Philosophy of Technology

First published Fri Feb 20, 2009; substantive revision Fri Jul 10, 2026

If philosophy is the attempt “to understand how things in the broadest possible sense of the term hang together in the broadest possible sense of the term”, as Wilfrid Sellars (1962) put it, philosophy should definitely not ignore technology. It is largely by technology that contemporary society hangs together. It is hugely important not only as an economic force but also as a cultural and, increasingly, political force. Indeed during the last one and a half centuries, when it gradually emerged as a discipline, philosophy of technology has mostly been concerned with the meaning of technology for, and its impact on, society and culture, rather than with technology itself. Mitcham (1994) calls this type of philosophy of technology “humanities philosophy of technology” because it accepts “the primacy of the humanities over technologies” and is continuous with the overall perspective of the humanities (and some of the social sciences). An interest in understanding technology itself, the practice of designing and creating artifacts, artificial processes and systems, and the nature of the things so created, developed only in the late twentieth century. This latter form of philosophy of technology seeks continuity with other philosophical disciplines (philosophy of science, philosophy of mind, philosophy of action and choice) rather than with the humanities and social sciences.

1. Different Approaches to the Philosophy of Technology

Technology in the narrow sense of tool-making and -using has been a presence in human life for millennia. But it was only at the start of the modern age, around 1500, that technology as a distinct phenomenon became a topic of philosophical reflection, where by technology we mean the totality of fabricated means put to use in order to achieve all sorts of practical ends, and the totality of ways to think of such means and bring them into existence. Initially this led to an unmistakably positive view, from which technology was presented as the road to the flourishing of humanity. Francis Bacon’s literary fantasy New Atlantis (1627) is the key text of this attitude, and also the earliest one. This positive attitude lasted well into the nineteenth century, well after the onset of the industrial revolution. Karl Marx, for example, did not condemn the steam engine or the spinning mill for the vices of the bourgeois mode of production; he believed that ongoing technological innovation allowed for the necessary steps toward the more blissful end stage of communism. We further discuss Marx in Section 3.2.4. Van der Pot 1985 [1994/2004] presents an extensive historical overview of appreciations of the development of technology generally.

A turning point in the appreciation of technology is marked by Samuel Butler’ Erewhon (1872), written under the impression of the Industrial Revolution—during which the first violent rejection of technology by the Luddites occurred—and of Darwin’s On the Origin of Species (1859). Similar to New Atlantis, Butler’s book is a literary fantasy; it describes a fictional country where all machines are banned and the possession of a machine or the attempt to build one is a capital crime. This radical policy was motivated by the conviction that ongoing technical improvements held the risk of leading to a ‘race’ of machines that would replace humankind. This introduced a theme that has remained influential in the perception of technology ever since.

A critical attitude predominated in philosophical reflection on technology during the remainder of the nineteenth century and most of the twentieth century. The representatives of this attitude were, overwhelmingly, schooled in the humanities or the social sciences and had little if any first-hand knowledge of engineering practice. Whereas Bacon wrote extensively on the method of science and conducted physical experiments himself, Butler, being a clergyman, lacked such knowledge. Ernst Kapp, who was the first to use the term ‘philosophy of technology’ in his (1877 [2018]), was a philologist and historian. Most of the authors who wrote critically about technology and its socio-cultural role during the twentieth century were philosophers of a general outlook, such as Martin Heidegger (1954 [1977]), Günther Anders (1956), Arnold Gehlen (1957 [1980]), Herbert Marcuse (1964), Jürgen Habermas (1968 [1971]), Hans Jonas (1979 [1984]) and Andrew Feenberg (1991, 1999). Others had a background in one of the other humanities or in social science, such as literary criticism and social research for Lewis Mumford (1934), law for Jacques Ellul (1954 [1964]), political science for Langdon Winner (1977, 1980, 1983) and literary studies for Albert Borgmann (1984). The form of philosophy of technology constituted by the writings of these and others has been called by Carl Mitcham, in his Thinking Through Technology (1994), ‘humanities philosophy of technology’, because it takes its point of departure from the humanities and the social sciences rather than from the practices of science and engineering, and it approaches technology accepting “the primacy of the humanities over technologies” (1994: 39), since technology originates from the goals and values of humans.

Humanities philosophers of technology tend to take the phenomenon of technology itself largely as a given; they treat it as a ‘black box’, a unitary, monolithic phenomenon. In contrast to the situation in, e.g., philosophy of science or political philosophy, this particular approach to philosophy of technology often does not aim so much to analyse and understand the phenomenon but to grasp its relations to morality (Jonas, Gehlen), politics (Winner), rationality (Habermas), the structure of society (Mumford), human freedom (Ellul, Marcuse), or metaphysics (Heidegger). In this way, these philosophers are almost all openly critical of technology: all things considered, they tend to have a negative judgment of the way technology has affected human thought and culture, or at least they single out for consideration the negative effects of technology on human thought and culture. This does not necessarily mean that technology itself is pointed out as the principal cause of these negative effects. In the case of Heidegger, in particular, the grip that technology has on modern society is rather a symptom of something more fundamental, namely a wrongheaded attitude towards Being which has been on the rise for almost 25 centuries, and he himself denied that his discussion of technology constituted a philosophy of technology.

All the same, the work of these founding figures of humanities philosophy of technology and of Heidegger in particular has been taken further by a second and third generation of scholars, and in the course of this development a more neutral rather than an overall negative view of technology and its meaning for human life and culture has come to be adopted. Notable examples are Ihde (1979, 1993), whose view of technology as mediator between humans and the world makes him the main representative of the approach called postphenomenology, and Verbeek (2000 [2005]), who has refined the notion of mediation and has extended the approach to include a moral dimension.

Mitcham contrasts ‘humanities philosophy of technology’ to ‘engineering philosophy of technology’, where the latter refers to philosophical views developed by engineers or technologists as “attempts … to elaborate a technological philosophy” (1994: 17). Mitcham discusses only a handful of people as engineering philosophers of technology: Ernst Kapp, Peter Engelmeier, Friedrich Dessauer, and much more briefly Jacques Lafitte, Gilbert Simondon, Hendrik van Riessen, Juan David García Bacca, R. Buckminster Fuller and Mario Bunge. The label ‘engineering philosophy of technology’ may easily suggest that these “attempts … to elaborate a technological philosophy” have something in common, some form of being grounded in a conception of engineering or in an empirical basis provided by an acquaintance with engineering practice. This however, seems hardly the case. Except for Bunge and Simondon, who are discussed below, these authors seem to be rather isolated figures, who share little beyond the absence of a ‘working relation’ with established philosophical disciplines. It is, therefore, unclear what questions and concerns underlie this notion of ‘engineering philosophy of technology’.

A more coherent alternative approach to humanities philosophy of technology has established itself only relatively recently, since the 1960s. For want of a better term this approach is usually referred to as analytic philosophy of technology. This approach is not primarily concerned with the relations between technology and society or culture but sees itself as first of all concerned with technology as such. It treats technology not as a ‘black box’ but as a phenomenon that should be studied in detail, and sees this phenomenon as something grounded in a practice, the practice of engineering. Analytic philosophy of technology therefore studies this practice, its goals, its concepts and its methods, and relates its findings to various themes from philosophy. This does not mean, however, that analytic philosophy of technology can be considered as somehow a development of ‘engineering philosophy of technology’. The two are neither historically nor substantially in a significant way connected. In particular there is no relation between Mitcham’s ‘engineering philosophy of technology’ and current philosophy of engineering, which has established itself as a subdiscipline within the philosophy of technology since the turn of the millennium. The work of, e.g., Florman (1976, 1990) can be seen as an early contribution from the engineering world. For this subdiscipline a comprehensive handbook was edited recently by Michelfelder and Doorn (2021).

The term ‘analytic philosophy of technology’ should not be understood as indicating an adherence to the philosophical ‘program’ of this name that flourished from the 1920s to the 1950s. It indicates not much more than the fact that the philosophers who contribute to it share a specific educational background. A fortiori, analytic philosophy of technology and humanities philosophy of technology cannot be contrasted as being the representatives within philosophy of technology of analytic philosophy and continental philosophy, respectively. To be sure, key thinkers from continental philosophy—notably Heidegger—have been a great influence on several humanistic philosophers, e.g., Ihde, Borgmann and Verbeek. Other important philosophical influences on humanities philosophy of technology, however, e.g. the critical philosophy of the Frankfurt School, seem to escape the contrast between analytic and continental philosophy. The differences between the two approaches strongly reflect the different ways they are tied up with academic disciplines outside of philosophy: analytic philosophy of technology with engineering science and design, humanities philosophy of technology with the social sciences and humanities. Of particular significance to humanities philosophy of technology has been the emergence of ‘Science and Technology Studies’ (STS) in the 1980s, which investigates from a broad social-scientific perspective how social, political, and cultural values affect scientific research and technological innovation, and how these in turn affect society, politics, and culture. For a more detailed discussion of the relevance of the analytic-continental distinction to the philosophy of technology, see Franssen (2022).

We discuss authors from humanities philosophy of technology in Section 3, where the problems and challenges are treated that technology poses for the societies in which it is practiced, but we do not present separately and in detail the wide variety of views existing in this field. For a more detailed treatment Mitcham’s 1994 book still provides an excellent overview. A recent comprehensive coverage of humanities philosophy of technology is available in Coeckelbergh’s (2020) textbook. Olsen, Selinger and Riis (2009) and Vallor (2022) offer wide-ranging collections of contributions; Scharff and Dusek (2014) and Kaplan (2009) present comprehensive anthologies of texts from this tradition. Meijers (2009) presents a comprehensive overview of the topics discussed in analytic philosophy of technology.

2. Analytic Philosophy of Technology

2.1 Relation between Technology and Science; Different Relations of Both to Philosophy

It may come as a surprise to those new to the topic that the fields of philosophy of science and philosophy of technology show such great differences, given the extent to which science and technology pervade one another. The development of technology crucially depends on scientific knowledge and engineering education accordingly is filled to the brim with courses in science. Conversely, experimental science is nowadays crucially dependent on technology for the realization of its research set-ups and for gathering and analysing data. This is an ongoing process, as currently the introduction of new AI technologies is leading to major innovations in scientific research; see, e.g., Behrens et al. 2023 [Other Internet Resources] and Royal Society 2024 [Other Internet Resources].

Though the mutual interpenetration of science and technology is a relatively recent development, which started around the middle of the nineteenth century and which is responsible for great differences between modern technology and traditional, craft-like techniques, its sheer vastness and depth would make one expect a corresponding interpenetration of the philosophical reflections on science and technology. A major reason that this is hardly the case is that science, unlike technology, emerged in the seventeenth century from philosophy itself. The answers that Galileo, Huygens, Newton, and others gave, by which they initiated the alliance of experiment and mathematical description that is so characteristic of modern science, were answers to questions that had belonged to philosophy since antiquity. Science, therefore, has always captured the attention of philosophers. Philosophy of science can be seen as a transformation of epistemology in the light of the emergence of science. No such intimacy has ever existed between philosophers and engineers or technologists. Their worlds still barely touch.

Yet it can be argued that parallel to the historical and substantial continuity existing between natural philosophy and science, a similar continuity exists between central questions in philosophy having to do with human action and practical rationality and the way technology approaches and systematizes the solution of practical problems. To investigate this connection may indeed be considered a major theme for philosophy of technology, and more is said on it in the next two sections. This continuity, however, seems considerably less recognized and discussed than the one between natural philosophy and science. Significantly it is only the academic outsider Ellul who saw in technology the emergent single dominant way of answering all questions concerning human action, comparable to science as the single dominant way of answering all questions concerning human knowledge (Ellul 1954 [1964]). But Ellul was not so much interested in investigating this relationship as in emphasizing and denouncing the cultural and moral consequences as he saw them.

The predominant position of science in the philosophical field of vision made it difficult for philosophers to recognize that technology merits special attention for involving issues that do not emerge in science, in particular issues related to what to do rather than what to believe. The view resulting from this lack of recognition is often presented, perhaps somewhat dramatically, as amounting to a claim that technology is ‘merely’ applied science.

It is therefore understandable that one of the first questions raised within the emerging field of analytic philosophy of technology was for a clarification of how exactly technology is different from science. This question received both radical and moderate answers. The radical answer, that technology is something entirely different from science, was given by Henryk Skolimowski (1966) and Herbert Simon (1969), in almost identical terms. As Skolimowski phrased it, science concerns itself with what is, whereas technology concerns itself with what is to be. Simon, in his book The Sciences of the Artificial, said that the scientist is concerned with how things are but the engineer with how things ought to be.

A moderate answer was provided by Mario Bunge (1966, 1985). He argued that technology is indeed applied science, but in a subtle way that does justice to the differences between science and technology. Bunge acknowledges that technology, in contrast to science, is about action, but with a form of ‘aboutness’ that is heavily underpinned by theory—this is what distinguishes technology from the arts and crafts and puts it on a par with science. According to Bunge, theories in technology come in two types: substantive theories, which provide knowledge about the object of action, and operative theories, which are concerned with action itself. The substantive theories of technology are in fact largely applications of scientific theories. The operative theories, in contrast, do not derive from scientific theories but are born in applied research itself. Still, as Bunge claims, operative theories show a dependence on science, in that in such theories the method of science is employed. This includes such features as modeling and idealization, the use of theoretical concepts and abstractions, and the modification of theories by the absorption of empirical data through prediction and retrodiction.

These two answers are not necessarily in conflict. The radical answer emphasizes that technology is after something other than what science is after. The moderate answer emphasizes that there is very significant overlap in the ways that science and technology each try to achieve what they are after, and that each, in pursuing its own goal, facilitates and stimulates the pursuing of its goal by the other party. The potential of this mutually reinforcing relationship is arguably the principal discovery of modernity.

2.2 Technology as Knowledge: Epistemological Issues

Bunge’s distinction between substantive and operative theories is a first step towards specifying how the stated distinction between technology and science in what they are about is reflected in their respective content. This involves distinguishing between content and product. The products of technology are artifacts, or more broadly conditions or situations controlled through artifacts. The content of technology is what enables its practitioners, engineers, to deliver such controlled conditions or situations: the sum total of technological knowledge. This distinction is equally at work in science, although the contrast is perhaps not as sharp. The products of science are explanations and predictions, whereas scientific knowledge, the content of science, is what allows scientists to produce convincing explanations and reliable predictions.

The interpenetration of science and technology, then, is first of all the interpenetration of their contents. An important input for the process of creating artifacts is scientific knowledge: knowledge about the behavior of components and the materials they are composed of in specific circumstances. This is where science is applied. Much of this knowledge, however, is not directly available from the sciences, since it often concerns extremely detailed, specific behavior in very specific circumstances. This knowledge is therefore often generated within technology, by the engineering sciences. But apart from this very specific scientific knowledge, engineering involves various other sorts of knowledge. In his book What Engineers Know and How They Know It, the aeronautical engineer Walter Vincenti (1990) gave a six-fold categorization of engineering design knowledge (leaving aside production and operation as the other two basic constituents of engineering practice). Vincenti distinguishes

  1. Fundamental design concepts, including primarily the operational principle and the normal configuration of a particular device;
  2. Criteria and specifications;
  3. Theoretical tools;
  4. Quantitative data;
  5. Practical considerations;
  6. Design instrumentalities.

The fourth category concerns the very specific descriptive knowledge generated by the engineering sciences, and the third the theoretical tools used to acquire it. These two categories can be assumed to match Bunge’s notion of substantive technological theories. The status of the remaining four categories is much less clear, however. Vincenti claims that they represent prescriptive forms of knowledge rather than descriptive ones, but this characterization raises further questions. Take the fundamental design concept ‘operational principle’, which refers to the way in which the function of a device is realized, or, in short, how it works. This is still a purely descriptive notion. Subsequently, however, it plays a role in arguments that seek to prescribe a course of action to someone who has a goal that could be realized by the operation of such a device. At this stage, the issue changes from a descriptive to a prescriptive or normative one. Extensive discussions of the various types of knowledge embodied by technology are offered by Houkes (2009) and Zwart and de Vries (2016).

Although the notion of an operational principle—a term that seems to originate with Polanyi (1958)—is central to engineering design, no single clear-cut definition of it seems to exist. The issue of disentangling descriptive from prescriptive aspects in an analysis of technical actions and their constituents is therefore a task that has hardly begun. This task requires a clear view on the extent and scope of technology. If one follows Joseph Pitt in his book Thinking About Technology (2000) and defines technology broadly as ‘humanity at work’, then to distinguish between technical action and action in general becomes difficult, and the study of action in technology must absorb all descriptive and normative theories of action, including the theory of practical rationality, and much of theoretical economics in its wake. There have indeed been attempts at such an encompassing account of human action, for example Tadeusz Kotarbiński’s Praxiology (1965), but a perspective of such generality makes it difficult to arrive at results of sufficient depth. It would be quite a challenge for philosophy to specify the commonalities and differences among action forms and the reasoning grounding them in, e.g., technology, organization and management, and economics, to mention just three prominent fields of study where action is central.

A more restricted attempt at characterizing the prescriptive part of technological knowledge is Niiniluoto’s (1993). The concern of science with what the world is like is worked out into the theoretical framework of science, the totality of its theories, models and explanations, which is descriptive. The concern of technology with what the world should be like has a corresponding ‘counterpoint’ theoretical framework, which is prescriptive. Niiniluoto sees this framework as so structurally similar to the framework of science that it constitutes something that deserves to be called a science—design science. The statements that form the content of design science, in being prescriptive, have a sui generis form. Niiniluoto calls them technical norms. They have the form ‘If one wants to achieve X, one should do Y’. The notion of a technical norm derives from Georg Henrik von Wright’s Norm and Action (1963). Technical norms need to be distinguished from so-called anankastic statements, of the form ‘If X is to be achieved, Y needs to be done’, which express natural or causal necessity. Anankastic statements are descriptive and therefore prime candidates for having a truth value. It is far less clear whether technical norms can have truth values. Von Wright tended to deny this, and stated that he did not understand the mutual relations between these statements. Niiniluoto accepts that technical norms have truth values but does not specify on which grounds. See Zwart, Franssen and Kroes (2018) for a detailed discussion of this issue. Ideas on what design science is and can and should be are evidently related to the broad problem area of practical rationality—see the entries on practical reason and instrumental rationality—and also to means-ends reasoning, discussed in the next section.

2.3 Technology as Design: Methodological Issues

To see that technology is not about what is but about what is to be is an important first step in coming to understand why so much philosophical reflection on technology has taken the form of socio-cultural critique. Technology is about changing the world. It is an ongoing attempt to adapt the world to our wishes. But this immediately raises the important questions which visions and whose wishes? Who decides and controls what is to be, and how (see also Section 3.2.2)? What kind of social and political influence is exerted here (see also Sections 3.2.4 and 3.2.5)?

In asking these questions, we seem to step out of the realm of technology proper just as we have entered it. Unlike scientists, who are often personally motivated in their attempts at describing and understanding the world, engineers are seen, not in the least by engineers themselves, as undertaking their attempts to change the world as a service to the public. Indeed Simon, in his characterization of technology as being about how things ought to be (Section 2.1), appends the condition “in order to function”, leaving it open whether the determination of functions as ends is part of technology. This view is a major source for the common picture of technology as being instrumental, as delivering instruments, means to ends, where the ends are specified outside of engineering. This picture is at the root of the controversial claim that technology is neutral with respect to values, or more specifically that neither technology as such nor technologies or technical artifacts incorporate values. This view can be found defended within analytical philosophy of technology by, e.g. Pitt (2000, 2014), who emphasizes that technological products, being ‘dead matter’, contain nothing that can bear value. Most philosophers of technology, however, argue that technological design is a goal-oriented process and that technical artifacts by definition have certain functions or affordances, so that they can be used for certain goals but not, or with far more difficulty or less effectively, for other goals. This conceptual connection between technical artifacts, functions, affordances, and goals seems to make it hard to maintain that technology is value-neutral. Section 3.2.1 discusses some elaborations of this view.

To this instrumental view corresponds a specific representation of the design process, the structured process leading toward that goal, which forms the core of the practice of engineering. In the engineering literature, the design process is commonly represented as consisting of a series of translational steps; see, e.g., Suh 2001. At the start are typically some specific client’s (rather than the public’s) needs or wishes. In the first step these are translated into a list of functional requirements, which then define the design task an engineer, or a team of engineers, has to accomplish. The functional requirements specify as precisely as possible what the device to be designed must be able to do. This step is required because customers usually focus on just one or two features and are unable to articulate the requirements that are necessary to support the functionality they desire. In the second step, the functional requirements are translated into design specifications, which articulate the exact physical parameters of crucial components through which the functional requirements are going to be met. The design parameters chosen to satisfy the requirements are then combined to arrive at a blueprint of the device. The blueprint contains all the details that must be known such that the final step in the process of manufacturing the device can take place. It is tempting to consider the blueprint as the end result of a design process, instead of any manufactured items. However, manufactured copies of a device are crucial for the purpose of prototyping and testing. This brings out that the sequence of steps making up the design process can and will often contain iterations, leading to revisions to the design specifications and sometimes also to the functional requirements. Additionally, in current practice the entire life cycle of an artifact is considered to be the designing engineer’s concern, up till the final stages of the recycling and disposal of its components and materials, and the functional requirements of any device should reflect this. From this point of view, neither a blueprint nor a prototype can be considered the end product of engineering design.

On the instrumental view, then, the first step of formulating the needs to be addressed belongs to the client, or to society, and is not subject to considerations of technical rationality. A rational or ‘scientific’ approach to design starts at the second phase, with the functional requirements. The particular requirements to be satisfied define a particular design problem or design task. The rational approach to completing this task is to choose from all the possible ways of meeting the requirements, plus all other considerations and criteria that are relevant, the way that meets them best. This creates several methodological problems. Most important of these is that the engineer is facing a multi-criteria decision problem. The various requirements come with their own operationalizations in terms of design parameters and measurement procedures for assessing a design’s performance. To each possible way of meeting the requirements corresponds a profile of rank orders or quantitative scales that represent its performance on each of the requirements and criteria. The task is to come up with a final score in which all these performances are somehow combined, such that the option that scores best can be considered the optimal solution to the design problem. Engineers describe this situation as one where trade-offs have to be made: in judging the merit of one option relative to other options, a relative bad performance on one criterion can be balanced by a relatively good performance on another criterion. An important problem is whether a rational method for doing this can be devised. It has been argued by Franssen (2005) that this problem is structurally similar to the well-known problem of social choice, for which Kenneth Arrow proved his famous impossibility theorem in 1950. Since then Arrow’s theorem been extended to cover a broader range of cases including ones where the input is quantitative; see the entry on Arrow’s Theorem. In technical design, the role that individual voters play in situations of social choice is played by the various design criteria, which each have a say in what the resulting product should come to look like. As a consequence, as long as we require from a solution method to this problem that it answers to a number of requirements that spell out its generality and rationality, it can be shown that no solution method exists. This poses serious problems for the claims of engineers that their designs are optimal solutions in the sense of satisfying the totality of the design criteria best. In most multi-criteria problems this notion of ‘optimal’ cannot be rigorously defined, just as in most multi-voter situations the notion of a best or even adequate representation of what the voters jointly want cannot be rigorously defined.

This result seems to except a crucial aspect of engineering activity from philosophical scrutiny, and it could be used to defend the opinion that engineering is at least partly an art, not a science. Instead of surrendering to this outcome, however, which has a significance that extends much beyond engineering, we should perhaps conclude instead that there is still a lot of work to be done on what might be termed, provisionally, ‘approximative’ forms of reasoning. It may be in the nature of forms of approximative reasoning that a general theory cannot be had. Arguably there is a parallel here to the situation with respect to inductive reasoning in science. Unlike the case of science, however, in technology we are still far from a systematic treatment from which such an insight could emerge.

Another reason for being skeptical about the prospects of a complete rational account of engineering design is the role played by creativity. If a technical design task is viewed as basically a problem of making a rational choice between a number of design options, then a clear division of labor between the part played by rational scrutiny and the part played by creativity suggests itself. Rationality concerns the question how to decide among given options, whereas creativity concerns the generation of these options. This distinction is similar to the distinction between the context of justification and the context of discovery in science. The suggested implication that rational scrutiny applies to the context of justification only has met with criticism concerning science, but for technological design it is definitely implausible. Much less than seems the case in science, the context of discovery in technology is governed by severe constraints of time and money. An overview of the issues can be found in Kroes, Franssen, and Bucciarelli (2009).

The ideas of Herbert Simon on bounded rationality (see, e.g., Simon 1957, 1982) are relevant here, since decisions on when to stop generating options and when to stop gathering information about these options and the consequences when they are adopted are crucial in decision making if informational overload and calculative intractability are to be avoided. However, it has proved difficult to further develop Simon’s ideas on bounded rationality since their conception in the 1950s. In particular, there seem to have been few systematic attempts to develop forms of bounded rationality for engineering design. They do not figure, e.g., in Viale (2021).

Another notion that is relevant here is means-ends reasoning. Standard approaches to means-ends reasoning take a set of known means, that is, actions with known results, as given and repeatedly apply problem decomposition until subproblems are reached for which there is a match in the set of means; see, e.g., Pollock (2002). Although this definitely corresponds to a substantial part of engineering practice, with its catalogs of proven solutions, it seems still overly restricted as a general approach. There may be all sorts of reasons—technical as well as political, legal and ethical reasons—that set limits to the decomposition of problems ad libitum in engineering design. Additionally, innovation seems primarily a matter of developing new means, which often follows upon a reconceptualization of the problem situation at an overall level. To cover these aspects, there seems room for a complementary approach to means-ends reasoning, in which the direction of the analysis is reversed compared to the standard approach.

Returning to the presentation of the design process as a series of translational steps as described above, the biggest idealization that this scheme contains is arguably located at the very start. Only in a minority of cases does a design task originate in a customer need or wish for a particular artifact. First of all, many engineers are intrinsically motivated to change the world, in particular the world as shaped by past technologies. Many design tasks are defined by engineers themselves, for instance, by noticing something to be improved in existing products. As a result, much technological development is ‘technology-driven’. Nevertheless design often starts with a problem noticed or pointed out in society, which engineers are then invited to solve. Many such problems, however, are ill-defined or wicked problems, meaning that it is not clear what the problem is exactly and what a solution to the problem would consist in. The ‘problem’ is a situation that people—not necessarily the people ‘in’ the situation—find unsatisfactory, but typically without being able to specify in substance or detail a situation that they would find more satisfactory. In particular it is not obvious that a solution to the problem would consist in some artifact, or some artifactual system or process, being made available or installed. Engineering departments all over the world advertise that engineering is problem solving, and engineers generally seem confident that they are qualified to solve a problem when they are asked to, whatever the nature of the problem. This has led to the phenomenon of a technological fix or ‘techno-solutionism’, the dealing with a problem through a the implementation of an artifact or artifactual process, where it is questionable, to say the least, whether this is the best way, or even an acceptable way, of dealing with the problem.

A candidate example of a technological fix for the problem of global warming would be the much debated option of injecting sulfate aerosols into the stratosphere to offset the warming effect of greenhouse gases such as carbon dioxide and methane. Such schemes of geoengineering would allow us to avoid facing the choices—most of them painful—that will lead to a reduction of the emission of greenhouse gases into the atmosphere, while allowing the depletion of the Earth’s reservoir of fossil fuels to continue. See Weinberg (1966) for the initial appreciation among engineers, and for a critical discussion of technological fixing or ‘techno-solutionism’ Volti 2009: 26–32 and Morozov 2013.

These wicked problems are often broadly social problems, which would best be met by some form of social action, which would result in people changing their norms of behavior or acting differently in such a way that the problem is mitigated or even disappears completely. In defense of the view from engineering, it could be said that the repertoire of ‘proven’ forms of social action is meager. It could be argued—particularly engineers might argue so—that the problems caused by technological fixing can be avoided by the systematic and thorough inclusion of the social sciences in the knowledge base of technology. This however, is a controversial view. ‘Social engineering’ is to many a specter to be kept at as large a distance as possible instead of as an ideal to be pursued: in their view no social problem should ever be approached with the mind-set of engineers. Karl Popper referred to acceptable forms of implementing social change as ‘piecemeal social engineering’ and contrasted it to the revolutionary, all-transforming but, in his view, completely unfounded schemes advocated by, e.g., Marxism. In the entry on Karl Popper, however, this choice of words is called “rather unfortunate”. Nonetheless, given the possible consequences, the question whether the social and human sciences can be developed to support technological applications to a similar extent as the natural sciences support them deserves more philosophical scrutiny than it seems to receive.

To look at technological design as a decision-making process is to view it normatively from the point of view of practical or instrumental rationality. At the same time it is descriptive in that it is a description of how engineering methodology generally presents the issue how to solve design problems. From that somewhat higher perspective there is room for all kinds of normative questions that are not addressed here, such as whether the functional requirements defining a design problem can be seen as an adequate representation of the values of the prospective users of an artifact or a technology, or by which methods values such as safety and sustainability can best be elicited and represented in the design process. These issues will be taken up in Section 3.1.2.

2.4 Metaphysical Issues: The Character and Ontological Status of Artifacts

Another central question in analytic philosophy of technology concerns the nature of the major products of technology, that is, technical artifacts. Artifacts are human-made objects: they have an author (see Hilpinen 1992 and the entry on artifact). Technical artifacts are, additionally, made to serve a purpose. This excludes, from the set of all human-made objects, byproducts and waste products. It is controversial whether this also excludes works of art. Although an ‘author’ busy at creating something may be well aware that byproducts and waste products are also produced, the author has no intention to produce them and no purpose for them in mind. In contrast, works of art generally do result from an intention directed at their creation (although in cases of conceptual art, this directedness may involve many intermediate steps) but it is contested whether artists include in their intentions that the work serve some purpose. And even if it is granted that artworks serve purposes, it can be argued that they do so in other ways than through the direct causal properties of their material constitution, whereas this is precisely how technical artifacts serve purposes. Most philosophers of technology who discuss the metaphysics of artifacts exclude artworks from their analyses. An account which aims to avoid this restriction is (Dipert 1993). See for further discussion the entries on the definition of art and the history of the ontology of art.

Since in order to serve purposes, technical artifacts must be causally efficacious and therefore material objects, they seem to be metaphysically hybrid: definable either by their material constitution or by the purpose they are for serving, that is, their function. This creates a priority issue between the two bases of their metaphysical status—an issue that was recognized already in antiquity and led to the famous puzzle of the Ship of Theseus (see the entries on material constitution and relative identity). David Wiggins (1980: 89) even took this issue to be the defining characteristic of artifacts. The emphasis on design and function in technology, and the predominance of (what seems to be) functional language for characterizing technological objects—clock, car—may suggest that in technology the priority issue has been settled in favor of function. Much effort, however, has been spent on arguing against a metaphysical priority of either function or material constitution in technology. Several scholars have emphasized that an adequate description of artifacts must refer both to their status as physical objects and to the intentions of the people engaged with them. Kroes and Meijers (2006) have dubbed this view “the dual nature of technical artifacts”; its most mature formulation is Kroes (2012). The mutual constraining of structure in function in artifacts has interesting connections with the issue of multiple realizability in the philosophy of mind (Shapiro 2004, Houkes and Meijers 2006) and with accounts of reduction in science (Mahner and Bunge 2001).

A central claim of the dual-nature program is that the two aspects are ‘tied up’, so to speak, in the notion of artifact function, and much effort has been put in producing a general account of this notion (e.g. Houkes and Vermaas 2010). The claim, central to the program, that artifact functions refer necessarily to human intentions raises questions in a broader context. Function is also a key concept in biology and no intentionality plays a role there. Additionally it is a key concept in cognitive science and the philosophy of mind, where it is crucial in grounding intentionality in non-intentional, structural and physical properties. To be sure it can be questioned whether the notion of artifact function necessarily refers to intentionality. It could be argued that in discussing the functions of the components of a larger device, and the interrelations between these functions, the intentional ‘side’ of these functions is at most of secondary importance. This, however, would be to ignore the possibility of the malfunctioning of such components. It is widely held that this notion is definable only in terms of a mismatch between actual behavior and intended behavior. A broadly accepted general account of function that covers both the intentionality-based notion of artifact function and the non-intentional notion of biological function—not to speak of other areas where the concept plays a role, such as the social sciences—is still lacking. The most comprehensive theory, that has the ambition to account for the biological notion, cognitive notion and the intentional notion, is Ruth Millikan’s (1984); for criticisms and replies, see Preston (1998, 2003); Millikan (1999); and Vermaas and Houkes (2003). The collection of essays edited by Ariew, Cummins and Perlman (2002) presents an introduction to the topic of characterizing the notion of function, although the emphasis is on biological functions. This emphasis remains very strong in the literature, as can be judged from the most recent critical overview (Garson 2016), which explicitly refrains from discussing artifact functions.

The focus on function, however, may easily block from view that the kinds that technological thought distinguishes are hardly ever proper functional kinds. There is more to, e.g., a knife than that it is ‘for cutting’, in the sense of meant to be used for cutting. For an object to be accepted as a knife, one should actually be able to cut with it, and what is more, to cut with it in an acceptable way. Despite innumerable attempts and claims, the perpetual motion machine, which would be for doing work perpetually, is not a kind of artifact. A kind like ‘knife’ is defined, not only by the intentions of the designers of knives that they be useful for cutting but also by a specific operational principle (see Section 2.2) known to these designers, on which their design is based. Or as it is phrased by Thomasson, an artifactual kind is defined by the designer’s intention to make something of that kind, by a substantive idea that the designer has of how this can be achieved, and by his or her largely successful achievement of it (Thomasson 2003, 2007). A distinction must therefore be made between a kind like ‘knife’ and a corresponding but different kind ‘cutter’. A ‘knife’ indicates a particular way a ‘cutter’ can be made. One can also cut, however, with a wire, a welding torch, a water jet, and undoubtedly by other sorts of means that have not yet been thought of. The truly functional kind is ‘cutter’. The major contrast between functional kinds and natural kinds, such as ‘gold’ or ‘atom’, is that the members of natural kinds satisfy some form of natural laws or regularities, whereas there are no regularities that all members of a functional kind answer to, due to the fact that they are multiply realizable in material form. If the kinds of artifacts that matter in technology are not truly functional kinds but are embodiments of operational principles that give them some commonality in physical and geometrical features, then the often emphasized metaphysical contrast between technology and science disappears, because there is a basis for law-like regularities being supported in technology as well, and this the more so once a particular artifact kind is subdivided into narrower kinds based on more sharply delineated operational principles. See for a defense of this position Soavi (2009) and for further contributions to these issues the essays in Franssen, Kroes, Reydon and Vermaas (2014).

A related criticism is that to have the class of technical artifacts range as widely as including hammers and knives as well as aircraft and computers is fundamentally flawed, as it leads to a distorted view of what technology is about. Already in the 1950s the French philosopher Simondon argued that mere utensils like knives and hammers are not properly speaking technological objects. Only objects of the sort of machines, which through their operation causally contribute to the conditions that are necessary for their continued operation, can be considered technological objects, as they require science-based design involving model building and calculations for the anticipation and creation of the exact causal contributions that are required. It is through the linking of technological objects of this sort into larger ensembles that are similarly stringently causally interlocked that we are able to build artifacts like aircraft and computers. For Simondon, whose work has become noticed only recently, see his (1958 [2017]). Much later, and independently, Lowe (2014) has argued in the same vein that machines should be considered to have a status different from simpler artifacts

3. Ethical, Social and Political Aspects of Technology

In this section, we address the philosophical reflection on the technical condition of modern human society and its normative evaluation. Technology affects people’s lives both directly and indirectly through the changes that it causes in the structure and patterns of society, and investigating the moral dimension of these processes is a central part of philosophy of technology. We discuss how such issues have been taken up in what is known as the field of ethics of technology (Section 3.1). We also discuss some recurrent themes when it comes to the social and moral aspects of technology (Section 3.2). In this section we will use the terms ‘ethical’ and ‘moral’ (or ‘ethics’ and ‘morality’) interchangeably, as reflects the general usage within the discipline. This usage will be put into question in Section 3.1.3, however.

3.1 Ethics of Technology

Ethics of technology is the term in use for the philosophical subdiscipline that studies ethical or moral questions concerning technology. This is not limited to normative theorizing, but may also be aimed at better understanding what ethical questions technology raises, and how to best conceptualize such questions. It was not until the twentieth century that the development of the ethics of technology as a systematic and independent subdiscipline of philosophy started. A plausible explanation for this late development is the instrumental perspective on technology that was mentioned in Section 2.3. This perspective implies, basically, a positive ethical assessment of technology: technology increases the possibilities and capabilities of humans, which seems in general desirable. Of course, since antiquity, it has been recognized that the new capabilities may be put to bad use or lead to human hubris. Often, however, these undesirable consequences are attributed to the users of technology, rather than the technology itself, or its developers. The instrumental view results in the so-called neutrality thesis (see Section 2.3), which holds that technology is a neutral instrument that can be put to good or bad use by its users. During the twentieth century, this neutrality thesis has been criticized.

Two general trends emerged during the development of ethics of technology. One is a move away from technological determinism—the assumption that technology is a given self-contained phenomenon which develops autonomously and irrevocably—to an emphasis on technological development being the result of human choices, although not necessarily the intended result of these choices. The other is a move away from ethical reflection on technology as such to ethical reflection of specific technologies, and to specific phases in the development of technology. Both trends together have resulted in an enormous increase in the number and scope of ethical questions that are asked about technology. These developments also imply that ethics of technology is to be adequately empirically informed, not only about the exact consequences of specific technologies but also about the details of the process of technological design, development and use. This has opened the way to the involvement of other disciplines in ethical reflections on technology, such as Science and Technology Studies (STS), Technology Assessment (TA), and design studies.

The last decades have witnessed in particular an enormous increase in ethical inquiries into specific technologies. Among the most visible new fields nowadays are digital ethics and AI ethics, which have evolved from computer ethics, with more recently a focus on robotics, artificial intelligence, machine ethics, and the ethics of algorithms. Other technologies like biotechnology have also spurred dedicated ethical investigations. More traditional fields like architecture and urban planning have also attracted specific ethical attention. Nanotechnology and so-called converging technologies have led to the establishment of what is called nanoethics. Other examples are the ethics of nuclear deterrence, nuclear energy and geoengineering.

Such new fields of ethical reflection are often characterized as applied ethics, that is, as applications of theories, normative standards, concepts and methods developed in moral philosophy. For each of these elements, however, application is usually not straightforward but requires a further specification or revision. This is the case because general moral standards, concepts, and methods are often not specific enough to be applicable in any direct sense to the specific moral problems that arise in the context of specific technologies. ‘Application’ therefore often leads to new insights which might well result in the reformulation or at least refinement of existing normative standards, concepts and methods.

An aspect of this has been thematized recently in terms of socially disruptive technologies, i.e. technologies that disrupt not only existing social practices but also the very concepts we use to evaluate these technologies and their effects. E.g., social media have disrupted the very concept of meaningful social interaction. In response to such conceptual disruption, existing concepts may be adapted or new concepts may be proposed, which links the ethics of technology to the emerging field of conceptual engineering (Cappelen 2018).

A historical example of a newly introduced (arguably descriptive) concept is ‘brain death’, a concept that was proposed to deal with the disruptive effects of the mechanical ventilator, a technology that made it possible to keep the respiration going of patients with no brain activity (and no chance of recovery). Examples of new, more clearly normative concepts are ‘meaningful human control’ (in response to new ethical challenges raised by drones and other autonomous technologies; see Section 3.2.2) and ‘explainability’ (in response to the opaqueness of AI) (van de Poel et al. 2023).

Apart from the general problem of application, it can, of course, be questioned whether the diverse issues and worries raised in society concerning technological innovation and development are best met by establishing new fields of applied ethics. This issue is in fact regularly discussed as new fields emerge. Several authors have, for example, argued that there is no need for nanoethics because nanotechnology does not raise any really new ethical issues; the ethical issues—e.g., unknown risk of exposure to toxic substances in consumer goods—raised are a variation on, and sometimes an intensification of, existing ethical issues, and can be dealt with by the existing theories and concepts from moral philosophy (e.g., McGinn 2010).

While different technologies may raise different types of ethical questions, this does not mean that there are no common themes that a more general ethics of technology would need to address. Moreover, humanities philosophers of technology have warned that a focus on applied ethics may undermine philosophical efforts of understanding technology as a whole (see Section 1 and Sharff and Dusek 2014: xiii–xiv). But even if the inquiry is not focused on technology as a whole, it is clear that there are common themes across different technological domains.

A general issue that applies to many new technologies is how to deal with the uncertainties about (potential) morally relevant impacts that typically surround new emerging technologies. Brey’s (2012) proposal for an anticipatory ethics may be seen as a reply to this challenge. The issue of anticipation is also one of the central concerns in the more recent interdisciplinary field of Responsible Research and Innovation (RRI) (e.g., Owen, Bessant and Heintz 2013). We will discuss several other recurrent themes in Section 3.2.

3.1.1 Engineering Ethics

Several forms of ethical reflection on technology take the practice of engineering into focus—in line with its significance as pointed out by analytic philosophy of technology. One such form is engineering ethics, which started off as a field of (applied) ethics in the 1980s in the United States, initially primarily as an educational effort. Engineering ethics is concerned with “the actions and decisions made by persons, individually or collectively, who belong to the profession of engineering” (Baum 1980: 1). In this approach, engineering is conceived as a profession and the typical ethical issues that are discussed are professional obligations of engineers as exemplified in, for example, codes of ethics of engineers, the role of engineers versus managers, competence, honesty, whistle-blowing, concern for safety and conflicts of interest (Davis 1998, 2005). Over the years, the scope of engineering ethics has broadened to include sustainability, social justice, privacy, global issues and the role of technology in society, and textbooks now also discuss the wider context in which such decisions are made (Harris, Pritchard and Rabins 2014; Martin and Schinzinger 2022; Taebi 2021; Peterson 2020; van de Poel and Royakkers 2023).

3.1.2 Design Ethics

Another form of ethical reflection that takes the practice of engineering into focus is to single out design. In design approaches, ethical considerations are taken as guidance to develop and design morally better technologies. Design ethics so understood is characterized by three basic assumptions:

  1. A proactive stance: traditionally ethical reflection on technology and its effects was often reactive. Design ethics aims to ‘front-load’ ethical issues in design.
  2. Ethics not as a break but as a constructive factor in technological development. Design ethics is aimed at designing technologies that are both socially accepted and morally acceptable.
  3. From preventing bad to doing good. Design ethics approaches typically see technology as a way to realize what is morally good or a vision of the good life and the good society.

Design ethics has two different historical roots, namely postphenomenological approaches in the philosophy of technology (see Section 1) as well as approaches such as value-sensitive design.

Postphenomenologists argue that that technologies mediate between humans and the world and that technological designs therefore affect how human perceive the world and what actions they perceive as possible and desirable. The task of design ethics is then to anticipate such mediations, as well as to think about and design for desirable mediations (Verbeek 2011).

Value-sensitive design aims at integrating values of ethical importance in engineering design in a systematic way (Friedman and Hendry 2019). The approach combines conceptual, empirical and technical investigations. There is also a range of similar approaches aimed at including values in design, like design for values (Van de Hoven, Vermaas, and van de Poel 2015) and ethics-by-design.

Design ethics has also met with criticism. We briefly mention two main points.

First, it can be argued that ethics cannot be guaranteed through design, as a term like ‘ethics-by-design’ suggests, because the ethical ramifications of technologies do not only depend on their design but also on the use, operation, maintenance and retirement of technology. This criticism is valid in the sense that design cannot guarantee ethical technology, and that also other phases of the lifecycle of technological products and systems require ethical reflection. However, it does not follow that design ethics is not a worthwhile effort.

A second criticism is that design ethics takes the framing of design problems as given and that it is too much expert-driven, rather than opening up the design process to underrepresented groups (see also Section 3.2). Such criticism may be valid for some approaches to design ethics, but it does not seem inherent in design ethics as such. Proper design ethics would take the formulation and framing of design problems as crucial and open to ethical reflection, and can open the design process beyond experts and the obvious stakeholders.

3.1.3 Political Philosophy of Technology

It is part of the rapid development of ethics of technology that it has become customary to characterize normative and evaluative questions concerning technology in general as ethical questions. However, not all normative and evaluative questions concerning technology are ethical. Some concern other normative realms like epistemology or aesthetics. But even the questions that concern the normative realm of morality cannot all be characterized as ethical questions without running into severe difficulties. Although ethics is one of the oldest topics studied in philosophy and the varieties in ethical thinking are huge, these varieties share an understanding that ethics is concerned with individual human action: whether the actions of a particular person in particular circumstances or of people generally in types of circumstances are right or wrong, recommendable or blameworthy, possibly so because of how these actions realize or aim for good or bad things. But many of the phenomena associated with technology and technological development that are cause for worry and raise normative questions cannot in a meaningful way be related to the actions of individual people; they are collective actions that may be matters of social choice. Two aspects need to be distinguished. First, the consequences of technological decisions concerning the design, implementation and use of technological products typically emerge only at the aggregate level of society far removed from the actual decision-making, and are almost impossible to foresee and to link to particular decisions (see also Section 3.2.2). Second, even the decision-making itself—which includes the decision-making involved in responding to the societal consequences of technology as they emerge, in particular attempts to control them—takes place in collective bodies such as companies, regulatory institutions and local, national and supra-national governments. For analysing such collective decision-making the individualistic framework of ethics seems inadequate. It is increasingly recognized that next to an ethics of technology also a political philosophy of technology, which focuses on institutional rather than individual agency, should be developed. We address issues of a political nature below in Sections 3.2.2, 3.2.4 and 3.2.5.

3.2 Some Recurrent Themes in the Ethics of Technology

We now turn to the description of some specific themes in the ethics of technology. We focus on a number of general themes that provide an illustration of general issues in the ethics of technology and the way these are treated.

3.2.1 Does Technology Have Moral Agency?

In Sections 2.3 and 3.1 the debate on whether technology can be considered a neutral instrument or whether it is value-laden or embodies values was mentioned, where the latter seems the majority position. Among the philosophers who adopt this position, some have sought to ground this value-ladenness in the claim that technology has moral agency. Latour (1992, 2002), in particular, has suggested that human moral agency and technological agency are symmetrical because, first, human action is not only mediated but substantially altered by technology (2002: 252) and, second, anything that makes a difference to a system is an agent. Verbeek (2011) follows Latour’s influential thesis that technology significantly influences (‘mediates’) human action but rejects the full symmetry of human moral agency and technological agency that Latour implies.

The crux is how the very notion of agency ought to be understood. On standard accounts in moral philosophy, moral agency is tightly connected to intentional agency and often to the capacity for moral reasoning and responsibility. Much of the debate about technological moral agency turns on whether these connections should be loosened or redefined.

Positive claims about the moral agency of technology usually depend either on (i) loosening standard criteria for intentional agency (e.g., treating causal efficacy or simple goal-directedness as sufficient for ‘agency’), or (ii) decoupling moral agency from intentional agency altogether, as in ‘mind-less moral agency’ accounts. While Latour exemplifies the former, Floridi and Sanders (2004) exemplify the latter approach. They explicitly reject the notion that moral agency requires intentional agency and then defend the thesis that technology can be a moral agent.

More recently, List (2025), drawing on a version of Dennett’s intentional stance (1987), argues that it is possible that AI systems be considered genuine intentional agents insofar as their observable behavior is best interpreted in that light and accordingly, since moral agency is tied to intentionality and control, that there is no in-principle bar to some AI systems eventually qualifying as moral agents. What remains contested is whether we should adopt such intentionalist criteria or the more revisionary, non-intentionalist criteria proposed by Floridi and Sanders, Latour, and others. Moreover, such expansive accounts leaves open the questions whether AI systems could also bear moral responsibility, and what appropriate reactive attitudes toward them are.

Alternatively, some researchers (e.g. Nyholm 2018) have argued that moral agency remains firmly rooted in human activity and that technology should not be understood as a distinct moral agent but rather as a tool or collaborator whose agency is directed and managed by the human agent.

In practice, talk of ‘technologies as moral agents’ often functions less as a precise metaphysical or conceptual thesis and more as a rhetorical way of insisting that technologies are not morally neutral. This risks conflating several distinct ideas: that technologies are value-laden (which we covered above), that they shape human action, and that they themselves meet criteria for moral agency. Moreover, as we have seen above, technology can be value-laden in other ways than by having moral agency (see, e.g., Klenk 2021). One could, for example, claim that technology enables (or even invites) and constrains (or even inhibits) certain human actions and the attainment of certain human goals and therefore is to some extent value-laden, without claiming moral agency for technical artifacts. A good overview of the debate can be found in (Kroes and Verbeek 2014).

If the step from intentional to moral agency involves further criteria, what are those, and can or does technology fulfill them? The field of machine ethics debates whether and what it takes to imbue moral sensitivity, as a criterion for moral agency, into technology. More recently, the debate about artificial moral advisors bears on questions about moral agency. However, even if it were to become possible to design genuinely moral artificial agents, it may be questioned whether it is morally desirable to do so (Bostrom and Yudkowsky 2014; van Wynsberghe and Robbins 2019).

Apart from the question whether intelligent artificial agents can have moral agency, there are (broader) questions about their moral status; for example would they—and if so under what conditions—qualify as moral patients, to which humans have certain moral obligations. Traditionally, moral status is connected to consciousness, but a number of authors have proposed more minimal criteria for moral status, particularly for (social) robots. For example, Danaher (2020) has suggested that behavioristic criteria might suffice whereas Coeckelbergh (2014) and Gunkel (2018) have suggested a relational approach. Mosakas (2021) has argued that such approaches do not ground moral status, and hence humans have no direct moral duties towards social robots (although they may still be morally relevant in other ways). Others have raised the concern that social robots may deceive us into believing they have certain cognitive and emotional capabilities (that might give them moral status) while they have not (Sharkey and Sharkey 2021).

3.2.2 Control and Responsibility

Responsibility has always been a central theme in the ethics of technology. Traditionally, philosophers were pessimistic about the possibility of engineers to assume responsibility for the technologies they developed. Ellul, for example, has characterized engineers as the high priests of technology, who cherish technology but cannot steer it. Hans Jonas (1979 [1984]) has argued that technology requires an ethics in which responsibility is the central imperative because of two related reasons: first, because of his conviction that technology now allows humanity to destroy the earth and itself, for instance through atomic weapons, as well as re-engineering nature and humanity, for instance through biotechnology; second, because modern technology is increasingly led by social and political forces that tend to escape the control of individuals, such as high-level economic and political interests and the push to scientific competition.

In engineering professional ethics, codes of ethics articulate the responsibilities of engineers towards employers, and clients as well as the public and society, typically in relation to their safety, health and welfare. However, as has been pointed out by several authors (Nissenbaum 1996; Johnson and Powers 2005; Swierstra and Jelsma 2006), it may be hard to pinpoint individual responsibility in engineering insofar as the conditions for the legitimate attribution of individual responsibility discussed in philosophical literature (freedom to act, knowledge, and causality) are often not met by individual engineers. The freedom of engineers is strongly limited by hierarchical or market constraints, and negative consequences may be very hard or impossible to predict beforehand. The causality condition is also often difficult to meet due to the long and complex chain of research and development. Davis (2012) maintains that despite such difficulties individual engineers can and do take responsibility. A related debate is the one about so-called ‘dual-use’, that is, to what extent scientists and engineers can and should take responsibility for undesirable, typically military, uses of technology (Rath, Ischi, and Perkins 2014).

Another relevant topic in this area is the so-called Problem of Many Hands (PMH). The term was first coined by Dennis Thompson (1980) in relation to the responsibility of public officials, and concerns the ascription of individual responsibility in collective settings where knowledge and control are distributed across many actors. Addressing the PMH arguably requires a structural approach focused on the design of institutions that promote virtuous behavior and practices in organizations (van de Poel, Royakkers and Zwart 2015).

Yet another way of capturing the problem of control and responsibility over technology is offered by the ‘dilemma of control’ (Collingridge 1980) (also referred to as the ‘Collingridge dilemma’), according to which control by society over (the consequences of) technological development is difficult because at the earlier stages of technological development there is higher control over outcomes but lower capacity to predict them, while at later stages, increased knowledge is accompanied by a decreased control, due to the stronger embedding of technology in society and the vested interests of investors and developers. Collingridge proposed to make the innovation process more corrigible and reversible as well as making developers and policy makers more accountable for technological choices. Because of this, Collingridge has been credited for anticipating some topics of the more recent literature on Responsible Research and Innovation (Genus and Stirling 2018; see also Sections 3.1 and 3.2.4).

Discussions over responsibility for technology have allowed for clarification of the notion of responsibility itself. Ladd (1991), Davis (2012), Doorn (2012) Klenk and Sand (2020) in different ways argue for a notion of responsibility that focuses less on blame and more on a forward-looking, virtuous and possibly collective notion of responsibility as more suitable for the engineering profession and technological development more generally.

The debates on control and responsibility over technology have enjoyed a renaissance with the recent development of AI, and in particular so-called machine-learning systems that can learn and adapt their behavior beyond their original programming thereby preventing prediction and control. New concerns have emerged about a possible ‘responsibility gap’ (Matthias 2004), situations in which it may be increasingly difficult if not impossible to legitimately hold humans blameworthy for the actions of ‘learning automata’. New broader concerns have been raised—also among experts—about AI systems spinning out of control and endangering the survival itself of humanity (Russell 2019, Bostrom 2014).

In applied ethics of technology, issues of human control and responsibility gaps have been first discussed in relation to so-called ‘lethal autonomous weapon systems’ (Sparrow 2007). The notion of ‘meaningful human control’ over AI-driven systems has been proposed to protect human dignity, safety and responsibility (NGO Art. 36). Recent literature has given the idea of ‘meaningful human control’ a more solid philosophical content (Santoni de Sio and van den Hoven 2018) and broadened the scope of its application to other sensitive domains like transportation and healthcare (Mecacci et al. 2024). Also, the notion of ‘responsibility gaps with AI’ has been expanded from gaps in blame and liability to cover also gaps in moral and political accountability as well as in the capacity of different actors to take the responsibility to create future, societally beneficial, AI systems (Santoni de Sio and Mecacci 2021). Nyholm (2018) argued that many alleged cases of responsibility gaps are better understood in terms collaborative human-technology agency. Framed as an issue of attributing responsibility for collaborations among many agents, the responsibility gap with AI is also clearly connected to the Problem of Many Hands (Constantinescu and Kaptein 2025).

3.2.3 Technological Risks

The risks of technology are one of the traditional ethical concerns in the ethics of technology. Risks raise not only ethical issues but other philosophical issues, such as epistemological and decision-theoretical issues (Roeser, Hillerbrand, Sandin and Peterson 2012; and the entry on risk).

Technological risks are usually defined as the product of the probability of an undesirable event and the effect of that event, although there are also other definitions (see Risk). In general it seems desirable to keep technological risks as small as possible. The larger the risk, the larger either the likeliness or the impact of an undesirable event is. Risk reduction therefore is an important goal in technological development and engineering codes of ethics often attribute a responsibility to engineers in reducing risks and designing safe products. Still, risk reduction is not always feasible or desirable. It is sometimes not feasible, because there are no absolutely safe products and technologies. But even if risk reduction is feasible it may not be desirable from a moral point of view as reducing risk often comes at a cost, and these costs may be so high that they are not worth it.

Risk evaluation is carried out in a number of ways. One possible approach is to judge the acceptability of technological risks by comparing them to other risks. One could, for example, compare technological risks with naturally occurring risks. This approach, however, runs the danger of committing a naturalistic fallacy: naturally occurring risks may (sometimes) be unavoidable but that does not necessarily make them morally acceptable. A second approach to risk evaluation is risk-cost benefit analysis, which is based on weighing the risks against the benefits of an activity or against the costs of doing nothing. Risk-benefit analysis has been criticized from a philosophical and ethical point of view (Hansson 2007). A third approach is to base risk acceptance on the (informed) consent of people who bear the risks after they have been informed about these risks (e.g. Martin and Schinzinger 2022). A problem of this approach is that technological risks usually affect a large number of people. Informed consent may therefore lead to a “society of stalemates” (Hansson 2003: 300).

Questions about acceptable risk may also be framed in terms of risking, i.e. taking risks or imposing risks on others. For risk imposition, the core question is under what conditions it is acceptable for some agent A to impose a risk on some other agent B. In the literature various normative criteria or principles have been proposed to judge the acceptability of risk impositions, including the following:

  • “Exposure of a person to a risk is acceptable if and only if the total benefits that the exposure gives rise to outweigh the total risks, measured as the probability-weighted disutility of outcomes.” (the traditional criterion in risk analysis according to Hansson (2003: 306)).
  • “Exposure of a person to a risk is acceptable if and only if this exposure is part of an equitable social system of risk-taking that works to her advantage.” (Hansson 2003: 305).
  • Imposition of a risk is acceptable to the extent it does not harm the risk-bearer (e.g., Placani 2017).
  • Imposition of a risk is acceptable to the extent that it does not reduce the overall freedom of the risk-bearer (Ferretti 2016).
  • Imposition of a risk is acceptable to the extent it does not infringe on the autonomy of the risk bearer (Oberdiek 2017).
  • Imposition of a risk is acceptable to the extent that the negative effects of the risk, when it materializes can (either) be reversed, repaired or compensated (Hayenhjelm 2018).
  • Imposition of a risk is acceptable to the extent that the risk imposition is non-dominating , i.e., if it does not allow the risk imposer to exercise their arbitrary power over the range of safe options that the risk-bearer are in a position to choose from (Maheshwari and Nyholm 2022).

Some authors have criticized the focus on risks in the ethics of technology. One strand of criticism argues that we often lack the knowledge to reliably assess the risks of a new technology before it has come into use. We often do not know the probability that something might go wrong, and sometimes we even do not know, or at least not fully, what might go wrong and what possible negative consequences may be. To deal with this, some authors have proposed to conceive of the introduction of new technology in society as a social experiment and have urged to think about the conditions under which such experiments are morally acceptable (Martin and Schinzinger 2022; van de Poel 2016).

Another strand of criticism states that the focus on risks has led to a reduction of the impacts of technology that are considered (Swierstra and te Molder 2012). Only impacts related to safety and health, which can be calculated as risks, are considered, whereas ‘soft’ impacts, for example of a social or psychological nature, are neglected, thereby impoverishing the moral evaluation of new technologies.

3.2.4 Power and Justice

Historically, the idea of analysing technology through the lenses of social power and justice goes back to Karl Marx, who, in The Poverty of Philosophy (1847), famously wrote: “The hand-mill gives you society with the feudal lord; the steam-mill, society with the industrial capitalist” (2000: 219–220). While it is a debated topic whether Marx was claiming that technology itself determines the social and political structure of society (Shaw 1978, Bimber 1990), he certainly claimed that the material structure of production in society, in which technology plays a major role, shapes social and political structures of power, and therefore technology is an important topic for political studies. Similarly, Langdon Winner has argued that “artifacts have politics” (Winner 1980). According to him, some technologies are inherently normative or political because they embody specific forms of power and authority or require or are strongly compatible with certain social and political relations. Railroads or nuclear energy, for example, seem to require a certain authoritative management structure. In other cases, technologies may be political due to the particular way they have been designed and deployed, that is the value system and the structure of power they reflect.

Marx also claimed in the Theses on Feuerbach (2000: 171–174) that “Philosophers have only interpreted the world in various ways; the point is to change it”. Inspired by this thesis, some different approaches have called for a ‘critical approach’ to technology, one that not only analyses the socio-political structure embedded in and supported by technology but also shapes the conceptual and political tools to change these structures. A common ideal is that of the emancipation of the groups that are currently harmed, oppressed, exploited or marginalized by tech-supported unjust social structures of power. One very influential stream of ‘critical theory’ directly inspired by Marx is the so-called Frankfurt School born in the 1950s. One author in this tradition who has thoroughly engaged the interplay between capitalism and technology has been Andrew Feenberg (1991).

More recent approaches directly inspired by Marx have proposed a revised theory of exploitation in connection with (digital) technology (Fuchs and Mosco 2016), and developed the idea of ‘general intellect’ present in the later Marx (‘Fragment on the machine’) to develop the idea of ‘cognitive capitalism’, a new historical era in which, thanks to scientific and technological development, information, knowledge and skills have become the new capital whose control determines the distribution of power (Vercellone 2007).

Other, critical theories of technology are those inspired by Michel Foucault’s analyses of ‘disciplinary power’ made possible in industrialized societies by automation, bureaucratization, and organization of information (Foucault 1975 [1977]) and, more recently, Gilles Deleuze’s theory of the ‘societies of control’ (Deleuze 1992), which, compared to Foucault, presents power as more fluidly organized and transmitted also thanks to modern digital technologies developed by private corporates. For a review of recent approaches in this area see Galič et al. (2017).

Another important stream of literature on power and technology is that inspired by feminist philosophy emphasizing that technology not only does have politics, but also gender, insofar as its development has so far strongly reflected the power and ideology of men in Western patriarchal societies (Wajcman 1991, 2010). At the same time, according to Donna Haraway, a new attention to the materially and socially constructed nature of human identity and the situated nature of knowledge may allow for new technologically mediated emancipatory practices (Haraway 1991).

To address issues of power in technology, a number of philosophers have pleaded for a democratization of technological development and the inclusion of ordinary people in the shaping of technology (Winner 1983; Sclove 1995; Feenberg 1999). Such ideas are also echoed in recent interdisciplinary approaches, such as Responsible Research and Innovation (RRI), that aim at opening up the innovation process to a broader range of stakeholders and concerns (Owen, Bessant and Heintz 2013). Some design scholars and social scientists have, however, argued that a deeper and more radical democratization is necessary (DiSalvo 2012), in which (marginalized) communities not only to participate in deliberation about technology within the current innovation process, but also more radically contest the structure of this process, in line with a more experimental (Dewey 1946) or even adversarial conception of democracy (Mouffe 2009); or even to take the lead in the process, according to the ideal of ‘design justice’ (Costanza-Chok 2020).

Issues of power and democracy have recently been raised in relation to digital technologies such as social media, algorithms and more generally Artificial Intelligence (AI), such as threats to democracy (from e.g. social media), the power of Big Tech companies, and new forms of exploitation, domination and colonialism that may come with AI (e.g., Coeckelbergh 2022; Susskind 2022; Zuboff 2017; Adams 2021).

Another important emerging theme is justice, which does not just encompass distributive justice (Rawls 1999), but also recognition justice (Fraser and Honneth 2003) and procedural justice. Questions about justice have not only been raised by digital technologies, but also by technologies targeted towards climate change mitigation, e.g., geoengineering. and energy technologies, and new notions have been coined like climate justice (Caney 2014) energy justice (Jenkins, McCauley, Heffron, Stephan and Rehner 2016) and spatial justice (Soja 2010).

3.2.5 Deception, Persuasion, Manipulation, and Coercion: The Ethics of Technological Influence

A further cross-cutting theme concerns the ways technologies shape human attitudes, choices, and behavior. The ethics of technological influence addresses how technologies do so, and how to distinguish permissible from impermissible forms of such shaping.

Much work in the philosophy of technology can be framed in terms of influence. Technological determinism highlights how technologies structure social practices; Latour’s account of technological mediation similarly stresses how artefacts co-produce action when humans ‘delegate’ tasks to them (Latour 2002). What is at stake is not simply that technologies influence us, but how, and whether such influence is normatively acceptable (see also Section 2.3).

Recent work has shifted precisely in that direction. Digital technologies—through continuous data collection, personalization, and adaptivity—make influence more targeted, opaque, and effective, which raises concerns about autonomy, consent, and control. For example, recommender systems on social media and e-commerce platforms tailor content and options to users on the basis of behavioral data, while the criteria and aims guiding these recommendations often remain opaque to those users (see, e.g., Milano et al. 2020).

A common starting point distinguishes persuasion, manipulation, and coercion (Beauchamp 1984; cf. Klenk 2024). Persuasion typically involves an open appeal to a person’s deliberative capacities. Philosophers often treat persuasion as permissible, though see (Mitchell and Douglas 2024). In contrast, social scientists and user-experience (UX) designers sometimes use the term more neutrally. Coercion restricts the range of acceptable options by threats or strong incentives. Manipulation is often placed somewhere between persuasion and coercion. While the tripartite model is useful heuristically, not all non-persuasive, non-coercive influence is manipulative (see the entry on the ethics of manipulation). Consequently, more substantive accounts have been proposed. Susser, Roessler and Nissenbaum (2019), in an influential discussion of ‘online manipulation’, define manipulation as hidden influence: the covert subversion of another’s decision-making by exploiting vulnerabilities. This account has been criticized for excluding visible dark patterns and for mischaracterizing manipulation in non-technological contexts (Klenk 2022).

Although these conceptual distinctions are not new, digital technologies provide fertile ground for examining them. A first example concerns persuasive technologies, interactive systems explicitly designed to change attitudes or behavior. Work on such technologies (e.g. Fogg 2002) analyses how websites, apps, and devices intentionally nudge users toward particular goals, prompting ethical discussion on the boundaries of legitimate design influence (Berdichevsky and Neuenschwander 1999; Spahn 2012). This debate connects to the broader literature on nudging, where a ‘nudge’ is a change in the choice environment that predictably influences behavior but remains easy to resist (Thaler and Sunstein 2008; Yeung 2017).

A second example is the extensive discussion of ‘dark patterns’, interface designs that exploit cognitive biases to steer users toward specific choices, such as unwanted subscriptions or excessive data disclosure (Brignull 2023). Competing accounts seek to distinguish dark patterns from acceptable forms of influence (Mathur, Kshirsagar and Mayer 2021; Timms 2025), and regulatory debates increasingly classify them as manipulative rather than merely persuasive or commercially creative.

A third important class of cases involves personalized and emotionally targeted influence through, for instance, social media, targeted advertising, recommender systems, and ‘microtargeting’. Algorithmic systems tailor content to inferred preferences, vulnerabilities, or affective states (e.g. the debate around Kramer 2014; Burr and Cristianini 2019). Susser, Roessler and Nussenbaum (2019) argue that such ‘invisible influence’ increases susceptibility to manipulation because the relevant mediation occurs below conscious awareness. Jongepier and Wieland (2022) contend that some forms of targeted influence express a kind of disrespect toward their targets. Wider concerns about algorithmic polarization, disinformation, and the political effects of recommender systems can be understood as further instances of these worries.

These developments have prompted regulatory responses, such as the EU’s AI Act, which prohibits certain manipulative practices, and they have stimulated more fine-grained philosophical work on manipulation and technological influence (see Klenk and Jongepier 2022 for an overview). One line of debate asks whether concepts such as deception, manipulation, or coercion—developed primarily for interpersonal contexts—apply straightforwardly to human-technology and human-AI interaction. Some propose unified normative accounts that cover both human and algorithmic manipulation, for instance by treating manipulation as a form of norm-violating or negligent influence (Klenk 2022). Others argue that AI deception and manipulation should be characterized differently from their human counterparts because of the distinct mechanisms involved (Tarsney 2025).

Another line of debate asks whether technologies generate genuinely new forms of influence. Some authors argue that technologies primarily exacerbate existing concerns (Cappuccio, Sandis and Wyatt 2022), whereas others claim that certain large-scale or emergent system behaviors introduce new forms of manipulation without intent (Pham, Rubel and Castro 2022). Relatedly, Susskind (2018) suggests that digital technologies may replace some forms of coercion with force: the structural foreclosure of options rather than threats contingent on choosing them. Methodological questions arise as well, including how to categories types of influence and how to evaluate them in normative analysis (Barnhill 2022; Klenk and Hancock 2019).

These debates also involve questions of technological agency (Section 3.2.1). If manipulation requires one agent covertly shaping another’s decision-making, whether technologies can manipulate depends on whether they qualify as agents in the relevant sense. Some argue that talk of ‘manipulative technologies’ is merely shorthand for manipulative human uses of technology (Noggle 2025), while others maintain that advanced AI systems may themselves count as manipulators for regulatory or practical purposes (Pepp, Sterken, McKeever and Michaelson 2022).

Finally, the ethics of technological influence intersects with themes of power and justice (Section 3.2.4). Highly effective and opaque forms of influence are often concentrated in a small number of corporate or state actors, raising questions about domination, democratic legitimacy, and structural injustice, as well as autonomy and consent.

Debates on persuasive technologies, dark patterns, and online manipulation thus illustrate the increasing need for a systematic account of permissible and impermissible forms of technological influence, which then needs inform reflection about appropriate design requirements (e.g., Gabriel et al. 2024 [Other Internet Resources]).

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Journals

Encyclopedias

  • Encyclopedia of Science, Technology, and Ethics, 4 volumes, Carl Mitcham (ed.), Macmillan, 2005.
  • Encyclopedia of Applied Ethics, second edition, 4 volumes, Ruth Chadwick (editor-in-chief), Elsevier, 2012.

Other Internet Resources

Cited Resources

Acknowledgments

As of the 2026 update, Maarten Franssen and Ibo van de Poel have been joined by Michael Klenk and Filippo Santoni de Sio for the purpose of updating and maintaining this entry. Gert-Jan Lokhorst has stepped back from work on this entry and is no longer listed as an author. While the entry still bears his influence, the material he wrote himself is no longer present. The authors wish to thank several anonymous reviewers for contributing many helpful suggestions over the course of time.

Copyright © 2026 by
Maarten Franssen <m.franssen@worldonline.nl>
Ibo van de Poel <I.R.vandepoel@tudelft.nl>
Michael Klenk <m.b.klenk@outlook.com>
Filippo Santoni de Sio <f.santoni.de.sio@tue.nl>

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