Non-Standard Singularities

In 2004, it was discovered that general relativity admits even more kinds of singularities than those known before, so-called ‘sudden singularities’ (Barrow 2004a, 2004b). The characterization of this kind of singularity has, so far, been confined to the context of cosmological models, including essentially all spacetimes whose matter content consists of homogeneous perfect fluids and a very wide class of spacetimes consisting of inhomogeneous fluids. The dynamics of those cosmological models is largely governed by the behavior of the cosmological expansion factor, a measure of the relative sizes of local regions of space (not spacetime) at different cosmological times. In an expanding spacetime, such as the one we believe ourselves to live in, the expansion factor continually increases, having “started from zero at the Big Bang”. If the universe’s expansion stops, and the net gravitational effect on cosmological scales results in the universe’s collapsing in on itself, this would be marked by a continual decrease in the expansion factor, eventuating in a Big Crunch singularity as the expansion factor asymptotically approached zero. The remaining dynamics of these cosmological models is encoded in the behavior of the Hubble parameter, a natural measure of the rate of change of the expansion factor. A sudden singularity, then, is defined by the divergence of a time derivative of the expansion factor or the Hubble parameter, though the factor or parameter itself remains finite.

Because important physical quantities, such as spatial pressure of the cosmological fluid, are proportional to such time derivatives, the physical interpretation of sudden singularities is often, in at least one sense, perspicuous: depending on the time derivative that diverges, a sudden singularity can mark the divergence of a physically important quantity such as pressure, within a finite interval of proper time (Cattoën and Visser 2005; Cotsakis and Klaoudatou 2005; Fernández-Jambrina 2014; Jiménez et al. 2016). In such cases, it may happen that the mass-density of the fluid itself, the expansion factor and its first derivative, and even the Hubble parameter and its first derivative, all remain finite: only the pressure (and so the second derivative of the expansion factor) diverges. Because the physical significance of quantities such as pressure is thought to be unambiguous, this feature of sudden singularities stands in marked contrast to the problems of physical interpretation that plague the standard type of singularity, discussed in section 1.3.

Of most interest, however, is the way that sudden singularities may differ in an even more fundamental way from standard singularities: there need be no path-incompleteness associated with them (Fernández-Jambrina and Lazkoz 2004, 2007). In effect, although the values of some physically important quantities diverge, the metric itself remains well defined, allowing curves “running into” the pathological point to continue through it. Indeed, point particles passing through the sudden singularity would not even notice the pathology, as only tidal forces may diverge (and not even all sudden singularities involve divergence of those): point particles, having no extension, cannot experience tidal force. If one wants to count sudden singularities as true singularities—and there seems every reason to do so—then this would put the nail in the coffin for the idea that singularities always can or should be associated with “missing points”.

Another type of singularity, recently characterized (Dąbrowski and Denkiewicz 2009) and closely related to sudden singularities, though conceptually distinct from them, are the so-called w-singularities, in which the singularity arises from divergence of the barotropic index w defining the equation of state of the cosmological fluid. (The barotropic index is the ratio of pressure to mass density in the fluid.) They share all the puzzling features of sudden singularities discussed here.

Although the discovery of sudden singularities has reinvigorated the study of singular spacetimes in the physics community (Cotsakis 2007), they remain so far almost entirely unexamined by the philosophy community. Nonetheless, they raise questions of manifest philosophical interest and import. The fact that they are such radically different structures from all other previously known kinds of singularity, for example, raises methodological questions about how to understand the meaning of terms in physical theories when those terms refer to structurally quite different but obviously still intimately related phenomena—the reasons for thinking of them as singularities are compelling, even though they violate essentially every standard condition known for characterizing singularities.

Another unusual kind of singularity deserves mention here, because of its possible importance in cosmology. The physical processes that seem to eventuate in most known kinds of singular structure involve the unlimited clumping together of matter, as in collapse singularities associated with black holes, and the Big Bang and Big Crunch singularities of standard cosmological models. A big rip, contrarily, occurs when the expansion of matter increasingly accelerates without bound in a finite amount of proper time (Caldwell 2002; Caldwell et al. 2003; Chimento and Lazkov 2004; Dabrowski 2006; Fernández-Jambrina 2014). Rather than the volume of spacetime shrinking to zero, its volume increases without bound—spacetime literally tears itself apart, not even fundamental particles being able to maintain their structural unity and integrity (Chimento and Lazkoz 2004; Fernández-Jambrina 2014). Again, standard concepts and arguments about singularities characterized as incomplete paths do not seem easily applicable here. Although big rips do have incomplete paths associated with them as well as curvature pathology, they are of such radically different kinds as to prima facie warrant separate analysis.

Recent work, codified by Harada et al. (2018), shows just how different such cosmological singularities can be. For homogeneous cosmological models filled with perfect fluids with a linear equation of state—the standard cosmological model—certain values of the barotropic index yield past, future, or past and future big rips that are such that every timelike geodesic runs into them, but every null geodesic avoids them. In other words, any body traveling more slowly than light will run into the singularity, but every light ray will escape to infinity. This is not a situation that lends itself to easy and perspicuous physical interpretation.