Some Historical Background

Smith (1992: 1103–4) traces state affairs like entities back to Aristotle and medieval philosophers. Important contributions to the theory of states of affairs were made in particular in Austro-German Philosophy. Stumpf (1907: 29–30) claimed that the notion of states of affairs was introduced in Franz Brentano’s lectures on logic (1870–1885). Brentano distinguished between a mental act, its content and its object. When I think of Hesperus, my thinking, the act, has a particular content in virtue of which it is directed on the planet, the object. In his logic lectures Brentano extended this distinction to judgements (Brentano 1870ff:13.020 [6]): when I judge that Hesperus is a planet, my judging has a content and an object: the object is what is judged (“das Geurteilte”). Stumpf (1907: 30) called the content of a judgement “Sachverhalt”. This term is now translated as “state of affairs”. However, Stumpf’s states of affairs are rather close to thoughts or propositions (see also Smith 1992, 1105). For example, Stumpf (1907: 30) likened states of affairs to Bolzano’s sentences-in-themselves. Sentences-in themselves are supposed to be either true or false. This suggests that states of affairs were also conceived as truth-value bearers by Stumpf.

According to Adolf Reinach (1911: 374, Fn.), Edmund Husserl, a student of Brentano, was the first to clarify the significance and distinctive nature of states of affairs. Husserl (1901: V §17, § 18) took the object and not the content of a judgement to be a state of affairs. Every judgement has a content, in Husserl terminology “matter” (Materie) in virtue of which it is directed on a state of affairs, its object. Different kinds of mental act can be directed on the same state of affairs. For instance, when I wonder whether Rome was built in a day and when I judge that Rome was built in a day, I am directed on the same state of affairs, but once in the questioning, once in the assertoric mode. Can judgements that differ in their matter be directed on the same state of affairs? An answer to this question would help us to fix the distinction between matter and content for judgements. But Husserl’s answer to this question is difficult to reconstruct. Husserl 1900 connected states of affairs further to correct judgement, probability and the laws of logic. For instance, a judgement is supposed to be correct if, and only if, the state of affairs it is directed on obtains (Husserl 1900: 13).

Reinach 1911 followed Husserl: states of affairs are the “correlates” of judgement and assertion (See Meinertsen 2022 for a comparison between Reinach and Armstrongian states of affairs). If, for instance, a particular rose exists, a range of states of affairs exists that depend on the rose, whether they obtain or not (see Reinach 1911: 340). If I judge that the rose is blue, I judge incorrectly, because the judged state of affairs exists, but does not obtain. The property of states of affairs to obtain or fail to obtain distinguishes them from facts. As we have seen in section 2, the “space” of states of affairs helps Reinach to clarify the notions of modality and probability (see Reinach 1911: 339–40). Reinach (1911: 338f) proposed, but did not argue in detail, that states of affairs are the relata of the ground-consequence relation. If an event a causes an event b, the state of affairs that a occurs is the ground of the state of affairs that b occurs. It is prima facie implausible that states of affairs are grounds and consequences. If it is either raining or it is snowing because it is raining, it must be a fact that it is raining. Facts or truths seem to be the relata of the ground-consequence relation. However, Fine (2012b: sect. 5) argues that a derived notion of non-factive grounding is useful. States of affairs are suitable as relata of this relation.

States of affairs figure prominently in Wittgenstein’s Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus. Potter (2011: 106) speculates about the influence of Austrian philosophers on Wittgenstein in this respect.