Spacetimes With Holes

This area has been the subject of recent philosophical work, primarily by Manchak (2009b, 2014a, 2016a). Keep in mind that these "holes" are very different from regions of no escape characterizing black holes, and also from the holes of the Hole Argument. Geroch (1977) originally proposed the idea of a generic “hole” in spacetime in trying to capture in as general terms as possible the idea that spacetime has no obstruction of any kind that would prevent it from “evolving as far into the future as it reasonably could”. (Recall the discussion of maximality and extendibility in section 1.1.) Although Geroch’s definition had powerful conceptual appeal, in the event it has proven untenable: Krasnikov (2009) showed that, according to it, even Minkowski spacetime fails to be hole-free. Manchak (2009b) showed how an emendation of Geroch’s definition could fix the problem. He then showed that, under the assumption of global hyperbolicity (a strong condition of causal well-behavedness for a spacetime), one gets a nice hierarchy of conditions relating to determinism: geodesic completeness implies effective completeness (Manchak’s own condition), which implies inextendibility, which implies hole-freeness (Manchak 2014a; see section 1.1 for the definitions of these conditions). In related work, Manchak (2014b) showed that, in a sense one can make precise, it should be easier to construct a machine that would result in spacetime’s having such a hole than one that would result in time-travel. In short, creating the possibility for indeterminism seems easier in the theory than the possibility for causal paradox!

Manchak (2016a) also recently introduced a new kind of pathology a spacetime can have, an “epistemic hole”: roughly speaking, a spacetime has an epistemic hole if two observers in initially identical epistemic states can evolve in such a way that what one can learn can only ever be, in principle, a proper subset of what the other can learn. Manchak shows that, if a spacetime has no epistemic holes then (under mild conditions on the niceness of the causal structure) the spacetime has no naked singularities as standardly construed. The condition differs also in its modal character from other such hole-freeness conditions, for it makes significantly weaker and more conceptually and technically tractable modal claims. However, it has a disadvantage of being satisfied in some clearly extendible examples (Doboszewski 2020).