b. 27 August 1947 Chicago, Illinois, U.S.A.
American citizen with permanent residency in U.K.
Married
B.A. in History (Departmental Honors with Great Distinction and University Honors with Great Distinction): University of California at Berkeley, 1969
M.A. in History: Columbia University, 1970
M.Phil in History: Columbia University, 1973
Ph.D in History (with distinction): Columbia University, 1991
Professor of the History of Renaissance Philosophy: 2004–
Reader in the History of Renaissance Philosophy: 1999–2004
Librarian: October 2002–
Visiting Professor, Seminar für Geistesgeschichte und Philosophie der Renaissance, Ludwig-Maximilians Universität, Munich, June-July 2002
Senior Lecturer in the History of Philosophy at the Warburg Institute: 1996–1998
Lecturer in the History of Philosophy at the Warburg Institute: 1987–1996
Assistant Librarian (Academic) at the Warburg Institute: 1974–1986
‘Francesco Filelfo's Lost Letter De ideis’, Journal of the Warburg and Courtauld Institutes, 42 (1979), pp. 236–49
‘Francesco Filelfo on Emotions, Virtues and Vices: A Re-examination of his Sources’, Bibliothéqued'humanisme et Renaissance, 43 (1981), pp. 129–40
‘Cicero, Stoicism and Textual Criticism: Poliziano on κατóρθωμα’, Rinascimento, 23 (1983), pp. 79–110
‘The Pseudo-Aristotelian Theology in Sixteenth- and Seventeenth-Century Europe’ in Pseudo-Aristotle in the Middle Ages: The ‘Theology’ and Other Texts, ed. J. Kraye, W.F. Ryan, and C.B. Schmitt, London, 1986, pp. 265–86
‘Moral Philosophy’ in The Cambridge History of Renaissance Philosophy, gen. ed. C.B. Schmitt; ed. Q. Skinner and E. Kessler; assoc. ed. J. Kraye, Cambridge, 1988, pp. 303–86
‘Daniel Heinsius and the Author of De mundo’, in The Uses of Greek and Latin: Historical Essays, ed. A. C. Dionisotti, A. T. Grafton and J. Kraye, London, 1988, pp. 171–97
‘Aristotle’s God and the Authenticity of De mundo: An Early Modern Controversy’, Journal of the History of Philosophy, 28 (1990), pp. 339–58
‘Erasmus and the Canonization of Aristotle: The Letter to John More’, in England and the Continental Renaissance: Essays in Honour of J. B. Trapp, ed. E. Chaney and P. Mack, Woodbridge, 1990, pp. 37–52
‘Alexander of Aphrodisias, Gianfrancesco Beati and the Problem of Metaphysics Α’, in Renaissance Society and Culture: Essays in Honor of Eugene F. Rice, jr., ed. J. Monfasani and R. Musto, New York, 1991, pp. 137–60
‘History of Western Ethics: The Renaissance’, in Encyclopediaof Ethics, ed. L. C. Becker, New York and London, 1992; reprinted (with additional bibliography) in A History of Western Ethics, ed. L. C. Becker, New York and London, 1992, pp. 63–79
‘The Philosophy of the Italian Renaissance’ in The Routledge History of Philosophy, vol. IV, ed. G. H. R. Parkinson, London and New York, 1993, pp. 16–69
‘The Transformation of Platonic Love in the Italian Renaissance’ in Platonism and the English Imagination, ed. A. Baldwin and S. Hutton, Cambridge, 1994, pp. 76–85; reprinted in The Renaissance in Europe: A Reader, ed. K. Whitlock (New Haven and London, 2000), pp. 81–7
‘Like Father, Like Son: Aristotle, Nicomachus and the Nicomachean Ethics’, in Aristotelicaet Lulliana magistro doctissimo Charles H. Lohr septuagesimum annum feliciter agenti dedicata, ed. R. Imbach, F. Dominguez, T. Pindl-Büchel, P. Walter, Turnhout, 1995, pp. 155–80
‘Renaissance Commentaries on the Nicomachean Ethics’, in The Vocabulary of Teaching and Research between Middle Ages and Renaissance, Proceedings of the Colloquium: London, Warburg Institute, 11–12 March 1994, ed. O. Weijers, CIVICIMA: Études sur le vocabulaire du moyen âge, VIII, Turnhout, 1995, pp. 96–117
‘The Printing History of Aristotle in the Fifteenth Century: A Bibliographical Approach to Renaissance Philosophy’, Renaissance Studies, 9 (1995), pp. 189–211
Entries on G. Bruno, M. Ficino, G. Pico della Mirandola, P. Pomponazzi and L. Valla in The Oxford Companion to Philosophy, ed. T. Honderich (Oxford, 1995)
‘Philologists and Philosophers’, in The Cambridge Companion to Renaissance Humanism, ed. J. Kraye, Cambridge, 1996, pp. 142–60
‘Lorenzo and the Philosophers’, in Lorenzo the Magnificent: Culture and Politics in Medicean Florence, ed. M. Mallett and N. Mann (Warburg Institute Colloquia, 3), London, 1996, pp. 151–66
Seven entries on humanists and philosophers (Angelo Decembrio, Bartolomeo Fazio, Marsilio Ficino, Cristoforo Landino, Justus Lipsius, Agostino Nifo and Angelo Poliziano) in The Dictionary of Art, ed. J. S. Turner, 34 vols (London and New York, 1996); reprinted in Encyclopedia of Italian Renaissance & Mannerist Art, ed. J. S. Turner (London and New York, 2000).
‘Melanchthons ethische Kommentare und Lehrbücher’, in Melanchthon und das Lehrbuch des 16. Jahrhunderts, ed. J. Leonhardt (Rostock, 1997), pp. 195–214
Five translations in Cambridge Translations of Renaissance Philosophical Texts, ed. J. Kraye, 2 vols (Cambridge, 1997), vol. I: Moral Philosophy, pp. 47–87, 192–99
‘Conceptions of Moral Philosophy’ in The Cambridge History of Seventeenth-Century Philosophy, ed. D. Garber and M. Ayers, 2 vols (Cambridge, 1998), II, pp. 1279–1316
Philosophy: Ancient, Medieval and Modern, Units 26–8 of Incunabula, The Printing Revolution in Europe 1455–1500 (Research Publications Inc., 1998)
‘The Contribution of Renaissance Humanists to the Neostoic Revival’, Wạtki neostoickie w literaturze polskiego renesansu i baroku. (Papers of the conference Neostoicyzm w literaturze i kulturze staropolskiej, Szczecin, 20–22 October 1997), ed. Piotr Urbanski (Szczecin, 1999), pp. 15–41. (Published in Polish translation as ‘Wkład renesansowych humanistów w odrodzenie neostoicyzmu’, Odrodzenie i Reformacja w Polsce, 42, 1998, pp. 5–23)
‘Stoicism and Epicureanism: Philosophical Revival and Literary Repercussions’, The Cambridge History of Literary Criticism, vol. III, ed. G. P. Norton (Cambridge, 1999), pp. 458–65.
‘Pietro Pomponazzi (1462–1525): Weltlicher Aristotelismus in der Renaissance’, in Philosophen der Renaissance: Eine Einführung, ed. P. R. Blum (Darmstadt, 1999), pp. 87–103.
‘“Ethnicorum omnium sanctissimus”: Marcus Aurelius and His Meditations from Xylander to Diderot’, in Humanism and Early Modern Philosophy, ed. J. Kraye and M. Stone, London Studies in the History of Philosophy, 1 (London, 2000), pp. 107–34
‘Classical Scholarship’, ‘Moral Philosophy’ and ‘Stoicism’, in The Encyclopedia of the Renaissance, ed. P. F. Grendler, 6 vols (New York, 1999)
‘Sir Richard Barckley’, in Dictionary of Seventeenth-Century British Philosophers, ed. Andrew Pyle 2 vols (Bristol, 2000)
‘The Immortality of the Soul in the Renaissance: Between Natural Philosophy and Theology’, Signatures, 30 November 2000, pp. 51–68
‘In Praise of Reason: From Humanism to Descartes’, in The Discovery of Happiness, ed. S. McCready (London: MQ Publications, 2001), pp. 136–51
‘L’interprétation platonicienne de l’Enchiridion d’Épictète proposée par Politien: Philologie et philosophie dans la Florence du XVème siècle, à la fin des années 70’, in Penserentre les lignes: Philologie et philosophie au Quattrocento, ed. F. Mariani Zini (Villeneuve d’Ascq: Presses Universitaires du Septentrion, 2001), pp. 161–77
‘Lorenzo Valla and Changing Perceptions of Renaissance Humanism’, Comparative Criticism, 23 (2001), pp. 37–55.
‘Ficino in the Firing Line: A Renaissance Neoplatonist and his Critics’, in MarsilioFicino 1433–1499: His Sources, His Circle, His Legacy, ed. M. J. B. Allen and V. Rees (Leiden: Brill, 2001), pp. 377–97
‘Humanism’, in The Oxford Companion to the Body, ed. C. Blakemore and S. Jennett (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2001), p. 368
‘Neo-Stoicism’, in Encyclopedia of Ethics, second edition, ed. L. C. Becker and C. B. Becker, 3 vols (Routledge: London and New York, 2001), II, pp. 1228–32
‘Renaissance Philosophy: Between the Late Middle Ages and Early Modern Era’, Internationale Zeitschrift für Philosophie (2001), pp. 187–98
‘Stoicism in the Renaissance from Petrarch to Lipsius’, Grotiana, n.s. 22–3 (2001–2002), pp. 3–27
Classical Traditions in Renaissance Philosophy, Variorum Collected Studies Series (Aldershot: Ashgate, 2002)
‘Eclectic Aristotelianism in the Moral Philosophy of Francesco Piccolomini’, in La presenza dell'aristotelismo padovano nella filosofia moderna della prima modernitá, ed. G. Piaia (Rome and Padua: Antenore, 2002), pp. 57–82
‘British Philosophy before Locke’, in A Companion to Early Modern Philosophy, ed. S. Nadler (Oxford: Blackwell Publishing, 2002), pp. 283–97
‘La filosofia nelle universitá italiane del XVI secolo’ in Le filosofie del Rinascimento, ed. C. Vasoli (Milan: Paravia Bruno Mondadori, 2002), pp. 350–73
21 entries for The Oxford Companion to Italian Literature, ed. David Robey and Peter Hainsworth (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2002)
‘The Role of Medieval Philosophy in Renaissance Thought: The Evidence of Early Printed Books’, in Bilan et perspectives des études médiévales (1993–1999). Actes du deuxième Congrès européen d’Études Médiévales, Barcelone (8–12 juin 1999), ed. J. Hamesse (Turnhout, 2004), pp. 695–714
‘The Legacy of Ancient Philosophy’, in The Cambridge Companion to Greek and Roman Philosophy, ed. D. Sedley (Cambridge, 2003), pp. 323–52
Articles in Oxford Dictionary of National Biography (Oxford, 2004), XXVI, pp. 792–3 (Haly Heron); XXXVI, pp. 942–3 (James Martin); XLII, pp. 451–2 (Thomas Palfreyman); XLXI, pp. 228–9 (Charles B. Schmitt)
‘The Humanist as Moral Philosopher: Marc-Antoine Muret’s 1585 Edition of Seneca’, in Moral Philosophy on the Threshold of Modernity, ed. J. Kraye and R. Saarinen (Dordrecht: Springer, 2005), pp. 307–30.
‘Pagan Virtue in Pursuit of Christian Happiness: Renaissance Humanists and the Revival of Classical Ethics’, in Zeichen – Rituale – Werte. Internationales Kolloquium des Sonderforschungsbereichs 496 an der Westfälischen Wilhelms-Universität Münster, ed. G. Althoff (Münster: Rhema, 2004), pp. 55–68.
‘Philosophy, Moral: Medieval and Renaissance’, in New Dictionary of the History of Ideas, ed. M. Cline Horowitz (Detroit etc.: Charles Scribner’s Sons, 2005), IV, pp. 1790–2.
‘Pseudo-Aristotle’, in Medieval Science, Technology, and Medicine: An Encyclopedia, ed. T. Glick, S. J. Livesey and F. Wallis (New York and London: Routledge, 2005), pp. 423–5.
‘Humanism’, in The Encyclopedia of Philosophy, second edition, ed. D. M. Borchert (Detroit MI: MacMillan Reference Books, 2006), IV, pp. 477–81
‘Philology, Moral Philosophy and Religion in Thomas Gataker’s Edition of Marcus Aurelius’s Meditations (1652)’, in Ethik – Wissenschaft oder Lebenskunst? Modelle der Normenbegründung von der Antike bis zur Frühen Neuzeit, ed. S. Ebbersmeyer and E. Kessler (Münster etc.: LIT Verlag, 2007), pp. 293–307
‘The Revival of Hellenistic Philosophies’, in The Cambridge Companion to Renaissance Philosophy, ed. J. Hankins (Cambridge, 2007), pp. 97–112
‘Senecanismus’, Historisches Wörterbuch der Rhetorik, ed. G. Ueding, VIII (Tübingen, 2007), cols 826–41
‘Pico on the Relationship of Rhetoric and Philosophy’, in Pico della Mirandola: New Essays, ed. Michael Dougherty (Cambridge, 2008), pp. 13–36
‘Teaching Stoic Moral Philosophy: Kaspar Schoppe’s Elementa philosophiae Stoicae moralis (1606)’, in Scholarly Knowledge: Textbooks in Early Modern Europe, ed. E. Campi, S. De Angelis, A.-S. Goeing and A. T. Grafton (Geneva, 2008), pp. 249–83
‘From Medieval to Early Modern Stoicism’, in Continuities and Disruptions between the Middle Ages and the Renaissance, Proceedings of the colloquium held at the Warburg Institute, 15–16 July 2007, ed. C. Burnett, J. Meirinhos and J. Hamesse (Louvain-la-Neuve, 2008), pp. 1–23
‘Italy, France and the Classical Tradition: The Origins of the Philological Commentary on the Nicomachean Ethics’, in Italy and the Classical Tradition: Language, Thought and Poetry 1300–1600, ed. C. Caruso and A. Laird (London, 2009), pp. 118–40
‘Pietro Pomponazzi (1462–1525): Secular Aristotelianism in the Renaissance’, in Philosophers of the Renaissance, ed. Paul Richard Blum (Washington DC, 2010), pp. 92–115 [revised version of ‘Pietro Pomponazzi (1462–1525): Weltlicher Aristotelismus in der Renaissance’, in Philosophen der Renaissance: Eine Einführung, ed. P. R. Blum (Darmstadt, 1999), pp. 87–103]
Seven entries in Oxford Dictionary of the Middle Ages, ed. R. E. Bjork (Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press, 2010), I, pp. 43 (Jacques Almain), 226 (Ermolao Barbaro), 253 (Cardinal Bessarion); III, 981–2 (Jacques Lefèvre d’Étaples), 1334 (Pietro Pomponazzi); IV, p. 1693 (Johannes Versor)
‘Renaissance: II. The West’, in The Classical Tradition, ed. A. Grafton, G. Most and S. Settis (Cambridge, MA and London, 2010), pp. 810–15
‘Introduction’ to Section XVI: ‘From the Multiple Meaning of Scripture to Philological Textual Criticism – Humanism and Reformation as Roots of the Formation of Hermeneutic Disciplines’, in Departure for Modern Europe: A Handbook of Early Modern Philosophy (1400–1700), ed. Hubertus Busche (Hamburg: Meiner Verlag, 2011), pp. 737–39.
‘Cristoforo Landino’, in Encyclopedia of Medieval Philosophy: Philosophy between 500 and 1500, ed. Henrik Lagerlund, 2 vols (Dordrecht and London: Springer, 2011), I, pp. 240–3.
‘Cardinal Bessarion and Ludovico Saccano’ [with Martin Davies], in Mantova e il Rinascimento Italiano: Studi in onore di David S. Chambers, ed. Philippa Jackson and Guido Rebecchini (Mantua: Sometti, 2011), pp. 225–38.
‘Pagan Philosophy and Patristics in Erasmus and His Contemporaries’, Erasmus of Rotterdam Society Yearbook, 31 (2011), pp. 33–60.
‘Unpacking the Warburg Library’, Common Knowledge, 18.1, Winter 2011 [ = ‘The Warburg Institute: A Special Issue on the Library and Its Readers’], pp. 117–27.
‘Ἀπάθεια and Προπάθειαι in Early Modern Discussions of the Passions: Stoicism, Christianity and Natural History’, in Francis Bacon and the Early Modern Reconfiguration of Natural History [= special issue of Early Science and Medicine, 17, 2012], pp. 230–53.
‘Marcus Aurelius and Neostoicism in Early Modern Philosophy’, in Blackwell Companion to Marcus Aurelius, ed. Marcel van Ackeren (Oxford, 2012), pp. 515–31.
Editor, jointly with W.F. Ryan and C.B. Schmitt, Pseudo-Aristotle in the Middle Ages: The ‘Theology’ and Other Texts (London, 1986)
Editor, jointly with A. C. Dionisotti and A. Grafton , The Uses of Greek and Latin: Historical Essays (London, 1988)
Associate editor, The Cambridge History of Renaissance Philosophy, gen. ed. C.B. Schmitt; ed. Q. Skinner and E. Kessler (Cambridge, 1988)
Editor, The Cambridge Companion to Renaissance Humanism (Cambridge, 1996); Spanish translation, Introducción al humanismo renacentista (Madrid, 1998)
Editor, Cambridge Translations of Renaissance Philosophical Texts, vol. I:Moral – Philosophy; vol. II: Political Philosophy (Cambridge, 1997)
Joint editor, with Martin Stone, Humanism and Early Modern Philosophy, London Studies in the History of Philosophy, 1 (London, 2000)
Co-editor, with Risto Saarinen, Moral Philosophy on the Threshold of Modernity (Dordrecht, 2005)
Co-editor, with Laura Lepschy, Caro Vitto: Essays in Memory of Vittore Branca (Reading, 2007)
Co-Editor with Maria Pia Donato, Conflicting Duties: Science, Medicine and Religion in Rome, 1550–1750, Warburg Institute Colloquia (London, 2009)
Joint-editor with G. A. J. Rogers and Tom Sorell, Insiders and Outsiders in Seventeenth-Century Philosophy (New York and London, 2010)
Joint-editor with G. A. J. Rogers and Tom Sorell, Scientia in Early Modern Philosophy: Seventeenth-Century Thinkers on Demonstrative Knowledge from First Principles (Dordrecht etc., 2010)
Joint editor, with W. F. Ryan and C. Burnett, Warburg Institute Surveys and Texts, 1986–
Advisory Board: Journal of the Warburg and Courtauld Institutes, 1985–95
Associate Editor: Journal of the Warburg and Courtauld Institutes, 1995–6
Joint Editor: Journal of the Warburg and Courtauld Institutes, 1997–
Advisory committee: I Tatti Renaissance Library, 1997–
Joint editor: International Journal of the Classical Tradition, 2012–
Editorial board, with responsibility for philosophy: The Classical Tradition (Harvard University Press) 2002–2010
Editorial board, Joseph Scaliger Correspondence, 2003–
Editorial board, with responsibility (together with John Monfasani and Eckhard Kessler) for the Renaissance and Sixteenth Century: Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy, 2002–
Editorial board, with responsibility for the fifteenth century, Encyclopedia of Medieval Philosophy (Springer, 2011)
British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 1991–2010
Bruniana & Campanelliana, 1995–
Letteratura italiana antica, 1999–
Albertiana 2002–
Electronic British Library Journal, 2005–2008
Erasmus of Rotterdam Society Yearbook, 2007–
Renaissance Studies, 2007–
Lias, 2010–
Rinascimento, 2012–
Three-year grant, together with Tom Sorell (University of Essex) and G. A. J. Rogers (Keele University), from the Leverhulme Foundation for an Academic Interchange Scheme, ‘The New Historiography of Early Modern Philosophy’ (2000–2003)
Two-year Joint Activities grant, together with Jan Papy (Leuven), from the British Academy in order to produce a critical edition, with English translation and commentary, of Justus Lipsius, Manuductio ad Stoicam philosophiam (2001–2003)
Three-year AHRC-funded research grant, together with David Lines (Principal Investigator) and Simon Gilson, on ‘Vernacular Aristotelianism in Renaissance Italy, c. 1400–1650’ (2010–2013)