E. Mental Causation and Supervenience

Two central objections that have been regularly made against Anomalous Monism concern how mental properties can be causally or explanatorily relevant in the physical world given monism (§6), and how these problems are compounded by Davidson’s appeal to the doctrine that mental properties supervene on physical properties (§5.3). In this supplement, we look in further detail at aspects of first objection and then consider what might motivate Davidson’s unargued assumption of supervenience.

E.1 Mental Properties and Causal Relevance

As noted in §6, the epiphenomenalist worry arises from two points that are absolutely basic to Anomalous Monism – first, that mental events are at the same time physical events, and, second, that while mental predicates cannot figure into strict causal laws, physical predicates must. Early criticisms moved very quickly from these points to the claim that mental properties were causally irrelevant relative to physical properties. Though it eventually became clear that this particular concern can get no traction within Davidson’s framework, it is instructive to follow out the line of argument. An early critic of Anomalous Monism, Ted Honderich (Honderich 1982 – for related literature, see Campbell 2003), articulates the worry by arguing, first, that not all properties of an event are causally relevant to its effect. For instance, the color of a piece of fruit has no effect on its measurement – when the fruit is placed on a scale, the subsequent movement of the weight indicator is not influenced by the fruit’s color. According to Honderich, the color is therefore a causally irrelevant property of the event (of placing the green fruit on the scale), while the weight of the fruit is a causally relevant property. Honderich then asks: what accounts for this distinction between causally relevant and irrelevant properties? And he claims that only properties that figure in strict laws – physical properties – are candidates for causal relevance. There is no strict lawlike relation between being green and the resulting measurement, while, according to Honderich, there is such a relation between the weight of the fruit and that measurement.

Honderich thinks that this simple point generalizes and shows that, within the framework of Anomalous Monism, mental properties are not causally relevant because they are not lawlike. His argument can be understood as follows: since Anomalous Monism insists that mental events have physical properties that can be related, by strict law, to the effects of those events, and also insists that such events’ mental properties cannot be so related, it is only ‘by virtue’ of its physical (i.e., strict lawlike) properties that a mental event causes what it does. Its mental properties, and thus its being the particular kind of mental event that it is, play no role in its causal powers. Thus, Honderich suggests that the cause-law principle must be articulated slightly differently – as the Principle of the Nomological Character of Causally Relevant Properties. This nomological property principle rules out the causal relevance of anomic mental properties.

Honderich’s argument is instructive for a more general consideration of the wave of epiphenomenalist criticisms lobbed at Anomalous Monism. First, Honderich’s distinction between causally relevant and irrelevant properties is completely insensitive to the question of what is being explained or caused, which effect is under consideration (Macdonalds 1995 and Gibbons 2006 usefully discuss the importance of typing effects in addressing the epiphenomenalist objections). Consider the fruit example. While the color of the fruit has no causal relevance to its measurement, that is not the only effect of the event of putting the fruit on the scale. The color catches the eye of a customer, bleeds onto the scale and changes its color, and causes a host of other effects that are not salient when considering only the effect of the measurement. Salience is dependent on explanatory interests, and if we shift those interests, what was an irrelevant property with respect to one effect may be a relevant property with respect to another (see §6.2).

Second, Honderich arrives at the view that an event’s physical properties are the only causally relevant ones through reflecting on Anomalous Monism’s insistence on the cause-law principle in light of the anomalism principle. If mental events must instantiate physical properties – strict-law properties – and all causal relations must be covered by strict causal laws, then an event’s having such properties is a necessary condition for standing in causal relations. Davidson can agree with all of this. However, Honderich concludes from this that it is only ‘by virtue’ of its physical properties that an event stands in causal relations. This ‘by virtue’ claim then allows Honderich to move directly to the conclusion that only physical properties are causally relevant. What enables (i.e., is necessary for) causation is thus held to be responsible for causation (for a similar argument, see Kim 1993a, 22). But this is disputable. Not all necessary conditions of some phenomenon are explanatory conditions – conditions ‘responsible for’ that phenomenon. For example, a person can talk only if she was born – having been born is thus a necessary condition of her talking. However, her ability to talk is not explained by her having been born. It is not ‘by virtue’ of being born that she can talk, though the former is a necessary condition of the latter. Davidson himself expresses skepticism about the intelligibility of his critics’ use of the ‘by virtue’ locution in discussing Anomalous Monism (Davidson 1993, 6, 13) (see further §6.1, and for discussion of a related mistake concerning the bearing of physical determinism on freedom see supplement B.3.1).

The point that causal explanation is interest-relative, and must be sensitive to what one wants to explain, is not novel. But it is a point that often gets lost in epiphenomenalist criticisms of Anomalous Monism. However, it is also a point that invites important questions about the relations and differences between causation and explanation. As we have seen, Davidson insists on a firm distinction between causation, which is a metaphysical relation between particular events independently of how they are described, and explanation, which concerns events only as they are described in particular ways. Thus, he is inclined to dismiss the epiphenomenalist concerns about Anomalous Monism, and the locution of ‘causally relevant and irrelevant properties’ as based upon a confusion and certainly a different metaphysical framework than that assumed by Anomalous Monism. Events themselves – rather than any particular aspect or property of them – cause other events. Our descriptions of these events (what we speak of as their aspects or properties) explain why effects described in certain ways occur. Mental descriptions explain actions by rationalizing them – making them intelligible in light of the agent’s beliefs and purposes. The mental event that explains an action by rationalizing it is a cause of that action – otherwise, as discussed above (§2.2), there would be no way of answering the question concerning which of the many mental events that rationalize some action are the ones that actually explain its occurrence (see further supplement E.2). That mental event is also a physical event (as is the action it explains), according to Anomalous Monism, because it stands in causal relations (the interaction principle), and thus (given the cause-law and anomalism principles) must instantiate physical (strict-law) properties. But properties themselves don’t cause anything, only instances of properties – and these are the events that bear or instantiate them.

Is this point really responsive to Honderich’s concern? It is instructive to observe how some proponents of Anomalous Monism (Macdonalds1986) have attempted to defend Davidson from epiphenomenalist concerns by exploiting the point in the following way. Honderich has insisted that the only causally relevant properties of events are strict-law properties. But properties don’t cause anything; only their instances do. And particular, causally interacting mental events are instances of strict-law properties, according to the monistic component of Anomalous Monism. (Recalling the discussion of the ‘because’ argument in §2.2, since reasons causally explain actions, and due to mental anomalism, actions must be physical, the claim that mental events cause physical events is justified.) So Honderich’s nomological property principle must itself be amended to the Principle of the Nomological Character of Causally Relevant Instances of Properties. Mental properties are causally relevant, according to this principle, because their instantiations are also instances of nomic properties, and nomic properties are paradigm examples of causally relevant properties.

However, it can reasonably be wondered how this line of thinking is responsive to the point that appears to be underlying Honderich’s nomological property principle. After all, the issue under consideration has been whether mental properties are relevant to explanation (recall the discussion of the color of the fruit). The Macdonalds’ insistence that they are turns on the point that only instances of properties cause anything. But instances are neither relevant nor irrelevant. At best, they either have or lack causal efficacy– they are or are not responsible for bringing about some effect or other. The Macdonalds have perhaps established that because physical events are paradigm examples of causally efficacious events, then since, according the Anomalous Monism, mental events are physical events, mental events inherit any causal efficacy had by physical events. But that is quite different than establishing that mental properties are explanatorily relevant – that an event’s being a mental kind of event matters to the occurrence of any effects in the world. (The Macdonalds (1995) later acknowledge this and develop an account of explanatory relevance; for discussion, see supplement E.2.)

E.2 Explanatory Epiphenomenalism

Recognition of an irreducible explanatory role for reasons, and mental properties generally, as expressed in the dual explananda strategy (§6.2), does not by itself fully do away with epiphenomenalist concerns. In light of mental anomalism, why think that reason explanations are causal explanations, rather than a sui generis form of noncausal explanation? The need for a causal relation between mental events cited in reason explanations (see discussion of the ‘because’ problem in §2.2) doesn’t settle this issue once we have distinguished between causal relations and explanations (see section §6). Neil Campbell (1998 and 2005) argues for an interpretation of Anomalous Monism on which while mental events stand in causal relations with each other, reason explanations are not causal explanations. He calls this ‘explanatory epiphenomenalism’. Causal explanations explain because they fit singular causal occurrences into true causal generalizations (2005, 442–43). However, reason explanations, according to Campbell, are more plausibly thought of as functioning along different lines: reasons explain actions by revealing the agent’s rationality in so acting in light of those reasons (2005, 445). The point of this explanatory epiphenomenalism is not to criticize reason explanations as illusory – as wrongly claiming to explain – but rather to point up limitations of the domain of causal explanation. On this view, not all genuine explanations are causal – reason explanations are sui generis and capture a distinctive pattern in nature that would otherwise be missed. This is an interesting twist on the noncausal theories of actions (§2.2), acknowledging both Davidson’s criticism of them (the ‘because’ problem) in insisting on causal efficacy (reasons cause (extensional) actions) yet also acknowledging their disavowal of causal explanation as a model for reason explanation and refusal to accept that only causal explanations capture real patterns in nature. It also explicitly connects the distinctive feature of reason explanation – rationality – to the reality of reasons and mental properties generally (see §4.2). Campbell is influenced in this line of thinking by McDowell’s reading of mental anomalism (§4.1.3), though he goes beyond McDowell in denying that reason explanations are causal.

Campbell acknowledges that reasons which explain actions are backed by generalizations (ceteris paribus ones), but claims that this fact “takes a back seat” to the normative dimension of rationalizing explanation, because generalizations record mere tendencies while rational explanations observe what agents should do – the fact that the generalizations hold is explicable by rationality, something that is not true of other forms of explanation (2005, 445). (Though Campbell doesn’t argue this explicitly, in this vein one might also point to the fact that the truth of the generalizations does not – indeed, cannot – explain the fact that the relations covered are rational. This is a key point in Kim’s reconstruction of the argument for mental anomalism – see §4.1.2.) The epistemic satisfaction that reason explanations provide is achieved differently than that of causal explanations – not by being an instance of a generalization, but rather by being a realization of rationality.

By itself, this point does not appear to rule out the idea that reasons explanations are causal explanations. Indeed, it seems to be a non sequitur. First, in other cases where explanations covered by generalizations are not thereby causal explanations – for instance, logic – the obstacle has to do with not meeting basic conditions for causal explanations, such as temporal succession. But such conditions are met in reason explanations. Second, as we have seen (§4.1.2), Davidson emphasizes that a normative component also underlies the physical realm in constitutive a priori principles. On Campbell’s reasoning, this would prevent physical explanations from being causal, which is clearly wrong. We see once again a problematic consequence of interpretations of the argument for mental anomalism (Kim’s and now Campbell’s) that highlight a strong distinction between normative and descriptive principles. Third, and related to this point, reason explanations might be different than other causal explanations in their subject matter without this preventing them from being causal. After all, there are other causal explanations that are also backed only by ceteris paribus generalizations, and a point analogous to the one Campbell emphasizes – that their constitutive feature explains why such generalizations hold rather than vice-versa – has also been made concerning biological explanations in particular and functional explanations generally (Macdonalds 1995; for related discussion, see below).

If rational explanations could be satisfying despite failing to be instances of generalizations, then there might be an asymmetry sufficiently strong to block the assimilation of reasons explanations to causal explanations. But Campbell does not argue for this, either in itself or as an interpretation of Davidson, and it has no clear independent plausibility – the failure of a reason explanation to generalize would in fact prevent it from being a satisfying explanation (see also §4.1.4). Reason explanations are satisfying both because they show that an action is a realization of rationality and also because such explanations are instances of generalizations. Both conditions are necessary for reasons explanations, and cannot be pulled apart. None of this appears to be inconsistent with reasons explanations being causal explanations, and seems merely to individuate reason explanations from those that are made relative to different explanatory interests.

However, Campbell provides an additional and conceptually distinct point in favor of an asymmetry between the two that would block assimilating reason explanations to causal explanations. Even though, for example, hurricanes and catastrophes don’t stand in strict lawlike relations, the explanation of the latter by the former is causal because we have at least a rough understanding of how hurricanes function in terms of underlying mechanisms – the physical properties co-instantiated by meteorological events. But the point of mental anomalism is to deny that there can be any such understanding in the case of reasons. Therefore, “without a means of connecting reason explanations to their underlying causal processes in an intelligible fashion there is nothing to account for their explanatory force if such explanations are taken to be a species of causal explanations” (Campbell 1998, 29). Campbell’s point seems to be that without an explanatory relationship between reason explanations and the physical causal explanations underlying them, not only is there no justification for holding reason explanations to be causal; moreover, the problem of causal explanatory competition and exclusion pressed by Kim (§6.2) rears its head. Campbell’s explanatory epiphenomenalism is thus a form of the dual explananda solution to Kim’s problem, but one that further eschews explanatory competition between reason and physical explanations by distinguishing not only their distinct explanans and explananda but also the form of explanation (causal or not) that relates them.

The Macdonalds (1995) hold, as Campbell does, that (1) mental events are causally efficacious by virtue of being identical with physical events, and that (2) despite the anomalous nature of reason explanations, they capture distinctive patterns that account for their explanatory usefulness. But the Macdonalds don’t see this as incompatible with reason explanations being causal. They cite biological events and explanations as meeting (1) and (2) – the pattern consisting in appearance of design resulting from natural selection – but emphasize that these are nonetheless causal explanations. It thus appears that the difference between their attitudes is due to the second point raised by Campbell – whether there exists an account of how such explanations explain. For the Macdonalds, there is an underlying account of design and natural selection in terms of underlying “physico-chemical changes”. That suggests that for the Macdonalds there needs to be an account of reason explanations in terms of the nomological properties that mental events instance in order for reasons explanations to be causal explanations – precisely what Campbell claims is ruled out by Davidson’s mental anomalism. And the Macdonalds, who accept mental anomalism, indeed hold that the patterns in both cases – rational and biological – must be “reliably produced” by co-instanced nomological properties. However, and crucially, such reliability does not depend upon or entail exceptionless relations (see further below).

Campbell’s explanatory epiphenomenalism is in effect calling into question the Macdonalds’ underlying assumption that patterns genuinely occurring “in nature” – and thus real – must bear an explanatory relation to nomological properties. On Campbell’s view, that assumption is unwarranted, particularly given the already established causal efficacy of mental events. Reason explanations can pick out genuine patterns “in nature” without being either causal explanations or explainable in terms of underlying nomological properties. The relevance of this for the current discussion is whether the Macdonalds’ “reliable production” requirement is consistent with Anomalous Monism, which Campbell in effect denies. We have already seen (§5.3) that the Macdonalds endorse a supervenience relationship between mental and physical properties, and claim that their conception of supervenience is consistent with both the strict nature of supervenience laws and also mental anomalism because we can’t currently state such laws and so are not in a position to predict or explain mental events on their basis. As we have also seen, this is consistent with – indeed, seems ultimately to require – a strict explanatory/predictive relationship between physical and mental properties, making mental anomalism into a merely epistemic and not metaphysical thesis.

If one rejects this particular attempt to square supervenience with mental anomalism, then the quagmire of §5.3 arises – how to articulate a conception that provides for dependency without exceptionless prediction or explanation. Interestingly, the Macdonalds’ later requirement of “reliable” (as opposed to exceptionless) relations is suggestive of a ceteris paribus conception of supervenience, which we earlier saw as an unexplored and potentially fruitful direction to take in trying to square Anomalous Monism with an explanatory priority of the physical through the supervenience relation. (Campbell valiantly but implausibly tries to fit Davidson’s appeals to supervenience into Campbell’s explanatory epiphenomenalist framework by claiming that while reason explanations depend upon physical causal explanations, this is a semantic and not a metaphysical thesis (Campbell 1998, 37–38), and so presumably does not entail an explanatory relationship between the mental and the physical of the kind pressed by the Macdonalds. Much of what we have seen Davidson saying about supervenience is inconsistent with this interpretation.)

Since Campbell allows that reason explanations make actions intelligible without falling under exceptionless generalizations (mental anomalism), he can’t object that physical properties cannot make reasons intelligible simply because of a non-strict relation between them. It might be responded that physical properties cannot make reasons intelligible because “making intelligible” means making rationally intelligible, and this is not something that physical properties are in the business of providing (as emphasized by the dual explananda approach). While this is true, it is both question-begging and misses the point. Explanations always make phenomena intelligible within the terms of the particular explanatory framework. This is the point of the idea that explanation is interest-relative. Within the framework of understanding the relationship between physical and mental properties, ceteris paribus relations can make it intelligible why some mental event is occurring – because some physical event is occurring, and there is a ceteris paribus relationship between them – even while not providing an exceptionless explanation for its occurrence. Rational intelligibility is not the only kind of intelligibility. As Campbell himself notes, the sort of explanation that physical properties can provide for hurricanes is neither exceptionless nor rational, but it nonetheless makes it intelligible why a hurricane is occurring or how it is behaving within its own particular explanatory framework.

The debate about asymmetries between reason and other explanations does not end here, and though we cannot explore it any further, it is worth briefly noting one direction in which it inevitably goes that is close to the heart of Anomalous Monism. A plausible question to ask at this point is why the generalizations – whether strict or ceteris paribus – hold at the most basic level between physical properties, between mental properties, and between the two. In other words, why are the fundamental laws of our world as they are? Now, an initial answer to this question might be that it is in the nature of the properties related that the laws are what they are. However, this answer masks an important asymmetry between the different kinds of generalizations, emphasized by both Kim and McDowell (§§4.1.2–4.1.3) and reflected in Campbell’s discussion. In the case of both purely physical and psychophysical generalizations, we can conceive of the possibility of different relations holding. (Though this point is powerfully intuitive, it is no simple task to make precise. For relevant discussion, see Chalmers 1996, Mumford 2009 and Latham 2011). This is the case whether the generalizations are strict or ceteris paribus. In the case of psychophysical generalizations in particular, there is no convincing answer forthcoming to the question of why these mental properties supervene on these rather than other physical properties. However, to the question “Why are these actions explained by these reasons?”, there is a deeper level of explanation available. And the answer isn’t simply “Because of a rational relation between the two”. Rather, it is because that rational relation has no conceivable alternative. It is not intelligible to us that those reasons might explain very different kinds of actions – this is the point of Davidson’s claim that rationality is constitutive of the mental (see related discussion in §4.1 and supplement D.8). As we have seen, it isn’t at all obvious that this asymmetry entails that reason explanations are not causal explanations, as Campbell insists. But there is no question that this asymmetry is important to our understanding of Anomalous Monism and the nature and status of reason explanations.

E.3 Supervenience and the Explanatory Primacy of the Physical

As we have seen, Davidson never argues for either the supervenience of the mental on the physical or the explanatory primacy of the physical. Here we consider some reasons for these claims that are consistent with the spirit of Anomalous Monism. One reason for the primacy claim is that while every mental event is physical, not all physical events are mental. Another is that, with Anomalous Monism already established, the only strict laws are strict physical laws. And given causal closure of the physical (see supplement C.1), every event that occurs must then have a physical explanation. These points motivate a kind of explanatory primacy to physical properties – they always explain the occurrence of physical events, which is not true of mental properties. However, none of these reasons motivates the sort of explanatory relation between physical and mental properties expressed in the supervenience claim (indeed, Davidson 1970, 214 describes these features of the physical as ‘bland’ and not indicative of any significant ontological bias towards the physical). Typically, supervenience claims are driven by the thought that one can only affect the higher-order (in this case mental) properties of an event or object by affecting its lower-order (physical) properties. One creates a beautiful statue by altering the physical properties of the marble; therefore, aesthetic properties supervene on physical properties. It appears that Davidson has in mind this sort of picture of the relation between physical and mental properties when he maintains that physical properties “determine” mental ones, and that the latter are “strongly dependent” on the former (Davidson 1973a, 253). But it is difficult to see how this claim is motivated in Davidson’s framework. Davidson offers no argument in favor of supervenience, and although he does think that it is required of any acceptable theory of the relation between the mental and the physical (Davidson 1993, 9), he never explains this requirement.

One possible explanation that is close to Davidson’s concerns is the following. If an event involving a change in mental properties occurs (e.g., a person comes to believe something), there must be some physical explanation of that event. Davidson’s causal extensionalism would lead him to say that what is explained is the event of coming to believe, but under a physical description. (And, as discussed in supplement C.1, causal closure of the physical holds that all physical events have physical explanations.) So the physical explanation is not of that change in mental properties directly. But the physical explanation does concern a physical change that coincides with the change in mental properties. Without some sort of supervenience claim, this coincidence would be merely that – a brute fact that could just as well be otherwise. It would be perfectly possible for that exact same physical change to be accompanied by a completely different mental change or even no mental change at all. In considering the mental change, absolutely no explanatory significance could be accorded to the physical change. But since many mental changes (i.e., actions) involve overt bodily movements for which physical explanations are possible, this would threaten to bifurcate completely the explanations of bodily movements and actions; the former would have nothing to do with the latter, which seems quite counterintuitive and also surprising given Davidson’s claim that actions are bodily movements (Davidson 1971, 49).

Continuing this line of thinking, a related reason for the supervenience claim, not mentioned by Davidson, is that it can otherwise appear completely miraculous that the ceteris paribus generalizations in psychology and the strict physical laws can so often converge in their predictions and explanations of events (see Cussins 1992, sect. 3, for discussion). If there are no explanatory relations between mental and physical properties, how is it possible that the psychological generalization that some individual will, given that he has certain reasons, open an umbrella on a certain occasion, predict an event that is also (under a different description) predicted by the physical laws? Such convergences occur countless times each day, but can appear to be only repeated miraculous coincidences unless there are explanatory relations between the mental and physical domains. Supervenience is one way of filling this explanatory void.

One final rationale for positing supervenience is that it can provide a criterion for distinguishing between those properties of an event that can play a role in genuine explanations and those that cannot. Why, for example, do many reject astrological explanations of human behavior as genuinely explanatory? On this view, it would be because astrological properties do not supervene on physical properties – there is no dependency or explanatory relation between the two. (For related discussion, see supplement E.2.)