowledge of an effect acquired through knowledge of its cause, which suggests that imagination and reason are fundamentally different ways of knowing things through their causes (E1A4, E2P7). Imagination consists of sensation, memory, and inferences drawn from signs (e.g., smoke signaling fire). These modes of imagination rely upon ideas arising from how the body is presently affected by external bodies (E2P17s). Reason, on the other hand, consists of knowledge rooted in the common notions, or ideas we have of properties common to everything conceivable under a specific attribute (E2P38–40). To illustrate this distinction, consider the experience of dropping a package on one’s foot. Imagination provides situational knowledge that the package is too heavy to carry, whereas reason understands the package as a physical thing with the capacity to exhibit motion and rest (E2L2d).

Spinoza prioritizes reason over sensation in holding that imagination alone leads to confused and inadequate ideas (E2P41). Imagination reports how a particular body is affected and usually fails to represent the causal order of nature (E2P16c2). Conversely, reason reports the nature of things independently of any particular affection, which means that rational knowledge is necessary and identical in all knowers (E2P18s, E2P44, E5P29s). This priority also manifests in Spinoza’s moral philosophy when he defines freedom and virtue as acting in accordance with the moral guidance of reason rather than imagination (E4P24, E4P66s).

Interpreters disagree about how to distinguish between the different forms of adequate knowledge. Soyarslan (2016) argues that reason can only achieve adequate knowledge of what is shared between the essences of things whereas intuition alone can achieve adequate knowledge of the unique essences of singular things. By contrast, Primus (2017) argues that reason confers adequate knowledge about transitive causes whereas intuition confers adequate knowledge about immanent causes. A related discussion emerges in Spinoza’s moral theory. Nadler (2015) argues that freedom, understood as living in accordance with the dictates of reason, is the central moral model of the Ethics. Soyarslan (2019) argues that wisdom, understood as living in pursuit of the eternal good of the understanding (through intuitive cognition), presents another moral ideal, perhaps of greater perfection.

Further Reading: the entry on Spinoza’s epistemology and philosophy of mind (§3.2); Klein 2002, 2014; Lebuffe 2009, 2017; Kisner 2011; Nadler 2015; Peterman 2017; Soyarslan 2016, 2019; Primus 2017, 2024.

2.1.3 Leibniz’s Privileging of Reason over Sensation

Leibniz privileges reason over sensation for several reasons. First, he links reason with eternal and necessary metaphysical truths about topics including substance, causation, and time. Since we have access to such truths, and we can reason on their basis, we can make well-founded claims about the world. As Leibniz writes in the Monadology, whereas we share sensation, memory, and imagination with non-human animals, “the knowledge of eternal and necessary truths is what distinguishes us from simple animals and furnishes us with reason and the sciences, by raising us to a knowledge of ourselves and of God.” In an earlier letter he also maintains that although sense-experience may occasion reflection on these concepts, we require reason to prove their universal truth or necessity: “all necessary truths derive their proof from this internal light, and not from the experiences of the senses, which merely give us the occasion for thinking of these necessary truths and can never prove a universal necessity, giving us only inductive knowledge” (AG 285).

Second, Leibniz associates activity and increasing perfection with the distinct perceptions furnished by reason. In contrast, sensation furnishes “confused” perceptions that Leibniz associates with passivity and decreasing perfection (for Leibniz, sensation provides “confused” perceptions or representations because he holds that a clear sensory perception of an object such as a table is composed of an infinity of smaller elements which have been conflated or “confused” together). Thus, according to the Monadology, “the creature is said to act externally insofar as it is perfect, and to be acted upon by another, insofar as it is imperfect. Thus we attribute action to a monad insofar as it has distinct perceptions, and passion, insofar as it has confused perceptions” (AG 219).

Since sensation is a confused form of representation, it is an open question whether our sensations accurately relate to the world; while Simmons (2001) argues that Leibnizian sensations literally resemble the objects that cause them, Ott (2016) suggests that Leibniz never successfully bridges the explanatory gap between sensation and cause.

Further Reading: the entry on Leibniz (§3); Ott 2016; Duchesneau 2023.

2.2 Innate Knowledge

The second commitment this entry identifies as a criterion for being considered a rationalist is a commitment to the existence of innate knowledge. This commitment holds that we have some knowledge that is intrinsic or justified independently of experience. This section identifies some important examples of innate knowledge and outlines what makes innate knowledge uniquely important to each author.

2.2.1 Innate Ideas in Descartes (and Cartesianism)

Descartes’ commitment to innate ideas is on display throughout his works. In the Third Meditation, for example, Descartes includes innate ideas, in addition to adventitious and fictitious ideas, in his enumeration of the three kinds of ideas (AT VII 37–8, CSM II 26). In this passage, Descartes defines innate ideas in terms of the “understanding” of certain things which derives “simply from my own nature”. The suggestion here seems to be that the content of innate ideas originates independently of experience (see the entry on Descartes’ epistemology). In a letter to Mersenne, Descartes specifies that the content of innate ideas consists in “true, immutable and eternal essences”, such as “God, mind, body, triangle”. (AT III 383, CSMK III 183)

As for the innate knowledge of these essences, Descartes describes it as “remembering” or “noticing” things that are intrinsically contained in the mind (Fifth Mediation, AT VII 64, CSM II 44). Importantly, these essences are not always “expressly known” by us. Rather, Descartes maintains that this innate knowledge is achieved by “the power of our own native intelligence, without any sensory experience” (Letter to Voetius, May 1643, AT VIIIB 166­–7, CSMK III 222–3). This means that the mind “has the faculty of summoning up” or, as it were, digging out the ideas of the essences which were naturally implanted within it through the activity of reason alone (Third Set of Replies, AT VII 189, CSM II 132).

Descartes’ innatism can be interpreted, as suggested by Newman (2006), in such a way that the representational content of ideas is derived solely from the mind and its properties, independent of sensory experience. For a discussion of the scope of innate ideas within Descartes’ epistemology, see Flage and Bonnen 1992. On how Descartes’ innatism may be understood as a reaction to the scholastic perspectives of his contemporaries, see Schmaltz 1997. A thorough examination of the topic, analyzing how innatism emerges across many of Descartes’ works in different aspects to form the foundation of his epistemological project, is offered by Boyle 2011.

Despite their central role in Descartes’ framework, innate ideas were rejected by two of his 17^th-century followers: Nicolas Malebranche (1638–1715) and Robert Desgabets (1610–1678). Malebranche’s rejection of innate ideas follows from his overall rejection of the Cartesian account of ideas as modes of thought. His doctrine of Vision in God holds that ideas are perfections of God contained only in divine wisdom. Additionally, Malebranche argues that innate ideas violate the simplicity with which God acts, since God would have to implant an infinite stock of innate ideas in the mind (SAT III.ii.4, LO 226–7). Desgabets, by contrast, rejects innate ideas while remaining a proponent of the orthodox Cartesian view of ideas as modes of thought. Desgabets subscribes to a version of the Scholastic principle ‘nihil est in intellect quod non prius fuerit in sensu’ (‘nothing is in the intellect which was not previously in the senses’). By this principle Desgabets understands that there can be absolutely no operations of thought which are independent of experience. This is because all human thought is intrinsically successive: “all our thoughts have a beginning, continuation, and end” (RD 5: 189). For Desgabets, succession, or temporality, depends on (local) motion, and motion is a mode of body. Therefore, all the operations of the soul depend for their origin on the body, so that it is only by means of sense-experience that the soul can have its thoughts.

The history of Cartesianism highlights how the ostensibly rationalist commitments adopted by Descartes get recharacterized in new and potentially incompatible ways.

Further Reading: the entries on Robert Desgabets, Descartes’ epistemology, Descartes’ theory of ideas, and Malebranche’s theory of ideas and vision in God; Nelson 2007.

2.2.2 Innateness in Spinoza’s Conception of Adequate Ideas

Several interpreters argue that innateness is a feature of Spinoza’s theory of adequate ideas. The main textual evidence for this reading appears in E2P11c, which establishes that adequate ideas are perceived by (and explained through) the human mind alone. Marshall argues that this passage expresses a distinct conception of adequacy as containment. She writes, “Idea x as it exists in God’s mind is adequate in human mind y, itself a complex idea, iff x as a whole is part of y. Thus, in E2P11c, Spinoza seems to equate an idea’s being adequate in a human mind with its being completely contained in that mind” (Marshall 2013: 26). In E2P24d and E2P25d, Spinoza additionally suggests that having an adequate idea of something requires having an adequate idea of its cause. Since adequate ideas are completely contained in the mind, Marshall argues, by appeal to Spinoza’s definition of adequate causation in E3D1, that the mind alone is the complete cause of the adequate idea (2013: 52). In other words, adequate ideas are innate.

Steinberg similarly argues that Spinoza ascribed innateness to adequate ideas. In particular, he draws attention to E3D1, E3D2, and E3P1, which establish that the mind acts only insofar as its effects can be clearly and distinctly perceived through its nature alone (Steinberg 2018: 198). In other words, Spinoza’s conception of how the mind acts presupposes the view that adequate ideas are innate. He summarizes Spinoza’s reasoning in a reductio argument starting from the premise that there are adequate ideas that are not innate in the mind. For such ideas not to be innate in the mind, they would have to be understood partially through the nature of something extrinsic to the mind. But, by E2P11c, this contradicts the definition of adequate ideas. Thus, Steinberg concludes that for Spinoza all adequate ideas are innate in the mind (2018: 199).

Further Reading: the entry on Spinoza’s epistemology and philosophy of mind (§3.1); Della Rocca 1996; Marshall 2013; Wilson 2014; Steinberg 2018.

2.2.3 Leibniz on Innate Ideas as Dispositions

Leibniz defends a dispositional account of innate ideas in texts including the Discourse on Metaphysics (1686) and New Essays on Human Understanding (1704). For Leibniz, the senses cannot supply the ideas of universal and necessary truths; rather, our minds contain these ideas “virtually” (AG 58) as in-born potentialities to think of their objects. In other words, “ideas and truths are innate in us – as inclinations, dispositions, tendencies, or natural potentialities, and not as actualities” (NE 52/GP 5 45). In this way, innate ideas are “like the matter of which that thought is formed.” In the Discourse, Leibniz associates his account of innate ideas with Platonic recollection (AG 58/A vi.4 1571). Although sense-experience is required to actualize these potentialities, Leibniz argues that sense-experience cannot supply the mind with its basic conceptions of “being, substance, one, same, cause, perception, reasoning” (NE 111/GP 5 100).

In the New Essays, Leibniz also defends the claim that each mind has a different collection of ideas using his principle of the identity of indiscernibles, which holds that indiscernible individuals are in fact identical. If, as Locke held, each soul is a blank slate or tabula rasa, then there would be multiple different yet indistinguishable individuals (NE 57/GP 5 49–50), an outcome foreclosed by the principle. Instead, Leibniz proposes that the mind is more like a block of marble contoured with veins. Just as the singular pattern of veins in a block of marble differentiates it from other blocks, minds are differentiated from one another by the singular nature of their virtual ideas.

Jolley (1990) helpfully situates Leibniz’s theory of innate ideas in relation to Locke and Malebranche’s respective accounts of ideas. Recently, scholars including Poser (2008) and Roinila (2019) have shown that Leibnizian innate ideas are moral as well as epistemic.

Further Reading: the entries on Leibniz (§6.3) and the historical controversies surrounding innateness (§3); Savile 1972; Jolley 1988; Vanzo 2018; López 2023.

2.3: Certain and Probable Knowledge

The third commitment this entry identifies as a criterion for being considered a rationalist is a commitment to an epistemology wherein certain knowledge plays a role. In these traditional ‘rationalist’ authors, this tends to mean a preference for certain rather than probable knowledge which is connected to their prioritization of reason over sensation.

2.3.1 Descartes on Moral and Absolute Certainty

Descartes distinguishes between two kinds of certainty: ‘moral’ certainty and ‘absolute’ (or ‘metaphysical’) certainty. Moral certainty pertains to judgements, made primarily on the basis of sense-experience, such as “having a body, there being stars and an earth”, whose truth, while probable, such that “it seems we cannot doubt them without being extravagant”, we lack “adequate grounds” to be entirely sure about (Discourse, AT VI 37–8, CSM I 130). Although Descartes admits that it is possible, strictly speaking, that the judgements of which we are only morally certain are false, this certainty nevertheless serves the practical role of “regulating our behavior” (Principles, AT IX 323, CSM I 289 n. 2). Thus, Descartes affirms that morally certain judgements have “sufficient certainty” only if they are restricted to the practical domain concerning the “application to ordinary life” (Principles, AT VIIIA 327, CSM I 289–90).

Absolute certainty, by contrast, consists in judgements of something for which “it is wholly impossible” that it “be otherwise than we judge it to be” (Principles, AT IX 324, CSM I 290). According to Descartes, this certainty is grounded on the infallibility of the “faculty which [God] gave us for distinguishing truth from falsehood”, namely, reason. Hence, absolute certainty arises, in Descartes’ view, through the proper use of reason. This involves restricting assent in our judgements to only those things which are clearly and distinctly perceived by reason (Principles, AT VIIIA 328, CSM I 290). Since, then, it is only by means of absolute certainty that we arrive at knowledge of the truth, Descartes maintains that absolute certainty is to be preferred to moral certainty, by which no such knowledge is obtained.

For analyses of Descartes’ epistemological project, which combines absolute certainty regarding metaphysical principles with experimental science, see Garber 1978 and Hatfield 1988. For discussion of potential tensions arising from attributing different degrees of certainty and the development of a concept of scientific explanation, see McMullin 2007 and Dellsén 2017.

Further Reading: the entry on Descartes’ epistemology; Morris 1970; Glouberman 1986; Ariew 2011; Zellmer 2024.

2.3.2 Spinoza on the Certainty of Adequate Ideas

Spinoza’s commitment to certain knowledge is expressed in his theory of adequate ideas. He defines an adequate idea as “an idea which, insofar as it is considered in itself, without any relation to an object, has all the properties, or intrinsic denominations, of a true idea” (E2def4). Put differently, adequate ideas are true when considered in themselves, independently of their relation to anything extrinsic. Spinoza appears to conceive adequacy in a few different ways throughout the following propositions. While E2P11c suggests that adequate ideas are those ideas completely contained in the mind (as a part to a whole), E2P24d and E2P25d suggest that adequate ideas are those ideas caused by the mind alone. Bennett (1984: 178) claims that Spinoza typically employs only the latter conception of adequacy, whereas Marshall (2013: 28) argues that both conceptions are compatible and interrelated. Spinoza’s main examples of adequate ideas are the idea of God’s infinite essence and the common notions (E2P47, E2P38c). The common notions are ideas we have of properties common to all modes conceivable under a particular attribute. For instance, while one’s knowledge of how particular bodies affect them is inadequate, one’s knowledge that bodies necessarily exhibit motion and rest is adequate (E2Ld).

Spinoza also holds that adequate ideas are certain and indubitable. He writes, “He who has an adequate idea, or (by E2P34) who knows a thing truly, must at the same time have an adequate idea, or true knowledge, of his own knowledge. I.e. (as is manifest through itself), he must at the same time be certain” (E2P43d). The main question from this passage is: what is the nature of second-order knowledge? Some interpreters might read this passage literally, suggesting that adequate ideas necessitate second-order ideas – ideas of ideas – to be certain. This reading is open to interpreters who understand Spinoza to be committed to a theory of second-order ideas (Curley 1969, Melamed 2013, and Morrison 2017). Conversely, Primus (2021) argues that second-order knowledge does not entail second-order ideas. Focusing on Spinoza’s claim in E2P21s that “the idea of the mind and the mind itself are one and the same thing,” Primus argues that second-order knowledge refers to the capacity of ideas to represent themselves reflexively (2021: 267). In her view, Spinoza discusses second-order ideas merely to illustrate the representational completeness of adequate ideas. While interpreters disagree over how to understand Spinoza’s conception of second-order knowledge, it remains clear that Spinoza views adequate ideas as certain and indubitable.

Further Reading: the entry on Spinoza’s epistemology and philosophy of mind (§3.1); Bennett 1984; Morrison 2017; Garrett 2018; Primus 2021.

2.3.3 Leibniz on Necessary and Contingent Truths

Leibniz distinguishes necessary truths of reason from contingent truths of fact. In the Discourse on Metaphysics, Leibniz argues that necessary truths (like the truths of geometry) are those whose contraries involve contradictions, whereas the contraries of contingent truths (like whether Caesar crosses the Rubicon) are not self-contradictory (AG 44–5). Nevertheless, future contingent facts God chooses to create are hypothetically necessary since they are certain to take place (AG 45). If we had God’s knowledge of contingent truths, we would know indubitably which contingent events will take place.

According to Leibniz, necessary truths may be demonstrated analytically in a finite number of steps, reducing subject and predicate terms to identities. God’s existence is a paradigmatic example of a necessary truth, and, hence, according to Leibniz, the subject “God” and the predicate “exists” are equivalent, and “existence does not differ from essence in God, or, what is the same thing, it is essential for God to exist” (AG 28). In contrast, Leibniz insists that in contingent truths “one continues the analysis to infinity… so that one never has a complete demonstration” (AG 28). In other words, when inquiring into contingent truths, one proceeds through an infinite series of reasons, never fully demonstrating the identity of subject and predicate.

Adams (1994: 34) proposes the problem of the “lucky proof” as a challenge to Leibniz’s account of the infinite analysis of contingent truths: it should be possible to demonstrate particular properties (predicates) of contingent individual substances in a finite number of steps. Rodriguez-Pereyra and Lodge (2011) suggest that one must still prove the consistency of the subject term, preserving the need for an infinite analysis. For Merlo (2012), demonstration must be infinite to show how a given truth is better than an infinite collection of alternatives. Steward (2014) denies the problem of the lucky proof by arguing that we cannot isolate properties as distinct “parts” of a concept.

Further Reading: the entry on Leibniz (§6); Rescher 1981; Merlo 2012; Mugnai 2021.

2.4 The Intrinsic Intelligibility of Nature

The fourth commitment this entry identifies as a criterion for being considered a rationalist is the view that nature is intrinsically intelligible. This means that despite epistemic limits on what each person can know individually, the natural world is, in principle, knowable through reason.

2.4.1 Descartes on God’s Omnipotence and the Intelligibility of Nature

The intelligibility of reality, in Descartes’ developed system, depends on understanding the articulation of essences in terms of substances, principal attribute, and modes (see the entry on Descartes’ modal metaphysics). Descartes identifies the essence of a thing with its nature. In the realm of created beings, Descartes recognizes only two: the essence or nature of the mind, which is thought, and the essence or nature of body, which is extension (Principles, AT VIII-A 25, 30–1; CSM I, 210, 215).

The origin of essences, in turn, is dependent on divine will, as seen in the discussion of the free creation of eternal truths. Descartes asserts that God created eternal truths freely, including the power to render them false, which seems to conflict with the necessity of eternal truths. This apparent contradiction suggests a tension in Descartes’ philosophy regarding the nature of God’s omnipotence and the necessity of truths. The nature of the necessity or contingency of the eternal truths in Descartes is a topic of intense debate among interpreters of his thought. This debate contrasts possibilism – truths as contingent on God’s will (Frankfurt 1977) – with necessitarianism, where truths are necessary but vary in kind. Curley (1984) sees them as necessary yet dependent on divine choice, while Bennett (1994) views their necessity as subjective, rooted in human cognition. While Descartes laid important groundwork for the principle of sufficient reason (cf. AT VII 109–112; CSM II 78–80), his rationale for developing a perspective on the intelligibility of reality differs from that of other traditional rationalists. The status of eternal truths – whether contingent or necessary – has a direct impact on the scope and validity of principles such as those of logic and mathematics in Descartes’ philosophy. In this sense, the intrinsic intelligibility of reality is closely tied to the precise meaning of Descartes’ thesis on the free creation of eternal truths. If eternal truths are contingent on God’s will, then they lack intrinsic necessity and cannot be fully explained by reason alone. This weakens the principle of sufficient reason, since not everything – especially fundamental truths – has a necessary ground, thereby limiting the overall intelligibility of reality.

Further Reading: Kenny 1970; Frankfurt 1977; Curley 1984; Osler 1985, 1994; Rodis-Lewis 1985; Bennett 1994; Lennon 2000; Rozemond 2008; Hattab 2016; Bender 2022a.

2.4.2 Spinoza on the Principle of Sufficient Reason

Spinoza’s commitment to the Principle of Sufficient Reason (PSR) demonstrates his view that nature is intrinsically intelligible. The most explicit statement of this principle is in E1P11d, which states “For each thing there must be assigned a cause, or reason, as much for its existence as for its non-existence.” In other words, a thing’s existence or nonexistence must be explained by appeal to a cause or reason. Interpreters also identify implicit formulations of the PSR in the early axioms of Ethics Book 1. For instance, E1a2 states: “What cannot be conceived through another, must be conceived through itself.” Della Rocca writes, “In proposing in 1ax2 that everything can be conceived through something, Spinoza presupposes that everything is able to be explained. He builds the notion of intelligibility right into the heart of his metaphysical system” (2008: 5). Moreover, E1a3 states: “From a given determinate cause the effect follows necessarily; and conversely, if there is no determinate cause, it is impossible for an effect to follow.” Lin writes, “That nothing happens or exists without a cause entails that everything has a sufficient reason or explanation” (2018: 137). These passages demonstrate Spinoza’s commitment to the PSR, though interpreters disagree about how Spinoza employs this principle.

Some interpreters argue that Spinoza’s commitment to the PSR plays an important role in his arguments for other notable positions. For instance, Della Rocca (2008) reconstructs Spinoza’s argument for necessitarianism – the view that the actual world is the only possible world – as relying upon the PSR as a premise. He writes, “God has the most power and reality possible, and, as such, determines everything else. And thus we can see that Spinoza’s necessitarianism ultimately derives from his PSR” (2008: 78). As Della Rocca tells the story, Spinoza’s necessitarianism is a necessary implication from his conception of God as the singular substance, which is ultimately motivated by the PSR. An alternative reconstruction might tell another story, however. Lin (2019) notes that the PSR plays an important role in establishing the necessary existence of God. Yet, beyond this conclusion, he notes “Spinoza’s argument for necessitarianism does not depend on his PSR” (2019: 174). Finally, Melamed (2012, 2013) argues that while the PSR remains a central commitment to Spinoza’s metaphysical system it is not a key to all doors and its relevance should limited to a few of Spinoza’s central arguments. While interpreters disagree over the scope of Spinoza’s commitment to the PSR, this principle clearly demonstrates his commitment to the view that nature is intrinsically intelligible.

Further Reading: the entries on principle of sufficient reason (§ 2) and Spinoza’s modal metaphysics (§ 1.1); Della Rocca 2008; Melamed 2012, 2013; Lin 2018, 2019; Renz 2018.

2.4.3 Leibniz’s Core Principles of Intelligibility

For Leibniz, the world exhibits a rational and aesthetically pleasing order that human knowers can grasp through philosophical as well as empirical scientific inquiry. Leibniz’s God is a transcendent and benevolent creator who chooses to create the best world from an infinite collection of possible worlds contained – qua possible – within his intellect. In selecting which possible world to make actual, God’s choice is governed by several principles including the principles of contradiction, sufficient reason (“PSR”), and the identity of indiscernibles (“PII”). According to the principle of contradiction, God cannot create a world that involves a contradiction; the PSR helps God select the best world, or the optimal collection of compossible individuals, i.e. individuals whose possibilities are mutually compatible; the identity of indiscernibles ensures that any individuals that are conceptually indiscernible are in fact identical. For Leibniz, the best world features maximal diversity from the fewest laws of nature; God acts with simplicity of means for the sake of “variety, richness, and abundance” of effects and ends (AG 38/A.vi 4 1537). This world is maximally beautiful in the sense of producing the greatest degree of pleasure when adequately perceived (AG 152–153/GP 7 306–7).

These principles shape divine and human reason and serve both ontological and epistemic functions. For instance, they inform the structure of the world that God creates insofar as they govern God’s intellectual and creative activity. Since they are baked into the structure of the created world, finite human knowers can draw on them as guides for a priori and a posteriori inquiry. In other words, since the world exhibits a rational order constrained by these principles, it is intelligible for us by way of these same governing principles. All of these projects rely on a fundamental trust that the world makes rational sense and that each human perspective expresses important truths about the world.

Recent scholarly debate has focused on the modal status of Leibniz’s principles: are the PSR and PII contingent or necessary features of reality? Whereas Rodriguez-Pereyra (2018) holds that PSR is necessary, Pikkert (2021) and Bender (2022b) argue that it is contingent. Regarding PII, Jorati (2017b) and Lin (2025) argue that it is contingent, while Bender (2019) argues that it is necessary.

Further Reading: the entries on Leibniz’s modal metaphysics and principle of sufficient reason, section 3; Jorati 2017a, 2017b; Rodriguez-Pereyra 2018; Pikkert 2021, 2022; Bender 2022b.

3. Expanding the Scope of Early Modern Rationalism

As noted at the outset, this entry subordinates the question ‘What is a rationalist?’ to the question ‘What are we doing when we employ the concept of rationalism?’. This is in line with the ‘instrumentalist’ (rather than ‘realist’ or ‘eliminativist’) approach adopted here (see §1.1). In response to the second question, this section aims to expand the concept of rationalism so as to include figures who lie outside of the traditional ‘canon’ of early modern philosophy. With that end in mind, this section discusses three figures: Anton Wilhelm Amo (1703–1759), Margaret Cavendish (1623–1673), and Anne Conway (1631–1679).

Throughout this section, it will become clear that the four criteria previously identified as hallmarks of ‘rationalism’ in the Introduction cannot be straightforwardly (and uncontroversially) applied to Amo, Cavendish, and Conway. This is hardly surprising, given that the concept ‘rationalism’ was designed specifically to categorize the ideas of Descartes, Leibniz, and Spinoza. And yet, this section shows that there are reasons to include Amo, Cavendish, and Conway in investigations of early modern rationalism. Each author has made theoretical contributions to early modern philosophy that sufficiently illustrate the commitments identified as criteria for rationalism to think of them as holding rationalist commitments – or, at the very least, to be connected to the tradition of rationalism in noteworthy ways. In other words, this section identifies aspects of these thinkers’ views that can be characterised as rationalist.

3.1 Privileging Reason over Sensation

The first commitment this entry identifies as a criterion for being considered a rationalist is the privileging of reason over imagination, sensation, or experience. As the labels for the concept ‘rationalism’ (and correspondingly, for ‘empiricism’) indicate, this is a key marker of whether aspects of a thinker’s view can be characterised as ‘rationalist’. The cases of Amo, Cavendish, and Conway are less clear-cut than Descartes, Leibniz, and Spinoza, but nonetheless there are reasons to think of these certain aspects of these three figures’ views as satisfying this criterion.

3.1.1 Amo on Sensation as Bodily, and Reason as Spiritual

Amo privileges sensation over reason to the extent that he thinks that bodies, alone, experience sensations, whereas minds never experience sensations, but engage only (and always) in rational and spiritual activity. In his two Dissertations, Amo advances a version of substance dualism inspired by Descartes. But Amo also identifies a problem with Descartes’ account of the mind-body relation. He claims that Descartes “confuses the act of understanding and the function of sensing” (Dissertation, 181). Amo is responding to, as he reads it, Descartes’ view that the mind can passively experience sensations along with the body (Dissertation, 179). According to Amo, the human mind is a kind of spirit and spirits are “purely active” (Dissertation, 159). Other types of spirit, for Amo, include angels and God. Human minds are a specific kind of spirit that is in ‘commerce’ with a material body. But, because they have a body, Amo argues, human minds are limited in their knowledge compared to other spirits (Dissertation, 165–7). In that sense, reason – connected to the spirits with greater knowledge than our own – is privileged over sensation, which is associated with the corporeal realm.

In Amo scholarship, there is debate concerning how Amo develops a dualist account of the mind-body relation that is consistent with this strict separation of sensation from rational and spiritual activity. Some commentators (Nwala 1978) take Amo to be defending Descartes’ view, others read him as closer to Leibniz in defending a theory of pre-established harmony (Emma-Adamah 2015; Smith 2015), while others read Amo as endorsing some kind of theory of occasional causation (Meyns 2019, Walsh 2019, Menn and Smith 2020, West 2022).

Further Reading: Nwala 1978; Wiredu 2004; Emma-Adamah 2015; Smith 2015; Meyns 2019; Walsh 2019; Menn and Smith 2020; West 2022.

3.1.2 Cavendish on Sense and Rational Contemplation

Margaret Cavendish prioritizes reason over sensation most clearly in her arguments against the experimental philosophers. Her arguments focus especially on the use of microscopes in natural philosophy. In the mid-1600s, microscopes were a new technology and were often treated as curiosities rather than tools. Robert Hooke’s Micrographia (1665) was one of the earliest works demonstrating the usefulness of microscopes to natural philosophy (Turney 2005; Henderson 2019). Hooke argued that microscopes remedy the natural deficiencies of human sensation. In his view, they reveal bodies’ inner motions and unveil the secret workings of nature.

Cavendish met these claims with suspicion. The opening chapters of Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy (1666) outline several disagreements with Hooke’s account of microscopy. In Cavendish’s view, microscopes face a significant risk of misrepresenting the natural world. Regardless of how they influence human perception, microscopes cannot achieve the results that Hooke purported. Cavendish took reason to be a more reliable supplement to human sensation than artifice. Boyle explains that for Cavendish “to understand the true nature of an object requires the use of reason, not sense-perception, no matter how well supplemented” (2017: 90). This is why Cavendish described the proper method of natural philosophy as “rational contemplation joined with the observations of regular sense” (OEP, 53). While experience plays an important role in natural philosophy, she ultimately prioritizes the use of reason.

Further Reading: O’Neill 2001; Wilkins 2014; Boyle 2017; Lascano 2020, 2023.

3.1.3 Conway on the Primacy of Rationality

With regard to the privileging of reason over sensation, it is important to bear in mind that Conway’s Principles presents a monist metaphysics and a hierarchy of beings (e.g., Principles, 6.7–8; see also Strok 2022). She affirms that “this distinction [between mind and body] is only modal and gradual, not essential or substantial” (Principles, 6.11). Body is merely “fixed and condensed” spirit, while spirit is “subtle and volatile” body (Principles, 8.5). This means that all substances are capable of reason, but may also be capable of sensation. Nonetheless, there are clear signs that Conway prioritizes rationality. In Conway’s hierarchy of reality, the most rational creatures are at the top. Further, reason and reasoning for Conway is ‘perfectible’ – i.e., can be increased ‘ad infinitum’ to borrow Hutton’s term (Hutton 2021: §4), though it cannot become infinite itself. This means that ascending in the scale of beings ensures that (greater) rationality is achieved (Sample 2022: 63; Hutton 2020). This shows that rationality is superior to other capacities. For instance, while a stone, or even a non-human animal, is capable of reason after transmutations (in time), human beings, who are closer to the top of the hierarchy, are more rational creatures.

Further Reading: Hutton 2020, 2021; Strok 2022; Sample 2022.

3.2 Innate Knowledge

The second commitment this entry identifies as a criterion for being considered a rationalist is a commitment to the existence of innate knowledge. It will become clear that this criterion is not satisfied by all the thinkers considered in this section. For example, Amo’s theory of knowledge does not satisfy the rationalist criterion. The case is less clear-cut for Cavendish and Conway. Cavendish does endorse some specific innate principles. Similarly, Conway commits herself to the existence of some innately known objective truths, although she does not specify what such knowledge amounts to.

3.2.1 Amo’s Rejection of Innate Knowledge

Amo explicitly commits himself to the claim that there is nothing in the intellect not first in the senses (Tractatus, 139, 141, 146). While no scholars have attempted to read Amo as holding a theory of innate knowledge, scholars such as Emma-Adamah (2015) and Smith (2015) have read Amo as endorsing a (Leibniz-style) theory of pre-established harmony concerning the mind-body relation. But as other scholars, including Meyns (2019), Walsh (2019), and West (2022), have argued, even this presumes too much of an ‘innatist’ reading of Amo. As Walsh and West both emphasise, Amo’s commitment to the Peripatetic axiom, combined with his substance dualism, generates a possible epistemic problem in terms of understanding how the mind can come to gain knowledge of the body – since that knowledge is neither innate nor, seemingly, directly received from the body. These considerations indicate that Amo does not satisfy the ‘rationalist’ criterion of accepting a theory of innate knowledge.

Further Reading: Emma-Adamah 2015; Smith 2015; Meyns 2019; Walsh 2019; West 2022.

3.2.2 Cavendish on Innateness

Margaret Cavendish identifies two examples of innate knowledge in her mature writings. The first example is knowledge of God. Cavendish writes, “the knowledge of the existency of God … is innate, and inherent in nature and all her parts” (OEP, 17). Importantly, this innate knowledge of God is qualified: it involves knowledge of God’s existence but not knowledge of God’s essence. As Detlefsen points out, “all Cavendish claims is that we know that God is the source of norms and standards through the order he imposes on the world in creation, and consequently that there are such normative standards. But we cannot know for certain what those standards are” (2009: 433). Thus, while every creature has innate knowledge of the creator, this knowledge only involves God’s existence.

The second example is self-knowledge. Cavendish writes, “all parts of nature, even the inanimate, have an innate and fixt self-knowledg” (OEP, 16). Interpreters disagree about the make-up of self-knowledge. They agree that parts of nature know their own material composition and the changes they undergo while persisting as individuals. Some readers argue that self-knowledge also includes a broader range of knowledge. Michaelian (2009) argues that self-knowledge may include knowledge of how to interact with other things. Boyle (2017) argues that self-knowledge may include normative knowledge of what a thing is supposed to be and how it is supposed to behave. In broadening the scope of self-knowledge, these interpretations also broaden the scope of innate knowledge in Cavendish.

Further Reading: the entry on Margaret Lucas Cavendish (§§3,6); Detlefsen 2009; Michaelian 2009; Boyle 2017; Peterman 2019a, 2019b, 2025; Georgescu 2021.

3.2.3 Conway on the Innate Dictates of Truth

Conway is committed to innate knowledge. In the Principles, she affirms that there are “objective truths” that secure “true Science, or certainty of Knowledge” (Principles, 6.2). She also claims that there are “inbred Notions and Dictates of Truth, which Men generally find in themselves” (Principles, 6.2). In other words, rational creatures have certain innate notions that are part of their nature, created by God. Conway is not explicit about what kind of knowledge she takes to be innate, though she suggest the following might be innate notions: the idea of God as a creator (Principles, 1) and as good (3.1, 6.9), the idea of the divine attributes (5.3), ideas of mathematics, geometry and logic (3.1, 6.2), the idea of Christ as medium (5), the idea that all tends to goodness (7.1). It remains unclear which rational creatures Conway believes to have these notions. For she contends that a horse has some notion of how to serve its master (6.6). Thus, it is possible that the horse has different notions compared to humans or that all rational creatures have the same notions but different possibilities in accessing them depending on where they are in the hierarchy of being.

Conway’s theory of knowledge is still an emerging area of scholarship, but Duran (1989) discusses it in relation to Leibniz and Spinoza, specifically, while Mercer (2012a) connects Conway’s account to the Neo-Platonist tradition.

Further Reading: Duran 1989; Mercer 2012a.

3.3 Certain and Probable Knowledge

The third commitment this entry identifies as a criterion for being considered a rationalist is a commitment to an epistemology in which certain knowledge plays a role. There are good reasons to believe that Amo and Conway satisfy this criterion, while the case is less clear with Cavendish. Again, this is consistent with our approach to identifying aspects of thinkers that can (and cannot) be characterised as ‘rationalist’.

3.3.1 Amo on the Certainty of Scientia

Amo’s discussion of certain knowledge in his Tractatus makes it clear that, in his view, philosophical inquiry – in particular, inquiry which proceeds via demonstration – ought to lead to certain rather than probable knowledge. For example, he writes that real knowledge “has the basis of its certainty in the known thing” (Tractatus, 102). And he argues that certainty can only be reached by the ‘scientific’ method, in Aristotelian terms scientia, i.e., demonstration. As he puts it, “[i]n science there is certainty, in conjecture uncertainty” (Tractatus, 102). This strongly indicates that, for Amo, a philosophical method that leads to anything short of certainty cannot be thought of as proper ‘science’ or demonstration.

Amo’s views on certainty, then, satisfy the criterion for rationalism under consideration in this section. It should also be noted, though, that Amo’s views are influenced by the Aristotelian tradition as well as the Cartesian one. For instance, Amo characterises certain knowledge as knowledge of things themselves, not ideas of them. This raises questions about what kinds of things we can know with certainty. Can we gain certain knowledge of the external, material world, for example, if our knowledge of it comes via ideas? Amo goes on to suggest that there is mutability and immutability in all things – and that we can know the immutable aspects of those things with certainty (Tractatus, 114). It isn’t totally clear what Amo has in mind here, but it would appear to be something like Descartes’ claim that the substance of a material thing like a block of wax can be known, even in spite of changes to those features of it perceived by the senses.

In the literature on Amo, there is very little discussion of certain knowledge as yet. Two sources that do discuss his claims about certain knowledge (albeit in a wider discussion of his theory of intentions) are Menn and Smith 2020 (Introduction) and Fasko and West forthcoming.

Further Reading: Menn and Smith 2020; Fasko and West forthcoming.

3.3.2 Cavendish on Certain and Probable Knowledge

Cavendish held that perceptual knowledge is probabilistic rather than certain. Boyle notes that “what Cavendish calls ‘knowledge’ of the external world is really only probable opinion” (2015: 440). While perceptual knowledge exhibits different degrees of probability, it never reaches the standard of absolute certainty. Georgescu underscores this point by noting that for Cavendish “perception presupposes ignorance” (2021: 628). Perceptual knowledge cannot achieve certainty precisely because it involves relations between different parts of nature. Insofar as parts of nature are separated or divided from each other, knowledge between them will involve a necessary degree of ignorance.

Conversely, Cavendish sometimes suggests that self-knowledge is certain rather than probabilistic. She distinguishes self-knowledge from self-perception, noting that the latter cannot “be in nature, because perception presupposes ignorance; and if there cannot be a self-ignorance, there can neither be a self-perception, although there may be an interior self-knowledge” (OEP, 136). In other words, Cavendish held that self-knowledge does not function like perceptual knowledge. Perceptual knowledge requires a certain degree of ignorance because it involves a relation between different parts of nature. Ignorance cannot characterize self-knowledge because, as Georgescu notes, “self-ignorance would presuppose a division from oneself, and that would be contradictory” (2021: 630). Thus, self-knowledge is a candidate for certain knowledge within Cavendish’s epistemology.

Further Reading: Michaelian 2009; Boyle 2015; Peterman 2019a, 2025; Georgescu 2021.

3.3.3 Conway on the Certainty of Objective Truths

The existence of certain knowledge in Conway seems to be challenged by her theory of transmutation, on which creatures (or individuals) ascend or descend a chain of being depending on how (morally) well they performed in their specific role as human, horse, etc. (Principles 6.2). She explains that while individuals can move up and down the chain, they retain their own unique identity or essence in doing so. She explains that this must be the case because, were it not, it would not be possible for us to have “certain knowledge of any thing” or attain any “objective truths”.

Why does she think this? Conway claims that “certainty of Knowledge, depends upon the Truth of the Objects” (Principles, 6.2). Her point seems to be that, if the world around us were not stable, then there would not be a stable set of objects for us to have knowledge of. And since certain knowledge depends upon the objects known, there would not, in turn, be a stable set of (objective) truths for us to know. Conway seems to assert that, even though the natural world around is mutable, there nonetheless remain some steady, objective truths about that world – that God has provided for creation. In other words, Conway is adamant that certainty of knowledge is possible even despite the mutable nature of things. Thus, despite the apparent tension with which this subsection began, there are reasons to believe that Conway does satisfy this criterion for ‘rationalism’. In Conway scholarship, Mercer (2012b) discusses the ‘objective’ (i.e., certain) knowledge of God that is available to all human beings.

Further Reading: Mercer 2012b, Hutton 2021.

3.4 The Intrinsic Intelligibility of Nature

The fourth commitment this entry identifies as a criterion for being considered a rationalist is the view that nature is intrinsically intelligible. Amo exhibits this criterion through his occasionalism and his view that creation is inherently intentional. Cavendish holds that material nature is fundamentally ordered, self-knowing, and perceptive. Conway holds that reality exhibits an intelligible hierarchy of ontological ranks which can be understood from innate and conceptual knowledge alone. Thus, each author examined in this section is committed to the intrinsic intelligibility of nature.

3.4.1 Anton Wilhelm Amo on the Intentionality of Creation

In his Tractatus, Amo argues that nature is intelligible because “[a]part from God, the first cause of all things, every being is the effect of an intention already brought through to its end” (Tractatus, 1.1.Obs., 1). Thus, the whole of creation can be rendered intelligible by appealing to the intention that brought it about. Substances exist because God intended to create them. Similarly, human actions (including sensation) should be understood as attempts to bring about certain ends. Anything that exists is the product of an intention and can therefore be understood as something that was brought about intentionally, for a particular reason. To understand something, therefore, is to direct one’s own intention in such a way that the intention behind that thing is understood. Thus, for Amo, creation is intelligible because it is intentional. Amo even goes so far as to define the different branches of learning – including mathematics, medicine, theology, natural philosophy, jurisprudence, and politics – as different ways of directing our intentions (by forming habits) towards beings that are the products of other intentions (e.g., Tractatus, 1.9.2.I, 15, 1.10.4, 17, and 1.11.1, 18).

In Amo scholarship, the two main discussions of intention are Menn and Smith 2020 (especially section 6) and Fasko and West forthcoming. Menn and Smith claim that intention is “the core technical notion of the Tractatus” (2020: 128), while Fasko and West build on Menn and Smith’s reading, demonstrating that intentions are a core notion across his entire philosophical corpus and also his views on the ends and methods of philosophy itself.

Further Reading: Menn and Smith 2020; Fasko and West forthcoming.

3.4.2 Margaret Cavendish on the Order of Nature

The order of material nature is a prominent theme in Cavendish’s metaphysics. She holds that nature is composed of infinitely many parts exhibiting infinitely various motions, which gives rise to a fundamentally diverse and ever-changing flux of matter. (PPO 1663, 6–10) Additionally, she holds that this flux of matter exhibits order. Cavendish writes, “Nature hath but One Law, which is a wise Law, viz., to keep Infinite matter in order” (PL, 2.5). The order of nature can be understood in various ways. Some interpreters argue that Cavendish is committed to a teleological conception of nature wherein every action is guided either by an intelligence or by the norms of nature (Detlefsen 2007, Cunning 2016). Others focus on how nature establishes order by counterbalancing infinitely various motions and figures (Boyle 2017, McNulty 2018). The order of nature is one of Cavendish’s main disagreements with atomism, which in her view represents nature as a disorderly flux (PPO 1655, “A Condemning Treatise of Atomes”).

Cavendish holds that nature’s order is intrinsically intelligible. Nature exhibits order only because it is self-knowing and perceptive. She writes, “If Nature were not Self-knowing, Self-living, and also Perceptive, she would run into Confusion: for, there could be neither Order, nor Method, in Ignorant motion” (GNP, 7). Ignorant motion is impossible because every action that takes place in nature happens within the influence of nature’s self-knowledge and perception. Ignorance would require absolute freedom and separability from the rest of material nature, which more properly characterize the rival view of atomism (PL, 1.29). Since such a separation is impossible, every part of nature is subject to nature’s self-knowing order.

Further Reading: Detlefsen 2006, 2007; Cunning 2016; Boyle 2017; McNulty 2018; Shaheen 2019, 2021; Georgescu 2021; Lascano 2023.

3.4.3 Anne Conway on the Scale of Beings

For Conway, reality is intelligible ‘from the armchair’, as it were, because our knowledge of God is innate (see §3.2.3) and also because we can understand the mutability of nature without engaging empirically with the world. Conway presents reality in terms of a threefold distinction with a discernible logical order. She asserts that there are three different “ranks of Beings” (Principles, 5.3) or “species” (6.1) which have a shared “Substance or Essence” (6.4): creatures, Christ, and God (4). This tripartite separation is grounded on the basis of the mutability of the member(s) of each species. Created things can change for better or worse; Christ, meanwhile, can only change for the better; while God is essentially unchanging (Principles, 6.4). Christ functions as mediation between immutability and total mutability, because he is immutable for the worst and mutable for the best. God gives being to creatures according to his eternal wisdom (Principles, 3.7). Nature is ordered according to wisdom, a mark of intelligibility.

These views have generated scholarly debates about exactly how Conway’s views on intelligible order should be characterized. Some have argued that she should be understood as a ‘trialist’ (Boyle 2006: 177). Others (Lascano 2023) argue that while Conway may not be an existence monist (for there is more than one thing existing), she is a substance monist (i.e., Conway is “committed to one underlying stuff in which all things participate”). For further discussions of exactly how we ought to characterise Conway’s monistic account of nature’s order, see Gordon-Roth 2018, Thomas 2020, and Head 2020.

Further Reading: Boyle 2006; Gordon-Roth 2018; Thomas 2020; Head 2020; 4; Lascano 2023; Grey 2024.

4. Conclusion: The Future of ‘Rationalism’

One aim of this entry has been to provide an instrumentalist account of early modern rationalism. While a realist approach identifies necessary and sufficient criteria for applying the label of rationalism to specific figures, an instrumentalist approach uses the criteria of rationalism to identify forms of theoretical kinship or resonances between the philosophical commitments of different figures in the early modern period. With an instrumentalist methodology in mind, this entry demonstrates that there is a story to be told about rationalism that encompasses more diverse voices, including women and non-European thinkers, as presented here.

By way of conclusion – and in the spirit of provoking future research into the historical category of ‘rationalism’ – this section showcases an example of how rational commitments were applied to social and political philosophy. This approach is exemplified by two further figures who lie outside the traditional early modern canon: Sor Juana Inés de la Cruz (1648–1695) and François Poulain de la Barre (1647–1723). Like Amo, Cavendish, and Conway, these authors do not perfectly satisfy the criteria for rationalism stipulated in the Introduction. But this section briefly demonstrates how each author’s rationalist commitments were fruitfully applied to the topics of gender equality and women’s education. It should be noted that, as has been the case throughout this entry, this discussion is not intended to be exhaustive. No doubt, there are other thinkers who could also be discussed in connection with rationalism. The aim here is simply to show what such future discussions might look like.

Sor Juana Inés de la Cruz was a prominent Mexican philosopher and author who incorporated rationalist epistemological commitments into her poetic and philosophical writings. The poem “Primero Sueño” (“First Dream”) describes the soul’s journey to knowledge while the body sleeps. The soul employs several strategies as it strives to achieve knowledge of the first cause, but each attempt is unsuccessful. These failures lead to a period of doubt which, unlike the methodological doubt in Descartes’ Meditations, provides the occasion for the soul to consider its own nature. The soul is reminded that it represents within itself all other species in the scale of beings and that it tends to the highest through its rational pursuit of knowledge (Strok 2022: 185). The poem concludes with the words “yo despierta” (“I awake”), which establishes a feminine subject – perhaps Sor Juana herself – suggesting that women can engage in the rational pursuit of knowledge as well. This conclusion is further supported in “Respuesta a Sor Filotea de la Cruz” (“Response to Sor Filotea de la Cruz”). Sor Juana shares her intellectual biography, including the fact that she found it difficult to avoid developing arguments and composing verses in her sleep. Throughout the letter, she advocates for the equal education of men and women, using her own disposition toward learning as evidence of women’s intellectual capabilities. The writings of Sor Juana thus present a sustained rejection of the unfair gendered expectations surrounding the pursuit of knowledge through rationality.

François Poulain de la Barre (1647–1723) asserted the intellectual parity of women and advocated for their education and participation in public life. His trilogy of works – De l’égalité des deux sexes (1673), De l’éducation des dames (1674), and De l’excellence des hommes (1675) – present a coherent thesis on gender equality rooted in Cartesian metaphysics. He argued that while natural differences exist between the sexes, social disparities are culturally constructed and not inherent. As Shapiro (2021) notes, the search for clear and distinct knowledge led Poulain to adhere to the principles of Cartesian metaphysics, highlighting the real distinction between mind and body. Since he held that no characteristics are shared between mind and body, he concluded that the mind has no sex and is equal in men and women (Poulain de la Barre 2002: 82) Poulain’s application of Cartesian principles to social analysis laid the foundation for later feminist movements and contributed to the Querelle des femmes movement in 15th- to 18^th-century France (Stuurman 1997, Shapiro 2021). His writings likewise showcase the application of rationalist principles to questioning gendered social norms.

Much remains to be said about the history of early modern rationalism. No doubt, future iterations of this entry will reflect this fact. Telling more inclusive stories about philosophy’s history requires that the concepts we employ (such as ‘rationalism’) not be static or stationary – that they be employed in a way that is fluid and adaptable to new aims and values that will inevitably emerge. An instrumentalist approach to the concept of rationalism makes it possible to understand the ideas and thinkers of the past in such a way that they continue to be relevant to contemporary perspectives and discourses.

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Baruch Spinoza

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Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz

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Anton Wilhelm Amo

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Margaret Cavendish

• Battigelli, Anna. 2014. Margaret Cavendish and the Exiles of the Mind. Lexington, KY: University Press of Kentucky.
• Boyle, Deborah. 2015. “Margaret Cavendish on Perception, Self-Knowledge, and Probable Opinion.” Philosophy Compass, 10 (7): 438–450.
• –––. 2017. The Well-Ordered Universe: The Philosophy of Margaret Cavendish. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Broad, Jacqueline. 2002. Women Philosophers of the Seventeenth Century. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• –––. 2011. “Is Margaret Cavendish Worthy of Study Today?” Studies in History and Philosophy of Science, Part A, 42 (3): 457–461.
• Cunning, David. 2016. Cavendish. New York: Routledge.
• Detlefsen, Karen. 2006. “Atomism, Monism, and Causation in the Natural Philosophy of Margaret Cavendish.” Oxford Studies in Early Modern Philosophy, 3: 199–240.
• –––. 2007. “Reason and Freedom: Margaret Cavendish on the Order and Disorder of Nature.” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie, 89 (2): 157–191.
• –––. 2009. “Margaret Cavendish on the Relation Between God and World.” Philosophy Compass, 4 (3): 421–438.
• Duncan, Stewart. 2012. “Debating Materialism: Cavendish, Hobbes, and More.” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 29 (4): 391–409.
• Georgescu, Laura. 2021. “Self-Knowledge, Perception, and Margaret Cavendish’s Metaphysics of the Individual.” Early Science and Medicine, 25 (6): 618–639.
• –––. 2023. “Cavendish on Life.” Notes and Records: The Royal Society Journal of the History of Science, 77 (4): 697–715.
• Lascano, Marcy P. 2020. “Margaret Cavendish and Early Modern Scientific Experimentalism: ‘Boys that play with watery bubbles or fling dust into each other’s eyes, or make a hobbyhorse of snow’.” The Routledge Handbook of Feminist Philosophy of Science, edited by Sharon Krasnow and Kristen Intemann, 28–40. Milton Park: Routledge.
• Lascano, Marcy P. 2023. The Metaphysics of Margaret Cavendish and Anne Conway: Monism, Vitalism, and Self Motion. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• McNulty, Michael Bennett. 2018. “Margaret Cavendish on the Order and Infinitude of Nature.” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 35 (3): 219–239.
• Michaelian, Kourken. 2009. “Margaret Cavendish’s Epistemology.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 17(1): 31–53.
• O’Neill, Eileen. 2001. “Introduction.” In Margaret Cavendish: Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy, edited by Eileen O’Neill. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Shaheen, Jonathan. 2019. “Part of Nature and Division in Margaret Cavendish’s Materialism.” Synthese, 196 (9): 3551–3575.
• –––. 2021. “The Life of the Thrice Sensitive, Rational and Wise Animate Matter: Cavendish’s Animism.” HOPOS: The Journal of the International Society for the History of Philosophy of Science, 11 (2): 621–641.
• –––. 2022. “A Vitalist Shoal in the Mechanist Tide: Art, Nature, and 17th-Century Science.” Philosophies, 7 (5) 111: 1–20.
• Peterman, Alison. 2019a. “Empress Vs. Spider-Man: Margaret Cavendish on Pure and Applied Mathematics.” Synthese, 196 (9): 3527–3549.
• –––. 2019b. “Margaret Cavendish on Motion and Mereology.” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 57 (3): 471–499.
• –––. 2023. “‘Actions of a Body Sentient’: Cavendish on the Mind (and against Panpsychism).” Oxford Studies in the Philosophy of Mind, 3: 399–431.
• –––. 2025. Cavendish. New York: Routledge.
• Wilkins, Emma. 2014. “Margaret Cavendish and the Royal Society.” Notes and Records: The Royal Society Journal of the History of Science, 68: 245–260.

Robert Hooke

• Henderson, Felicity. 2019. “Robert Hooke and the Visual World of the Early Royal Society.” Perspectives on Science, 27(3): 395–434.
• Turney, Gerard. 2005. “The Impact of Hooke’s Micrographia and Its Influence on Microscopy.” In Robert Hooke and the English Renaissance, edited by Paul Welberry Kent and Allan Chapman. Leominster, Herefordshire: Gracewing Publishing.

Anne Conway

• Bender, Sebastian. 2022c. “Anne Conway’s Metaphysics of Change.” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 39 (1): 21–44.
• Boyle, Deborah. 2006. “Spontaneous and Sexual Generation in Conway’s Principles.” In The Problem of Animal Generation in Early Modern Philosophy, edited by Justin E. H. Smith, 175–193. Cambridge Studies in Philosophy and Biology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Duran, Jane. 1989. “Anne Viscountess Conway: A Seventeenth Century Rationalist.” Hypatia, 4 (1): 64–79.
• Grey, John. 2024. “Anne Conway’s Ontology of Creation.” Journal of the American Philosophical Association, 10 (2): 333–348.
• Gordon-Roth, Jessica. 2018. “What Kind of Monist is Anne Finch Conway?” Journal of the American Philosophical Association, 4 (3): 280–297.
• Head, Jonathan. 2020. The Philosophy of Anne Conway: God, Creation, and the Nature of Time. London: Bloomsbury.
• Hutton, Sarah. 1997. “Anne Conway, Margaret Cavendish and Seventeenth-Century Scientific Thought.” In Women, Science, and Medicine, 1500–1700, edited by Lynette Hunter and Sarah Hutton, 218–234. Stroud, Gloucestershire: Sutton.
• –––. 2004. Anne Conway: A Woman Philosopher. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• –––. 2020. “Plato and the Platonism of Anne Conway.” In Women, Philosophy and Science: Italy and Early Modern Europe, edited by Sabrina Ebbersmeyer and Gianni Paganini, 41–51. Cham: Springer.
• –––. 2021. “Princess Elisabeth and Anne Conway (1631–1679): The Interconnected Circles of Two Philosophical Women.” In Elisabeth of Bohemia (1618–1680): A Philosopher in her Historical Context, edited by S. Ebbersmeyer and S. Hutton. Women in the History of Philosophy and Sciences, vol 9. Cham: Springer.
• Lascano, Marcy. 2023. The Metaphysics of Margaret Cavendish and Anne Conway: Monism, Vitalism, and Self-Motion. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Mercer, Christia. 2012a. “Platonism in Early Modern Natural Philosophy: The Case of Leibniz and Conway.” In Neoplatonism and the Philosophy of Nature, edited by James Wilberding and Christoph Horn. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• –––. 2012b. “Knowledge and Suffering in Early Modern Philosophy: G. W. Leibniz and Anne Conway.” In Emotional Minds: The Passions and the Limits of Pure Inquiry in Early Modern Philosophy, edited by Sabrina Ebbersmeyer. Boston: De Gruyter.
• –––. 2015. “Seventeenth-Century Universal Sympathy: Stoicism, Platonism, Leibniz, and Conway.” In Sympathy: A History, edited by Eric Schliesser, 107–138. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Sample, Hope. 2022. “Anne Conway on Divine and Creaturely Freedom.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 31 (6): 1151–1167.
• Strok, Natalia 2022. “‘El caballo será por fin alguna vez convertible en hombre’: consideraciones en torno al caballo y su transmutación en Anne Conway.” Siglo Dieciocho, 3: 59–80.
• Thomas, Emily. 2020. “Anne Conway as a Priority Monist: A Reply to Gordon-Roth.” Journal of the American Philosophical Association, 6 (2): 75–84.

Sor Juana Inés de la Cruz

• Benítez, Laura. 2019. “Sensibility and Understanding in the Epistemological Thought of Sor Juana Inés de La Cruz.” In Feminist History of Philosophy: The Recovery and Evaluation of Women’s Philosophical Thought, edited by Eileen O’Neill and Marcy P. Lascano, 75–96. Cham: Springer.
• Gallegos-Ordorica, Sergio Armando. 2020. “Sor Juana Inés de La Cruz on Self-Control.” Philosophy Compass, 10: 1–10.
• Santa Cruz, M. I. 1994. “Filosofía y feminismo en Sor Juana Inés de la Cruz.” In Mujeres y filosofía II: teoría filosófica de género, edited by María Luisa Femenías, 157–181. Buenos Aires: CEAL.
• Strok, Natalia. 2022. “Juana Inés de la Cruz: el estudio para ignorar menos.” In Filósofas y filósofos de la modernidad: nuevas perspectivas y materiales para el estudio, edited by Silvia Manzo, 179–189. La Plata: EDULP.

François Poulain de la Barre

• Leduc, Guyonne. 2010. Réécritures anglaises au XVIIIe siècle de l’Égalité des deux sexes (1673) de François Poulain de La Barre: du politique au polémique. Paris: Harmattan.
• Pellegrin, Marie-Frédérique. 2020. Pensées du corps et différences des sexes à l’époque moderne. Paris: ENS Éditions.
• Reuter, Martina. 2013. “Freedom of the Will as a Basis of Equality: Descartes, Princess Elisabeth and Poullain de la Barre.” In Freedom and the Construction of Europe, vol. 2, edited by Quentin Skinner and Martin van Gelderen, 65–83. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Schmitter, Amy M. 2018. “Cartesian Prejudice: Gender, Education and Authority in Poulain de la Barre.” Philosophy Compass, 13 (12): e12553.
• Shapiro, Lisa. 2021. “Poulain de la Barre’s Socializing of the Cartesian Mind.” Revista Seiscentos, 1 (1): 1–18.
• Stuurman, Siep. 1997. “Social Cartesianism: François Poulain de la Barre and the Origins of theEnlightenment.” Journal of the History of Ideas, 58 (4): 617–640.
• –––. 2004. François Poulain de la Barre and the Invention of Modern Equality. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.

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