D. Mental Anomalism

In this supplement, the various arguments for different components of mental anomalism that are discussed in the main text (§2.3 and §§4–4.2) – psychological anomalism and psychophysical anomalism – are explored in much more detail.

D.1 Deviant Causal Chains and Mental Anomalism

As noted in §2.2, the distinction between action and mere behavior/bodily movement is key to many of the issues raised by Anomalous Monism. According to Davidson, action is (identical to) intentionally described behavior – the movement of a hand through space in a certain way may be an action of waving or swatting or some other action. But it need not be: it may simply be mere bodily behavior – as happens as the result of a muscle twitch or a strong gust of wind, when something happens to the agent rather than being done by her. The behavior must be both caused by and rationalized by an agent’s beliefs and desires in order to be an action.

However, while these two conditions are necessary for action, they are not, according to Davidson, sufficient. The rationalized behavior must be caused in the right way by the beliefs and desires in order to be action. Davidson notes the possibility of cases where an agent’s beliefs and desires cause behavior which, while in some sense being rationalized by those states, is nonetheless not action. A mountain climber might become so unnerved by his desire to rid himself of an annoying second climber sharing his rope and belief that jiggling the rope is a means for doing so that he unintentionally jiggles the rope, leading to the loss of the second climber. This is not an action – it is mere behavior that happens to him, no different than if caused by a muscle twitch or gust of wind. Yet the belief and desire do provide a rationalization of an action that would be identical with that behavior under normal conditions. The problem is that under the actual conditions, the behavior is caused in the wrong way – through a “deviant causal chain” – by the belief and desire, and so is not an action. Clearly this sort of problematic case can be multiplied. And Davidson is skeptical about the possibility of cashing out what it means to be caused in the right way (Davidson 1973b, 78–9), for reasons relating to mental anomalism (Davidson 1973b, 80).

At a very general level, the anomalism principle will rule out the possibility of analytic solutions to this problem of deviant causal chains. Such analyses attempt to spell out, in terms of some required physical and mental conditions, how behavior must be caused by reasons (“caused in the right way”) in order to be action. (That some physical conditions are necessary in such an analysis is guaranteed, as we have seen (§2.3), by the open nature of the mental and subsequent psychological anomalism.) Such analyses would be part of an attempt to reduce actions to bodily movements caused in a particular way by mental states, presumably to be followed by a reductionist account of those mental state-types to physical state-types in the form of simultaneous-instantiation bridge laws of the form ‘P₁ ↔ M₁’, which are the basis of type-identity theories of mind opposed by Davidson. Once one recognizes this wider reductionist project within which purported analytic solutions to the problem of deviant causal chains figure, it becomes clear that mental anomalism must reject them.

To make fully explicit why this is so: any initially plausible such analysis of action would entail particular psychophysical laws of the form ‘(M₁ & M₂ & M₃ & P₁) → P₂’, something clearly rejected by mental anomalism. For such an analysis would state that whatever behavior (P₂) which in fact is caused in the right way (M₃ & P₁) by reasons (M₁ & M₂) would be the action that is rationalized by those reasons. This provides a schema for generating strict psychophysical laws: by plugging in particular reasons M₁ & M₂ and the causal conditions M₃ and P₁ proffered by the analysis, we get a strict predictive psychophysical law simply by noting which effect is produced by these causes. Because such strict psychophysical laws would be entailed by purported solutions to the problem of deviant causal chains, mental anomalism must reject such solutions. (In the course of an extended discussion of the problem of deviant causal chains, Bishop 1989, 125–75, fails to see this connection between it and mental anomalism – see 164. For useful overview of the problem of deviant causal chains, and discussion of how conceptions of causation different from Davidson’s might deal with it, see Stout 2010.)

So mental anomalism is a fully general thesis about the impossibility of strict lawful statements in which mental predicates figure. This includes statements that concern purely psychological types (whether successive (§2.3) or normative (see §4.1.2 and supplements D.4 and D.8), successive mental and physical types, simultaneously occurring mental and physical types, or analytically related mental and physical types.

D.2 Rationality and Mental Anomalism

As discussed briefly in §4.1 and §4.1.1, closely aligned with indeterminacy of interpretation is the role of the principle of charity in formulating a theory of a person’s behavior (Davidson 1970, 222–23). While charity enables the possibility of interpretation by eliminating the possibility of predominate irrationality and non-rationality (see supplement D.8), it still allows for multiple empirically adequate alternative interpretative schemes for an individual’s behavior. The charity principle is closely aligned for Davidson with mental anomalism. According to this principle, we must “try for a theory that finds him consistent, a believer of truths, and a lover of the good (all by our own lights, it goes without saying)” (Davidson 1970, 222). In the process of coming to understand another, by assigning mental states and events to him and meanings to his words, we must, Davidson claims, stand ready to adjust previous such assignments based upon new evidence about the person and how it relates to the overall project of finding him and his behavior intelligible. There are two key points here that for Davidson point towards psychophysical anomalism. First, we never have all possible evidence – we must maintain an openness to better interpretations of previous behavior as new evidence becomes available. Interpretation is always ongoing. And second, ‘better’ interpretations are those made in light of the constitutive ideal of rationality. Consequently, Davidson claims,

there cannot be tight connections between the realms [of the mental and the physical] if each is to retain allegiance to its proper source of evidence. (Davidson 1970, 222)

Rationality is claimed by Davidson to be constitutive of the mental in the sense that something only counts as being a mind – and thus an appropriate object of psychological attributions – if it meets certain rational standards. This constitutive idea is open to weaker and stronger interpretations (for related discussion, see Cherniak 1981). The weaker interpretation sees only very basic logical, semantic or conceptual constraints on understanding others – and thus what is constitutive of minds – which allows for more significant variation as one moves further out from these to more substantive principles of practical reasoning and theoretical reasoning, and even more when extending out further to desires and values. The stronger interpretation appears to be suggested in the quote from Davidson immediately above. In requiring consistency, true beliefs and appropriate desires, it appears to require maximizing, as much as possible, agreement between interpreter and interpreted, and thus a maximal conception of what is constitutive of minds. The weaker interpretation instead requires merely minimizing inexplicable error on the part of the agent being interpreted, thus allowing for deviations (even if limited in certain ways) from psychological assignments that might be required by the stronger interpretation. On this view, the interpreter puts himself into the shoes of the interpreted, acknowledging evidential and cognitive limitations that might prevent her from achieving maximal rationality (Grandy 1973). As we will see in the next few sections, how one interprets the notion of rationality as constitutive directly affects how the argument for psychophysical anomalism is interpreted to work. But it is worth noting here that the weaker, more sensitive and fine-grained principle of charity still rules out predominant irrationality and non-rationality, for essentially the same reasons: a condition of mental content being in place at all, which allows for the identification of predominately explicable isolated cases of irrational and non-rational behavior, requires acting and thinking largely in accordance with basic norms of rationality (see supplement D.8 for detailed discussion).

While Davidson never offers any substantive account of what the proper source of evidence is for the physical, he often invokes the notion of rationality as constraining mental ascription, and it is clear that whatever constrains physical ascription is supposed to pull in a different and potentially conflicting direction. One way of getting at Davidson’s idea here is through the traditional distinction between ‘normative’ and ‘descriptive’ concepts. When we look to uncover generalizations in the physically described world, what we find to follow from a certain set of physical conditions, at the most fundamental level, is a brute fact. Our world is constituted in certain ways, in its most basic governing laws, that are ultimately inexplicable and that we could imagine to be otherwise in different possible worlds. This is contrasted with mental ascription, where the normative notion of rationality requires some mental states to follow from others, and rules out the possibility of certain other sequences, in all possible worlds (allowing for unusual circumstances that need to be laid out). In a sense that needs to be explained, mental states bear conceptual, necessary relations to each other that differentiate them in principle from physical states – this is the point that Davidson accepts from the Logical Connection Argument (§4).

D.3 Holism, Indeterminacy of Translation, and Mental Anomalism

Davidson’s most explicit considerations in favor of mental anomalism appeal to factors about the interpretation of action (linguistic as well as non-linguistic) and the ascription of mental states and events to persons. Several distinguishable features are noted – holism with respect to particular ascriptions, indeterminacy with respect to systematic interpretative frameworks, and the responsiveness of mental ascription to an ideal of rationality. According to holism, particular mental states can be cited in explanation of behavior only in the context of other mental states, which in turn depend upon others. Davidson claims that this dependency and holistic interrelatedness is “without limit” (Davidson 1970, 217). This echoes a related point he makes about the impossibility of definitional reduction of mental states in purely behavioristic terms, because of the ineliminable need for mental caveats (e.g., that the person understands, or notices or cares….) qualifying any attempt to state non-mental conditions for mental states.

Davidson presents these claims about definitional reduction as facts which “provide at best hints of why we should not expect nomological connections between the mental the physical” (Davidson 1970, 217). If definitional reduction of this kind were in fact impossible, it would rule out the possibility of a subclass of strict psychophysical laws – those relating mental states with non-intentionally described behavior – but the basis for this impossibility would not have been explained. And without knowing what that basis is supposed to be, we have no reason to accept Davidson’s claim that definitional reduction is indeed impossible. What prevents us from articulating all the required caveats? Without a rationale in hand, nothing prevents a reductionist from simply offering us detailed definitions and challenging us to come up with counterexamples. Something both principled and convincing is clearly needed. Davidson’s concerns about definitional reduction are ‘hints’ concerning nomological reduction only in the sense that they draw out our intuitions about something standing in the way of formulating such laws. What that obstacle is needs clear formulation. (Davidson 1995b, 12, clearly rejects the idea that holism by itself can ground mental anomalism, noting that all systems of measurement are holistic.)

At times, Davidson appeared to flirt with the idea that the missing link was provided by the thesis of the indeterminacy of translation, developed by Quine (1960) and endorsed by Davidson (1970, 222; 1979) as the indeterminacy of interpretation (to make clear the need for a unified theory of linguistic meaning, the content of mental states, and action (Davidson 1973c, 1974d, 1980a). This thesis claims that, even given the principle of charity and consequent rejection of the possibility of predominant irrationality and non-rationality (see supplement D.8) there are still empirically adequate but non-equivalent complete frameworks for assigning linguistic meanings and mental states to a person on the basis of his behavior, and that there is no fact of the matter that determines that one but not other such frameworks is correct. In particular, there are no physical facts, inside a person’s body or head or outside in the external world, that could settle whether a person’s words refer to some determinate range of objects rather than some other range, or whether one rather than another systematically interdependent set of mental states, with distinct distributions of truth values, is true of that person (see Davidson 1979). If the indeterminacy thesis is true, then on the face of it there might be some rationale for rejecting the possibility of psychophysical laws. For if all physical facts are consistent with different psychological/semantic assignments to a person, then it seems that knowing all the physical facts could not tell us whether certain mental states were true of that person, or certain meanings true of her words, rather than some other assignments. Neither assignment could be exceptionlessly predicted or explained – just as mental anomalism maintains.

There are two problems with this, however. First, this would do nothing to rule out psychophysical laws of the form ‘M₁ → P₁’. Indeterminacy would only result in multiple such laws: ‘M₂ → P₁’, ‘M₃ → P₁’ etc. And so it couldn’t ground the completely general thesis of psychophysical anomalism. But more importantly, Davidson himself holds that the least controversial versions of indeterminacy, having to do with diverging reference schemes, amount to mere notational variance – as he puts it, meaning is what is invariant between empirically adequate translation schemes (Davidson 1977, 225; 1999a, 81). This is what makes such principle of charity-consistent residual indeterminacy manageable in terms of understanding. And given that such schemes are generated through a purely mechanical permutation function (Davidson 1979, 229–30), it is a relatively simple technical trick to take these different schemes into account when formulating psychophysical laws. The laws, for instance, could be formulated with disjunctive predicates (‘P₁ → (M₁ ∨ M₂ ∨ M₃’)). Or, if disjunctive predicates are considered problematic, the laws could be of the form ‘P₁ → M*’, where ‘M*’ picks out the invariant element between the empirically equivalent theories. So it is not at all clear that indeterminacy in and of itself is capable of supporting an across-the-board rejection of strict psychophysical laws. And Davidson ultimately acknowledges this, in stating that mental anomalism would hold even if indeterminacy didn’t (Davidson 1970, 222).

D.4 Kim’s Reductio Strategy for Establishing Mental Anomalism

Jaegwon Kim’s account of Davidson’s position (Kim 1985) builds on the distinction between normative and descriptive concepts and principles discussed briefly in §4.1 and §4.1.2. Kim argues that if there were strict lawlike relations between mental and physical predicates, the ‘brute factness’ and contingency of the physical would illegitimately ‘infect’ the mental. For the mental to retain its identity, strict psychophysical laws must therefore be ruled out. Rationality considerations will typically lead us to attribute a belief that q to a person if we attribute a belief that p and also attribute a belief that p entails q. According to Kim’s account, beliefs involved in very basic logical, semantic or conceptual relations like this hold of necessity – we cannot make sense of possible worlds where beliefs of the first two kinds are attributed but not the third. It is this necessity that strict psychophysical laws would disrupt.

Now, this may appear to be too strong a claim, in light of Davidson’s rejection of strict, purely psychological laws (§2.3). Mental anomalism rejects the possibility of any strict laws in which mental predicates figure (see §4), but Kim is deploying strict laws of the form ‘M₁ → M₂’ here (more explicitly: ‘(M₁ & M₃) → M₂’). Kim, with some initial plausibility, would reply that Davidson is only interested in rejecting strict descriptive (i.e., explanatory, predictive) laws, not strict normative laws. We’ll return to this concern again below. For now, let’s see how Kim’s basic insight is developed.

If physical predicates stood in strict lawful relations to mental predicates, their contingency would ‘infect’ the mental in the following sense. Suppose that there were strict bridge laws correlating the simultaneous instantiation of mental and physical properties, ‘P₁ ↔ M₁’ and ‘P₂ ↔ M₂’. Then, Kim argues, given rational principles of the form ‘M₁ → M₂’, these bridge laws would, on Kim’s view, license substitutions into those principles that would enable the logical derivation of physical laws like ‘P₁ → P₂’. Indeed, the reverse would be true as well; starting with the physical law ‘P₁ → P₂’, and assuming the psychophysical bridge laws, one could derive, through substitution, the rational principle ‘M₁ → M₂’. However, the metaphysical status of the rational principle and the physical law are supposed to be importantly different – rational principles are necessary, true in all possible worlds, while physical laws, being contingent, are not. With the bridge laws in place, a contingent physical law could explain (through substitution and derivation) the rational principle, undermining its status as necessary. Similarly, going in the other direction, a necessary rational principle could explain the physical law, undermining its status as contingent. The modal status of the explaining law/principle would transfer, via substitutions licensed by the bridge laws, to the explained law/principle, altering its modal nature. (The validity of the substitutions that Kim assumes to be licensed in these modal contexts by the bridge laws is, at the very least, controversial and cannot be resolved here). Because it is the bridge laws that enable these problematic modality-altering derivations (since we’re assuming as legitimate strict normative mental laws), they – and thus strict psychophysical laws more generally – are to be rejected. This is how Kim makes sense of Davidson’s cryptic claim (§4.1) that psychophysical anomalism is grounded in the fact that mental and physical explanations owe their allegiance to different sources of evidence. (For related discussion, see supplement E.2.)

Kim’s argument rests upon two central assumptions. First, it assumes that a distinction between strict and ceteris paribus laws need not play any essential role in understanding Davidson’s rejection of psychophysical laws. It is, purportedly, not the different scopes of mental and physical laws that account for their asymmetry, but rather their different purposes – prescribing vs. describing (Kim 1985, 381). Second, it assumes that there is a firm distinction between normative laws and relations, on the one hand, and descriptive laws and relations, on the other, that can support the weight of psychophysical anomalism (Kim 1985, 383). The first assumption is clearly mistaken; as already noted, Davidson heavily emphasizes the focus on strict laws in his own discussions of Anomalous Monism, and explicitly allows only for the possibility of ceteris paribus and not strict laws incorporating mental predicates (§4). Given this, Kim’s reductio strategy would fail to uniquely identify the specific culprit responsible for producing the problematic modality-altering derivations as being the bridge laws rather than the rational principle, all of which (according to Kim) are strict. On Davidson’s view, the culprit could just as easily be identified as the strict rational law. The argument would therefore fail to underwrite psychophysical anomalism.

This concern would perhaps be less of a problem if Kim’s were right in his second assumption, that strict normative rational laws are not ruled out by mental anomalism – because normative – and also contrast sharply with descriptive physical laws. That would justify Kim’s identification of the culprit in his reductio argument as the psychophysical laws. But Kim is wrong about this too. One smaller point to note relevant to this is that Davidson recognizes a normative component to the physical realm, in constitutive a priori principles that govern very basic physical concepts such as ‘object’ and ‘event’ in all possible worlds (Davidson 1970, 220; 1974b, 239; 1973a, 254; see §3.2 above). But it is unclear how or whether such principles might restrict which physical events can follow from which in anything like the way this is supposed to be true for rational principles.

However, more directly relevant to Kim’s argument, a related but opposite problem that is much more significant arises with Kim’s central claim, that strict laws of the form ‘M₁ → M₂’ are consistent with mental anomalism because they are normative, and therefore not descriptive or explanatory/predictive. Purely normative principles state only what someone should think or do given other mental states that are true of him. They entail nothing about what a person will think or do. Kim, however, claims that we would never attribute the antecedent beliefs without attributing the consequent belief when considering the most basic logical, semantic, and conceptual relations. This claim goes well beyond what one merely should believe. It has explanatory/predictive consequences concerning what one does and will believe: on Kim’s view, if M₁ is true of a person, then M₂ should and also will be true of that person.

While this is far too strict a requirement according to Davidson’s own conception of rationality (see related discussion in §4.1.3 and supplement D.5), Kim is rightly reflecting a key point: the normativity of the mental does not, on Davidson’s view, stand completely apart from how minds actually work in practice – i.e. descriptively. How we should think or act must, to a significant degree, be reflected in how we do think or act. (Indeed, if this were not the case, and the normative principles in Kim’s argument had no empirical consequences at all, the argument would be open to the objection that it illicitly trades on different senses of the “laws” or “principles” in the different premises, blocking as invalid the substitutions that the argument depends on.) But this tells against the sharp dichotomy Kim posits between normative and descriptive laws, which he needs in order to justify using a strict (normative) psychological law in his argument against strict psychophysical laws so as to generate the modal transfer problem arising from assuming those psychophysical laws. Psychological laws are not purely normative, precisely because of their constitutive role in mental ascription, and consequent constraint on how minds actually can work in practice (§4 and §4.1). With normative notions informing, as mentioned above, physical principles and, more significantly, there being descriptive consequences of psychological principles, there does not then appear to be a sufficiently robust distinction between the two in Davidson’s framework that can bear the weight of psychophysical anomalism in the way that Kim’s interpretation requires.

As we have seen, one key problem with Kim’s reductio strategy for interpreting the argument for mental anomalism is that it fails to register Davidson’s distinction between strict and ceteris paribus laws. Can Kim’s very straightforward and elegant interpretative approach be saved by making requisite adjustments? It might not affect Kim’s basic point to formulate the rational principle deployed in his argument in ceteris paribus rather than strict form, while maintaining its necessary status: necessarily, all things being equal, if an individual is attributed one belief he should be attributed another (for promising considerations in favor of this hedged picture of normative rational principles, see supplement D.8). This allows for exceptions under unusual circumstances, but insists that attributions of such exceptions must be well motivated and also not generally the case. But there would nonetheless be a contrast with the merely contingent status of any physical regularities. Suppose that there is a necessarily true psychological generalization

(1*) ‘ceteris paribus, M₁ → M₂’.

The most that can be derived from it together with strict bridge laws

(2) ‘P₁ ↔ M₁’

and

(3) ‘P₂ ↔ M₂’ (assumed for the purposes of reductio)

would be the contingently true

(4*) ‘ceteris paribus, P₁ → P₂’,

not the strict law ‘P₁ → P₂’, due to the obvious invalidity of deriving a stronger modality (strict law) from a weaker one (ceteris paribus). How would these adjustments affect the reductio strategy of showing that presumptively contingent relations between physical states would be explained by necessary rational relations and vice-versa given (2) and (3)? Yalowitz (1997, 238–40) claims that the reductio would then fail, arguing in one direction that any troubling sense of constraint of the physical by the rational due to (2) and (3) would be lost because of the nonstrict nature of (4*) and subsequent allowance of exceptions to ‘P₁ → P₂’. Yalowitz’s idea seems to be that since not all cases of P₁ result in the occurrence of a P₂, there is no necessary relation between the types P₁ and P₂. And this seems to suggest that the constitutive essence of the physical has not been infected by that of the mental. The existence of exceptions by itself seems to secure the contingent status of relations between P₁ and P₂. As a result, the objection to bridge laws (2) and (3) – the point of Kim’s argument – would then be removed.

An analogous point could be made if explaining (1*) by (4*); here, Yalowitz’s criticism would presumably be that the troubling notion that certain mental possibilities which should be ruled out by the necessity of (1*) would not be ruled out, given (2) and (3), would be lost because of the now nonstrict nature of (1*) and subsequent allowance of the possibility of alternatives to M₂ when an M₁ occurs. Here, Yalowitz’s idea would seem to be that since the nonstrict nature of (1*) already allows exceptions, it could not be an objection to (2) and (3) that they allow the constitutive essence of the physical – contingency – to jeopardize the necessary nature of mental generalizations. This is because the nonstrict nature of (1*) already allows for cases where an M₂ is not produced by an M₁, and thus the relation between M₁ and M₂ is contingent.

However, there is room for debate here. Since we are trying to make room for the notion of necessary ceteris paribus generalizations like (1*) (see also §5.3 and §6.1), we need to be careful not to collapse the distinctions between strict and necessary generalizations and also between ceteris paribus and contingent generalizations. Yalowitz’s argument appears to be doing precisely this in holding that the existence of exceptions – the mark of a ceteris paribus generalization – entails a merely contingent relation between cases successfully covered (non-exceptions) by that generalization. This can be seen clearly by considering the following. The existence of exceptions does show that there is no necessary relation between P₁ and P₂ – there are possible worlds (including the actual world) in which the latter does follow from the former. But this is orthogonal to the key question of whether there are possible worlds in which P₁’s don’t cause P₂’s ceteris paribus. And if the generalization is supposed to be necessary, as we are proposing in assuming (1*) and deriving (4*) from it, then this is not possible. Since certain possibilities about the relations between P₁ and P₂ are being ruled out by (1*) together with (2) and (3), it appears that Kim’s central point survives the adjusted argument and continues to hold: bridge laws like (2) and (3) enable the transference of the constitutive essences of the mental and physical from one to the other, and so must be rejected. In this case, the contingency of (4*) should allow for the possibility of the realization of its denial – not merely an exception like P₃, which Yalowitz’s argument highlights, but rather a world in which it is false that ‘ceteris paribus, P₁ → P₂’. But this possibility, required by the constitutive essence of the physical (contingency), is ruled out by (2) and (3) given the necessity of (1*). So it is only by denying (2) and (3) – psychophysical anomalism – that the constitutive essences of the mental and the physical can be respected.

This point is even clearer if one considers the reverse version of the adjusted Kim argument, with (4*), together with (2) and (3), explaining (1*). Here the problem with (2) and (3) would be the following: according to the contingent status of (4*), there are possible worlds where ‘ceteris paribus, P₁ → P₂’ is false. The existence of exceptions allowed by (1*), while establishing that there are possible worlds (including the actual world) in which M₁’s don’t cause M₂’s, is, once again, orthogonal to the question of whether there are possible worlds in which ‘ceteris paribus M₁ → M₂’ is false. And since (4*) is only contingently true, there are indeed such worlds. Since certain possibilities about the relations between M₁ and M₂ are being ruled in by (4*) together with (2) and (3), it once again appears that Kim’s central point survives the adjusted argument and continues to hold. The necessity of (1*) should block the possibility of the realization of its denial – a world in which ‘ceteris paribus, M₁ → M₂’ is false. This impossibility, required by the constitutive essence of the mental, is ruled out by (4*), constituting a reductio of (2) and (3). Thus, Yalowitz’s objection to the adjusted Kim strategy for establishing psychophysical anomalism appears to fail.

Our adjustment of Kim’s argument, taking into account Davidson’s rejection of strict psychological laws and lack of reliance on the notion of a purely normative psychological principle, thus looks promising as a reconstruction of Davidson’s argument for psychophysical anomalism. Yalowitz (1997, 240), however, mentions a few other problems with it that are not easily dismissed or, for that matter, assessed. First, there is a concern about how the deductive-nomological model of explanation handles explanatory relations between ceteris paribus generalizations – if one generalization, which has exceptions, cannot explain why or when another generalization has exceptions, then it is a good question to ask how the former can be said to explain the fact that the latter holds when it does. (For related discussion, see Fodor 1974 and 1991, and Schiffer 1991.) Further, it is very unclear how the deductive-nomological model can be applied to generalizations of different modalities (necessary and contingent). And there is a related question about the legitimacy of substitutions within the sorts of modal contexts Kim is working with. In particular, are substitutions of physical for mental properties in metaphysically necessary generalizations like (1*) licensed by the existence of metaphysically contingent bridge laws relating mental and physical properties like (2) and (3)? If not, then the problematic derivations and explanations would not go through, and so neither would any transfer of constitutive essence from one domain to the other. These structural questions about Kim’s argument (both the original and the adjusted versions) make a final assessment of his approach too complex to settle here.

D.5 Uncodifiability and Mental Anomalism

John McDowell also focuses on the normative nature of rationality, and, like Kim, emphasizes the difference between the merely brute, contingent relations among physical states and the necessary, conceptual relations between mental states (McDowell 1985, 389). But McDowell emphasizes a very broad conception of rationality as an ideal constitutive of the mental, taking in more than merely the familiar deductive relations – logical, semantic or conceptual – deployed in Kim’s reading (McDowell 1985, 391–4). McDowell appears to be guided by some of Davidson’s broader formulations and discussions of the principle of charity (§4.1), which extend to more general principles governing action and belief formation, highlighted in Davidson’s discussions of irrationality (see Davidson 1982 and Davidson 1985c). For example, the principle of continence requires one to act on the basis of all available considerations, and the principle of total evidence requires one to believe the hypothesis supported by all of one’s evidence. The broader formulations also entail that our conception of rationality includes conceptions of the Good, and so the formation of rationally appropriate desires, thus extending beyond mere constraints on belief. According to McDowell, those inclined to think that mere deductive relations among beliefs can be captured in physical terms (see Loar 1981) will find mental anomalism much more difficult to deny when taking into account this broader conception of rationality.

To establish this, McDowell appeals to this broader conception of rationality in order to exploit a crucial gap between rational norms and actual explanations of behavior:

Finding an action or propositional attitude intelligible, after initial difficulty, may not only involve managing to articulate for oneself some hitherto merely implicit aspect of one’s conception of rationality, but actually involve becoming convinced that one’s conception of rationality needed correcting, so as to make room for this novel way of being intelligible... there is sure to be a gap between actual current conception and ideal structure... (McDowell 1985, 392)

Just as our beliefs about empirical matters can be mistaken in any given case, and we can make genuine discoveries about empirical reality, just so with rationality. This is what it means for rationality to be an ideal for McDowell. Clearly this claim is much more plausible with the broader conception of rationality that McDowell is urging than the weaker conception limited to mere deductive relations. McDowell goes on to argue that because of this feature, we must be open to the possible reinterpretation of a person’s behavior and psychological states in light of our changing conception of rationality. And how it changes cannot be anticipated in advance so that rationality could be captured in a permanent set of principles from which strict laws could be fashioned. For this reason, rationality is uncodifiable. According to McDowell, this is what underlies mental anomalism. It’s not clear from McDowell’s discussion whether he is claiming that, as a result, rational principles are at best hedged and ceteris paribus, not strict. His overt point is that our grasp on what rationality requires can change over time and so cannot be codified. These are two very different claims, and neither entails the other. What appears to be key for McDowell is a highly idealized conception of rationality, one that outstrips our grasp of it. (For discussion of how the broader conception of rationality might be interpreted in terms of ceteris paribus rational principles, see §4.1.4 and supplement D.8.)

One might understand the reasoning here in the following way: because it is built into our conception of rationality that our own particular grasp of rationality may be mistaken on any given occasion and is also inherently limited, no statement of psychological or psychophysical generalizations could exhaust, and therefore explain, our conception of rationality. If the concept of rationality does not simply consist in one’s conception, at any given time, of rationality, then it cannot be captured in terms of the actual goings on in one’s brain. And the analogous point applies if we substitute “everyone’s” for “one’s”; that is the full extent of the gap between ideal rationality and our grasp of it that McDowell is insisting on. This appears to be how McDowell gets from the uncodifiabilty of rationality to the impossibility of strict psychophysical laws (see further discussion below). This contrasts interestingly with Kim’s strategy: on McDowell’s reading, it is partly because no detailed and strict, fully explicated statement of a rational principle could be claimed to be necessarily true that there can be no psychophysical laws. On Kim’s view, it’s because there are such strict rational principles that such laws are ruled out.

A number of questions arise in considering McDowell’s argument. It appears to be heavily influenced by Davidson’s remarks about the ongoing nature of interpretation (Davidson 1970, 223; see §4.1). However, Davidson appeals to the fact that new evidence – in the form of behavior and environmental context – is always coming in that can force us to revise existing interpretations of an agent. There is no mention of shifting standards, or unarticulated or inarticulable conceptions of rationality. Indeed, the implication is that a stable standard, when taking into account new evidence, can lead to revised interpretations of prior behavior. This is an option that McDowell fails to register in his thought, quoted above, that we sometimes struggle to understand each other and then succeed. McDowell gives us two explanatory options for understanding such cases: that we come to better understand something implicit in our grasp of rationality, or (his key idea) that we realize that our grasp of rationality required correction. A far more simple and likely explanation, and one that better coheres with Davidson’s own view, is that we acquired new information about the agent or her environment, or recognized that we hadn’t taken something into account sufficiently that we already knew. McDowell is emphasizing a gap between ideal rationality and our conception of it. Davidson only recognizes a potential gap between our conception of rationality and particular instances of thought and action that are irrational. These are two entirely different gaps. So McDowell appears to be going well beyond Davidson’s own views about the concept of rationality. Indeed, the idea that one is not able to fully articulate a concept in the way suggested by McDowell – that it is in effect ineffable – does not clearly sit comfortably with Davidson’s views about conceptual relativism and rejection of the idea of untranslatable languages (see further supplement B.1.

It also isn’t easy to see how such a highly idealized picture of rationality as outstripping our conception of it fits with Davidson’s guiding thought, that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription. That guiding thought requires that how we should think and act is largely how we do think and act (see supplement D.8). McDowell’s idealized picture of rational principles, and their gap with actual rational conceptions, doesn’t address this specific requirement, and potentially violates it. In its place, he emphasizes the particular style of explanation that occurs in mental ascription: that actions are made intelligible by being, “or approximate to being”, revealed as they ideally ought to be. This is in contrast to physical explanation, where things are explained by being shown to come about because that is how things generally tend to happen (McDowell 1985, 389). “Approximate” here appears intended to accommodate the gap that McDowell insists upon but without letting it widen in such a way that Davidson’s guiding thought isn’t honored; “approximate”, after all, connotes coming close. But nothing in McDowell’s discussion makes contact with Davidson’s idea that mental events actually or generally happen as they ought – the style of explanation, given McDowell’s gap, is consistent with this never happening. It is in danger of being just a style. Once McDowell’s gap is posited, it seems all too possible that Davidson’s guiding thought is lost.

Davidson’s explicitly stated picture of rational norms (see Davidson 1985c) sees them as constitutive in the sense that we must attribute commitment to them to a creature if we are to be able to ascribe it any mental content at all. Deviations from rationality can only be identified against the background of this attributed commitment, and so must be the exception and not the rule (see supplement D.8 for more on this). This is an internalist view of rational norms – they must reflect the agent’s actual psychology. McDowell, on the other hand, is articulating an externalist view of reason (McDowell 1995), which sees rational norms as binding despite not reflecting the agent’s actual psychology. This explains the gap he insists on, but it clearly derives from a very different picture of rationality than Davidson’s. McDowell’s picture also appears to conflict directly with Davidson’s in McDowell's claim, deriving directly from the gap he defends, that constitutive rational norms are not restricted to a priori status, but can also depend upon empirical discovery (McDowell 1985, 394). Davidson’s constitutiveness idea, as just described, has no space for such empirically-derived rational norms. There may be such norms, but they can’t fall under what is constitutive of mental ascription.

Finally, McDowell, following what he takes to be Davidson’s own argument (McDowell 1985, 389), moves quickly from the uncodifiability of rational principles to the impossibility of strict psychophysical laws. The reasoning isn’t spelled out, but must be something like the following: to say that rationality is constitutive of the mental entails that mental ascriptions depend essentially on governing rational principles. If those principles cannot be codified, then for any rational principle of the form ‘(M₁ & M₂₎ → M₃’, it is always possible that M₁ and M₂ hold of an agent, but it is not the case that this agent ought to M₃. Now consider a psychophysical generalization of the form ‘(P₁ & M₁ & M₂₎ → M₃’. One might think that the analogous conclusion must also follow: that the antecedent of this generalization can hold but – because of uncodifiability – the consequent might not. If so, then the uncodifiabiilty of rationality would entail the impossibility of strict versions of such psychophysical generalizations.

But purely normative rational principles only tell us what an agent ought to think or do. And such psychophysical generalizations are descriptive, not normative; they tell us how an agent does or will think or act. So the claim that there is no strict answer to the question what an agent ought to think or do – as uncodifiability holds – seems orthogonal to the issue of whether there is a strict answer to the question of what an agent does or will think or do if certain mental and physical conditions obtain. We know that humans are sometimes irrational and also cognitively limited. So one cannot move directly from conclusions about how one ought to think or act to conclusions about how one will think or act. This is compatible, as McDowell himself grants (McDowell 1985, 389), with seeing rationality as constitutive (see supplement D.8). And this is true even taking into account the key feature of Davidson’s constitutiveness idea, which goes entirely missing in McDowell’s discussion: that how one does or will think or act must predominately be how one ought to think or act. This is what it means to say that mental ascriptions depend essentially on governing rational principles; any tighter connection posited between rational principles and actual thought and behavior is inconsistent with the manifest fact of irrationality and cognitive limitations. It must be admitted that the dialectical situation here is murky, and it is understandable to be seduced, as McDowell’s argument seems to reflect, by the thought that M₃ in the psychophysical generalization above must always be subject to revision because of rationality considerations, preventing that generalization from being strict. But since rationality considerations cannot strictly dictate how an agent does or will act in particular situations, that thought is mistaken. There does not appear to be a straightforward line of argument from the uncodifiability of rationality to the impossibility of strict psychophysical laws.

As we’ve seen, McDowell, like Kim, emphasizes the difference between the merely brute, contingent relations among physical states and the necessary, conceptual relations between mental states. However, this point appears to be entirely separable from the distinctive feature of McDowell’s reading of the argument for mental anomalism – it has nothing especially to do with the idea of rationality as uncodifiable in McDowell’s specific sense. One can think of rationality as constitutive, as normative and as asymmetrical to the physical in the way just noted – as Kim does – without buying into McDowell’s distinctive picture of it. So it looks like the salvageable part of McDowell’s actual argument for psychophysical anomalism ultimately reduces to Kim’s. Uncodifiability as McDowell understands it appears to be a red herring.

Therefore, despite McDowell’s extremely subtle and interesting views about the nature of the ideal of rationality, in the end those views do not appear to provide a secure foundation for mental anomalism within Davidson’s framework. It is only what is shared in common with Kim’s strategy – the modal asymmetry between rational and physical explanation – that bears directly on mental anomalism. And that leaves McDowell’s reading facing some of the concerns raised in §4.1.2 and supplement D.4. (McDowell’s distinctive notion of uncodifiability is tied to viewing rational principles as ideals. For an interpretation of uncodifiability tied instead to a recognition of their limitations, and further exploration of issues related to broad rationality, see supplement D.8.)

D.6 Context, Complexity, and Mental Anomalism

As we have seen above, Kim thinks that mental anomalism is susceptible of a kind of proof. This seems to be something stronger than Davidson himself claims (Davidson 1970, 215). In light of Davidson’s modesty about provability, and lack of explicit argumentation, some commentators (Child 1993; see also McDowell 1979) have suggested that mere reflection on the kinds of generalizations that we draw upon in coming to understand each other supports (but cannot prove) mental anomalism. Such generalizations are rules of thumb that hold only for the most part, and require, for their application to a given case, detailed contextual supplementation that cannot, by its nature, be included in anything like a universal generalization. The suggestion is that the sheer amount of contextual detail that would need to be accounted for in any statement with even a hope of being true is inappropriate for inclusion in strict lawful statements. A related strategy is to point to a lack of fixed, predetermined ends that all humans (or even any particular human over the course of her life) aim for in situations of choice, or values to maximize when deciding what to believe (such as simplicity, scope, and consistency in the case of theory choice) (Child 1993). The thought here is that if there are no such fixed ends or values, then no psychological generalization could be complete – since in particular contexts such ends or values play a crucial explanatory role in determining what to do or believe. Unlike McDowell’s claims about limitations on our grasp of rationality discussed above (§4.1.3), these considerations, according to Child, explicitly suggest that principles of rationality, in particular those governing practical reasoning not considered by Kim (§4.1.2), are ceteris paribus and not strict.

It would seem, however, that reflection on the level of detail required for strict laws in the physical sciences fails to provide for an interesting asymmetry here. If one considers the number of factors that would have to be taken in to account in order to state conditions that guarantee that when a match is struck it will produce a flame, the resulting strict law would be quite complex, and in a way not obviously different from any putative strict laws in which mental predicates figure, with contextual features included. And if there are indeed no fixed ends or values in the realm of choice and a decision, this can be accommodated in the same way – the contextual ends or values could themselves be included in the putative strict laws. This would complicate and expand the set of such laws, but as already noted this is not something that would set mental generalizations apart from physical ones. The main problem with Child’s appeal to complexity and context in psychological explanation is that it doesn’t provide a systematic explanation for why these are ineliminable. Without such an explanation, we don’t get the sort of asymmetry with the physical sciences that is needed to promote mental anomalism. (For a very different strategy for arguing that rational principles are ceteris paribus, not strict, that is not subject to these objections, and how this bears on mental anomalism, see supplement D.8.)

D.7 Causation and Mental Anomalism

We have been looking at different ways of making sense of and justifying Davidson’s claim that mental anomalism stems from the constitutive role of rationality in mental ascription. In Davidson’s writings, however, another line of argument often surfaces which focuses less on the rational nature of mental events and more on their causal nature. As we have already seen, in his earliest work on action Davidson argued that reasons explain actions by causing them, and he later came to emphasize that what makes mental states and events what they are is determined in part by their causes and effects. Particular psychological explanations are causal (they invoke causes – Davidson 1963), and are formulated in terms of causally defined concepts (for propositional attitudes, see Davidson 1987b, 41; for mental contents, see Davidson 1987a, 44). In later work he frequently notes the anomic nature of causal concepts and causal explanations, and how mental properties and reasons explanations are anomic because of this – “reason-explanations…are in some sense low-grade; they explain less than the best explanations in the hard sciences because of their heavy dependence on causal propensities” (Davidson 1987b, 42; see also Davidson 1991, 162 and Davidson 1995b, 4–5). If mental concepts are causally defined, and strict laws do not employ causally defined concepts, then mental anomalism appears to follow straight away, without need of any detour through issues concerning the rationality of mental concepts.

Extending this reasoning, Davidson writes that

[m]ental concepts…appeal to causality because they are designed, like the concept of causality itself, to single out from the totality of circumstances which conspire to cause a given event just those factors that satisfy some particular explanatory interest. (Davidson 1991, 163)

This appears to ground the causal definition of anomic properties (whether mental or otherwise) in the fact that they answer to particular explanatory interests. This is contrasted with the case of ‘ultimate physical’ properties: “Explanation in terms of the ultimate physics, though it answers to various interests, is not interest relative” (Davidson 1987b, 45). This seems to collapse the distinction between psychology and all the other special sciences with respect to the question of anomalism. All of the latter answer to particular explanatory interests, and are thus selective with respect to the total sufficient condition for an effect-type (see Davidson 1987b, 45); the causal definition, and thus anomalism, of their vocabularies is owed to this interest-relativity and selectivity. ‘Ultimate physics’, on the other hand, “treats everything without exception as a cause of an event if it lies within physical reach (falls within the light cone leading to the effect)” (Davidson 1987b, 45).

Davidson repeats these sorts of claims about the anomic nature of causally defined properties in a number of places in later writings, but at no point does he clearly bring them into contact with his early remarks concerning the constitutive role of rationality in psychological ascription. And he never provides argument in support of this general thesis concerning causality. It is natural to wonder why, given this general thesis about causally defined concepts, rationality should be thought to underwrite mental anomalism. And it becomes imperative to know why that general thesis is plausible (for discussion, see Yalowitz 1998a).

With regard to the first issue, there is some evidence that Davidson is confusing two distinct questions: why mental concepts cannot stand in lawlike relation to physical concepts, and why mental concepts cannot be eliminated in favor of physical concepts in the explanation of human behavior. Given the general thesis about causally defined properties, we have an understanding of why mental concepts are anomic. But this leaves open the question whether we ought to continue to traffic in anomic concepts generally, and mental concepts in particular. Why not eliminate them in favor of the nomic physical concepts? Here, the rationality of mental concepts may be thought to provide an answer. If we wish to understand why an agent performed the action that she did, as opposed to having a full sufficient causal explanation of why her body moved as it did, we are interested in a selective explanation – that part of the total sufficient condition that satisfies the particular explanatory interests behind reasons-explanations (Davidson 1991, 163). Those interests highlight the normative nature of reason and action – their responsiveness to the principle of charity and ideal of rationality. Rationality, on this line of thinking, does not account for mental anomalism; but it does speak to the question of mental realism (see further §6.2). (For further discussion of the anomic nature of causally defined concepts and its bearing on Anomalous Monism, see Yalowitz 1998a. For more on the relation between rational explanation and mental realism, see supplement E.2. For discussion of issues closely related to the causal definition argument, see §6.3 and supplement B.2.

D.8 Rationality as Constitutive of the Mental, Irrationality, and Mental Anomalism

In this supplement we look at the background for Davidson’s claim that rationality is constitutive of the mental, the bearing of irrational phenomena on this claim, and the relationship between irrational phenomena and mental anomalism.

Campbell (2020, 34–39) argues that in order to save Davidson’s claim that reasons are causes, Davidson must give up the idea that rationality is constitutive of psychological explanation (for more on this idea, see §4.1). Campbell takes this idea to conflict with Hume’s distinctness requirement for causation, which Campbell takes to entail that “in principle, anything can cause anything – in particular, that anything psychological can cause anything else psychological”. Driving Campbell’s argument are cases where an agent holds some belief that stands in irrational or non-rational relations to other mental states or non-mental physical states that the initial belief nonetheless causally explains. These examples are supposed to establish that “anything psychological can cause anything else psychological”, and so to be inconsistent with Davidson’s idea that rationality is constitutive of the mental. Campbell takes Davidson’s idea to require rational relations between all causally interacting mental states. As we’ll see in this section, Campbell misunderstands Davidson’s position concerning these points.

In arguing as he does, Campbell fails to recognize a key point in Davidson’s framework. Campbell’s discussion – and virtually all discussions in the more scientifically-oriented philosophical literature concerned with psychology and psychiatry (for examples, see Stich 1985 and Bortolloti 2005) – simply assumes that an agent holds some particular belief and then describes isolated cases where that belief stands in irrational or non-rational relations to other mental states or non-mental physical states. Campbell doesn’t consider the conditions that enable the identification of the initial belief in the first place. For Davidson, this gets the methodology entirely backwards. This explains the focus on radical interpretation in Davidson’s picture (Davidson 1973c). Campbell (2020, 38–39) does note a related view of Quine’s (1960, 58–59): that identification of what might appear to be extreme irrationality is best thought of as instead based on a mistranslation of the speaker’s language. But Campbell again fails to follow that idea to its source, again citing plausible isolated cases of irrational thought and action that he takes to invalidate Quine’s claim. But this entirely misses Quine’s point about mistranslation. That point is driven by issues surrounding the thesis of the indeterminacy of translation, something that also motivates Davidson’s overall framework for thinking about mental content and psychological explanation (see discussion §4.1.1 for further discussion of the indeterminacy thesis and its relation to mental anomalism).

Quine and Davidson argue that if we allowed for the possibility of predominant irrationality or non-rationality in an agent (needed in order to overthrow the constitutiveness idea), which includes massive faulty reasoning, false beliefs, and desires in conflict with widely shared values, there would be so many possible interpretations of her language and psychology available that we would be unable choose between them, and so could not understand her. And this would entail that we could not justifiably attribute mental contents to her at all. There are an indefinitely large number of ways that an agent could be wrong in their reasoning, beliefs, and desires once one allows for the possibility of predominant irrationality and non-rationality. All such possibilities could be made consistent with the behavioral evidence once corresponding adjustments are made in contributing components (linguistic meaning, beliefs, desires etc.) and overall assessment of degree of rationality, irrationality, or non-rationality (Davidson 1973c, 1977, 1979). So a condition of understanding another person – of grasping their language and their behavior more generally – and therefore justifiably attributing mental content to her at all, requires putting constraints on possible interpretations.

That is the point of the principle of charity. According to this principle, we must “try for a theory that finds him consistent, a believer of truths, and a lover of the good (all by our own lights, it goes without saying)” (Davidson 1970, 222; for discussion of an alternative formulation of this principle (Grandy 1973), see supplement D.2). The constitutive claim, then, is that a condition of understanding others at all requires interpreting their language and other behavior as largely in accordance with basic norms of rationality. There can be isolated deviations from such norms (Davidson 1982, 1985c), but they can only be identified as such – as involving the attitudes and contents that they do, such as the initial beliefs in Campbell’s cases – against the background of mostly rational thought and behavior (Davidson 1985c, 352). Linguistic meaning and mental content must first be identified in order for attributions of irrational mental states and actions to be possible. And this is only possible if rationality is recognized as constitutive, and so reducing indeterminacy of translation to manageable levels consistent with understanding (see supplement D.3 concerning “manageable levels”). Campbell’s isolated cases of irrational and non-rational beliefs and actions don’t address Davidson’s overall framework for identifying mental content at all (similarly for Bortolotti 2005), and thus the rationale for the idea that rationality is constitutive of the mental.

Related to this, it should also be noted that the very idea of irrationality for Davidson involves internal inconsistency in an agent between his beliefs, desires, and reasoning and his own rational commitments, as opposed to mere disagreement between two agents (Davidson 1985c). This internalist view of irrationality further contributes to ruling out the possibility of predominant irrationality, because a condition of attributing these rational commitments themselves to an agent, to allow for particular cases of inconsistency, presupposes that by and large the agent acts in accordance with those commitments. Without this, there would be no basis upon which to attribute these commitments as opposed to others, re-opening the difficulty discussed above concerning too many possible interpretations and so no way to justifiably attribute any mental contents at all.

Davidson’s overall point can be put this way: a condition of even identifying a skeptical challenge to the idea that rationality is constitutive of psychological ascription, of the kind put forward by Campbell and so many others, is that one understand that challenge’s content. And understanding content depends upon accepting charity, and thus the idea that rationality is constitutive. Otherwise one faces the “too many possible interpretations” problem. So such skeptical challenges undermine themselves if they claim to be intelligible at all.

As we’ve seen, the main point that drives Campbell’s critique of Davidson’s response to the Logical Connection argument (§4), and to the constitutiveness idea in particular, is the Humean requirement that “in principle, anything can cause anything – in particular, that anything psychological can cause anything else psychological” (Campbell 2020, 34). And as we’ve also seen, contrary to Campbell, that Humean requirement can be made sense of within Davidson’s framework given his extensionalism about causation and his views about interpretation, indeterminacy, the need for charity in the ascription of content, and thus the constitutiveness idea. Since irrational and non-rational thoughts and actions are possible on Davidson’s view, in one sense so is the claim that “anything psychological can cause anything else psychological”. But that claim has to be understood as pertaining to isolated cases and as inconsistent with predominant irrationality and non- rationality. (To be fair, Campbell 2020 is articulating, and applying to psychological explanation, an entirely different account of causation and causal explanation (Woodward 2003) than Davidson’s. That account would have to be assessed on its own merits. See §6.2 for related discussion of Campbell.)

Does the existence of irrational phenomena provide any basis for mental anomalism? The broader conception of rationality in Davidson that is highlighted by McDowell (§4.1.3 and supplement D.5) suggests a different notion of uncodifiability that does not face the concerns raised by McDowell’s interpretation. Davidson mentions several different principles of rationality, from the more theoretical to the more practical sides of a spectrum (Davidson 1985c). There are the rules of classical logic (one ought to deductively reason in accordance with its basic rules), Carnap’s principle of total evidence (one ought to accept the hypothesis best supported by one’s total evidence), Quine’s principle of conservation (one ought, all things being equal, to change as few beliefs as possible when faced with recalcitrant data), and the principle of continence (one ought to prefer or act on the judgment based on all relevant considerations). These rational obligations can be very demanding on agents in what Cherniak 1981 aptly calls the finitary predicament, with limited cognitive and temporal resources. Finite agents will often be forced to make decisions under conditions that prevent them from double checking their logical reasoning, or gathering and considering all their evidence, or taking into account all relevant considerations. Something has to give: one often lacks the luxury to adequately meet any one of these rational obligations in a given case.; that one can actually meet all of them adequately is practically impossible. Rational triage is always in play concerning our rational obligations. The question thus arises about the relation between them: whether they stand in some sort of objective and determinate hierarchy that could tell us, under conditions where those that are directly relevant can’t all be adequately satisfied, which have priority amidst an ordered ranking.

Davidson never explicitly addresses this question, and various comments scattered throughout his later writings pull in different directions. He does emphasize a lack of any exhaustive list of rational principles, which suggests skepticism that such objective ordering of rationality principles is possible (1985c, 352). On the other hand, Davidson 1995b, 14, and more generally his discussions of decision theory within the unified theory of meaning and action (see also 1990a) suggest that at an ideal level there is no inconsistency or tension between basic rational principles, which seems to require an objective ordering. Lack of such an objective ordering would be one way of understanding the uncodifiability of rationality and thus mental anomalism. If rationality is uncodifiable in this way, then there can’t be strict normative laws of rationality that underlie psychological ascription, because without an objective ordering, no rational principle can say what one ought strictly to do in any given situation. All such principles must acknowledge the possibility of incommensurable conflict with other rational principles, and reflect this in being expressed in a hedged ceteris paribus form. We will return below to the question of how this point bears on the possibility of strict psychophysical laws.

Related to skepticism about such objective ordering of rational principles, some philosophers have argued that it can sometimes be rational to choose or act in violation of rational norms, and thus to act irrationally (Baron 1988, McIntyre 1990). And Davidson has expressed sympathy with this sort of view (Davidson 1985d, 143). Baron 1988 has argued that while self-deception – which Davidson understands to be a self-induced violation of Carnap’s principle of total evidence (1985d, 145) – is generally wrong because it undermines one’s agency by being self-perpetuating and gradually undermining responsible epistemic and moral practices, it also can, in individual cases, be beneficial to the agent and so not wrong (Baron 1988, 433–435). Benefits of self-deception are holding false beliefs in particular cases that make it easier to live with things one cannot change and where the falsity of the beliefs is essentially benign. It can also lead us to treat others more generously. Baron also argues that self-deception is practically indispensable in helping to resolve the inevitable underdetermination that faces us in understanding ourselves (Baron 1988, 441–444). We often don’t quite know what we think or feel on a matter of personal importance, and there are at least a few plausible self-interpretations between which to choose. At some point one must form a picture of a situation or act based on some self-conception. Self-deception, typically involving motivated reasoning such as wishful thinking, provides one way of resolving this underdetermination. More importantly to Baron, the tension and instability in our self-conception that self-deception causes can actually help us to understand better what we are about, when the self-deceived self-conception just doesn’t ultimately fit (Baron 1988, 441). This further indispensability claim, however, isn’t needed for Baron’s central point that it can sometimes be practically rational to be theoretically irrational (a point also made by Strawson 1962).

McIntyre 1990 argues against the claim that weakness of will is always irrational when it involves violating of the principle of continence (this is “akratic” action, which Davidson takes to define weakness of will). (Holton 1999 questions both this definition and whether it identifies what we commonly identify as weakness of will. For further discussion of this broader set of issues, see McIntryre 2006. There is a very complex debate in the literature on practical reasoning about these issues that cannot be addressed here.) In doing so, McIntyre is claiming that violating that principle – that one ought to prefer or act on the judgment based on all relevant considerations – can be more rational than blind allegiance to it. She is careful not to claim that such violations are outright rational (McIntyre 1990,380); rather, she is emphasizing a scalar aspect to rationality judgments. She argues that all-things-considered judgments of the kind emphasized in Davidson’s principle of continence are defeasible for a variety of reasons (McIntyre 1990, 389) and also can conflict with and reasonably be overridden by other principles governing practical reasoning (McIntyre 1990, 380). Doing other than what one believes one has most reason to do is a violation of the principle of continence, and yet it can be a more rational action than acting continently in some cases, because one can be wrong about what one believes one has most reason to do: introspection is not an infallible process, and humans have finite cognitive capacities which force trade-offs between competing demands for thoroughness and efficiency in their deliberations (McIntyre 1990, 382). McIntyre also argues more generally that virtuous character traits such as alertness and acuity, requiring flexibility and awareness of one’s own limitations, can reasonably lead agents to choose and act in ways that conflict with what ideal rationality requires (McIntyre 1990, 396–399).

Considerations like those put forward by Baron and McIntyre, as well as the skepticism about objective ordering of rational principles discussed previously, suggest that principles of rationality are at best ceteris paribus, not strict (McIntyre says that such principles are prima facie requirements (McIntyre,1990, 380), which comes to the same thing). The conception of uncodifiability they articulate differs from that discussed by Child (§4.1.4 and supplement D.6) because of the emphasis on competition between rational norms as an explanation for the complexity and contextual considerations regarding psychological generalizations that Child emphasizes. For Child, these considerations are mere brute facts, not something that can be further explained. They therefore can’t provide for the needed asymmetry with physical generalizations, because for all we learn from Child’s discussion they may in fact be eliminable, as they are with physical generalizations. (Child also says that his conception of uncodifiability is compatible with the existence of true, exceptionless rational principles (Child 1993, 219), further distinguishing his view from the one under discussion here.)

With this conception of uncodifiability in hand, and recalling the problems raised in §4.1.3 and supplement D.5 for McDowell’s attempt to go straight from a different conception of uncodifiability to psychophysical anomalism, one might explore re-deploying Kim’s strategy for casting doubt on strict psychophysical laws (§4.1.2 and supplement D.4). Kim’s strategy turns on modal differences between psychological (necessarily true) and physical (contingently true) generalizations. This modal distinction can carry over to hedged normative rational principles, in keeping with Davidson’s guiding idea that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription, in place of Kim’s strict principles. This could be used to articulate the tension with strict psychophysical laws that Kim highlights in order to make sense of Davidson’s claim that “there cannot be tight connections between the realms [of the mental and the physical] if each is to retain allegiance to its proper source of evidence” (Davidson 1970, 222). Using necessarily true, hedged rather than strict normative laws will avoid some of the problems with Kim’s account. This idea is explored in supplement D.4.