Abilities

In the accounts we give of one another, claims about our abilities appear to be indispensable. Some abilities are so widespread that many who have them take them for granted, such as the ability to walk, or to write one’s name, or to tell a hawk from a handsaw. Others are comparatively rare and notable, such as the ability to hit a Major League fastball, or to compose a symphony, or to tell an elm from a beech. In either case, however, when we ascribe such abilities to one another we have the impression that we are making claims that, whether they are worth saying or not, are at least sometimes true. The impression of truth exerts a pressure towards giving a philosophical theory of ability. It is not an option, at least at the outset, to dismiss all our talk of ability as fiction or outright falsehood. A theory of ability can be reasonably expected to say what it is to have an ability in a way that vindicates the appearance of truth. Such a theory will deserve the name ‘philosophical’ insofar as it gives an account, not of this or that range of abilities, but of abilities generally.

This article falls into three parts. The first part, Sections 1 and 2, states a framework for discussing philosophical theories of ability. Section 1 will say more about the distinction between abilities and other powers of agents and objects. Section 2 will make some formal distinctions that are helpful for framing any theory of ability. The second part, Sections 3 and 4, surveys theories of ability that have been defended in the philosophical literature. Section 3 concerns the most prominent kind of theory, on which abilities are to be understood in terms of a hypothetical relating an agent’s actions to her volitions. Section 4 concerns theories that are not hypothetical in this way. The third part, Section 5, turns to two significant applications of a theory of ability. This section considers what role such a theory can play in the free will debates and in giving an account of disability. Debates about free will often involve claims about agents’ abilities, and many have hoped that getting clearer on abilities themselves could resolve, or at least shed light on, such debates. Similarly, some theorists of disability have hoped that appealing to the notion of ability can help explicate what it takes to have a disability. The aim of this last section will be to assess whether these hopes are reasonable ones.

• 1. A taxonomy
  • 1.1 Dispositions and other powers
  • 1.2 Demarcating abilities
  • 1.3 Knowledge how and skill
• 2. Distinctions in ability
  • 2.1 General and specific abilities
  • 2.2 Further distinctions
• 3. Hypothetical theories of ability
  • 3.1 The conditional analysis
  • 3.2 Problems for the conditional analysis
  • 3.3 Sophisticated conditional accounts
  • 3.4 Alternative hypothetical accounts
• 4. Non-hypothetical theories of ability
  • 4.1 The modal analysis
  • 4.2 The modal analysis: extensional adequacy
  • 4.3 The modal analysis: logical considerations
  • 4.4 Alternative non-hypothetical accounts
• 5. Applying the theory of ability
  • 5.1 Ability and the free will debates
  • 5.2 Ability and disability
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. A taxonomy

What is an ability? On one reading, this question is a demand for a theory of ability of the sort described above. On another reading, however, this question simply asks for a rough guide to what sort of things we are speaking of when we speak of ‘abilities’. So understood, this question is not asking for a theory of ability, but for an explanation of what exactly a theory of ability would be a theory of. This section will offer an answer to this question on this second, more modest, reading.

1.1 Dispositions and other powers

It will be helpful to begin by considering a topic that is related to, but nominally distinct from, abilities: dispositions.

Dispositions are, at first pass, those properties picked out by predicates like ‘is fragile’ or ‘is soluble’, or alternatively by sentences of the form ‘x is disposed to break when struck’ or ‘x is disposed to dissolve when placed in water.’ Dispositions so understood have figured centrally in the metaphysics and philosophy of science of the last century (Carnap 1936, 1937; Goodman 1954), and also in influential accounts of the mind (Ryle 1949). They are like abilities in many significant respects, in particular in the fact that they are properties of things that can exist even when not manifested: as a glass may be fragile even when it is not broken, so may a person have the ability to raise her arm even when she is not raising her arm.

While dispositions have been central to contemporary philosophical discussions, they do not exhaust the range of the possibilities inherent in things. Especially notable, for present purposes, are those that are intimately connected to agency. These include the susceptibility of things to be acted on in certain ways — such as the edibility of an apple, or the walkability of a trail — that the psychologist J.J. Gibson called affordances (Gibson, 1979). These include also the powers of action that we ascribe to things, of the kind observed by Thomas Reid: ‘Thus we say, the wind blows, the sea rages, the sun rises and sets, bodies gravitate and move’ (Reid 1788/2010, 16; Reid himself regarded these locutions as “misapplications” of active verbs, based on erroneous views of the grounds of powers). Finally, and crucially, these include the powers of agents themselves.

In light of this ontological diversity, it will be useful to have a term that encompasses all the possibilities inherent in things and in agents. Let us reserve the word ‘power’ for that general class. Dispositions, as defined above, are a proper subset of powers more generally. Affordances, as sketched above, are another one. And abilities, in a sense still to be defined, are yet another.

It may yet be that dispositions are especially privileged among the powers. For instance, they might be more fundamental than the other powers, in the sense that other powers may be reduced to them. It has been proposed, for instance, that affordances may be reduced to dispositions (Scarantino 2003). And we will consider in some detail, in Section 3.4, the proposal that abilities themselves may be reduced to dispositions. But our initial hypothesis is that dispositions are simply one member of the broader family of powers, albeit one that has received a great measure of attention in the philosophical literature.

1.2 Demarcating abilities

Abilities, then, are a kind of power. What kind of power, precisely, is an ability? As the term will be understood here, there are two additional conditions that a power must meet in order for it to be an ability. First, abilities are distinguished by their subjects. Abilities are properties of agents, rather than of things that are not agents. Objects have dispositions and affordances — as a glass is disposed to break when struck, or affords the drinking of liquid — but they do not have abilities. Being a power of an agent is not, however, a sufficient condition for being an ability. This is because agents have powers that are not abilities. Therefore, second, abilities need to be distinguished by their objects: abilities relate agents to actions.

Some examples may make the need for this second condition clear. Some powers, though properties of agents, do not intuitively involve any relation to action. Consider the power of understanding language. Understanding a sentence, while it is not wholly passive or arational, is not typically an action. In contrast, speaking a sentence is. Thus the power to understand French will not be an ability, on the present taxonomy. In contrast the power to speak French will be an ability, since it involves a relation to action. (See van Inwagen 1983, 8–13.)

So, as the term will be understood here, an ability is a power that relates an agent to an action. This way of demarcating abilities, while serviceable for our purposes, is not unproblematic. For it inherits the problems involved in drawing the distinction between actions and non-actions. First, there is the problem that the domain of action is itself a contentious matter. Second, there is the problem that, even if we have settled on an account of action, it is plausible that the domain of action will be vague, so that there are some events that are not definitely actions, but that are not definitely not actions either. Arguably both of these points about action apply, also, to the property of being an agent. If this is right, then the present account of ability, which is cashed out in terms of agency and action, will be correspondingly contentious and vague. Borderline cases may, in the end, generate problems for the theory of ability. But such problems will not be central here. For giving such a theory will be difficult enough even when we focus on paradigm cases of agency and action, and so on paradigm cases of ability.

Note there is a similarity between the present category of ability, as distinct from other powers, and the traditional category of active powers, where active powers are those that essentially involve the will (Reid 1788/2000). But it is not clear that these distinctions overlap exactly. For example, the power to will itself will clearly be an active power. It is less clear whether it will count as an ability, for the answer to that question will turn on the contentious question of whether willing is itself an action.

1.3 Knowledge how and skill

Some will expect an account of ability to also be an account of knowledge how, on the supposition that one knows how to perform a certain action just in case one has the ability to perform that action. This supposition, which we may call the Rylean account (since it is most explicitly defended in Ryle 1949, 25–61), has been challenged by intellectualists about know how, notably Stanley and Williamson (2001). Intellectualists argue that knowing how to perform an action is a matter of knowing a certain proposition. Stanley and Williamson’s account draws on observations about the standard treatment of embedded questions (‘know who’, ‘know where’, and so forth; see Karttunen 1977) to defend this idea. Specifically, they propose that knowing how to A is knowing that some way is a way for one to A. On this view, then, knowing how to A is clearly not the same thing as having an ability to A.

Authors who reject the Rylean account may nonetheless wish to uphold one of two weaker Rylean theses. (It bears noting that Stanley and Williamson reject both.) First, one might defend the Sufficiency Thesis, which says that ability implies know how. The Sufficiency thesis is incompatible with the intellectualist claim that know how requires knowledge of some proposition. Second, one might defend the Necessity Thesis, according to which know how implies ability. The Necessity Thesis is compatible with the view that know how requires (in addition to ability) knowledge of a certain proposition.

Still, also the Necessity Thesis has been challenged, often by appeal to cases like the following (adapted from Stanley and Williamson 2001). Imagine a retired ski instructor who is no longer physically capable of descending the slopes. One might think that it is possible for the ski instructor to retain their knowledge how to ski even when they have lost their physical ability. Intuitively, they might still be able to impart their know how on others. This suggests that know how does not imply ability.

A common way for defendants of the Necessity Thesis to respond to cases like these is to say that whether know how implies ability depends on our understanding of ability. In particular, if it suffices for ability that one can perform an act succesfully in some (set of) relevant circumstances (where these circumstances need not actually obtain), then there may be a sense in which the ski instructor in the example retains their ability to ski. It is ability in this sense, the argument goes, that is implied by knowledge how (for further discussion see Hawley 2003 and Cath 2019). Another response (developed in Boylan 2024) is to propose that there are two different readings of know how claims. On one reading, know how entails ability; on another it does not. The question then is whether any extant account of know how can explain both these readings.

Whatever our view of ability’s relation to know how, there is a further question at the intersection of these topics that bears consideration: how should we accommodate skills? Skillful action is often thought to involve a cognitive component. This suggests that having a skill is closely connected to having propositional knowledge. In line with this, some authors propose to adopt an intellectualist account of skill. For instance, Pavese and Beddor (2023) defend the view that skills are propositional knowledge states. On this view, knowledge how reduces to knowledge that, and having a skill to A just is having knowledge how to A. Therefore, having a skill reduces to having knowledge of some proposition.

Alternatively, one might suggest that having a skill is best understood as having an ability that meets certain further conditions. One oft-mentioned condition that is thought to distinguish skills from other abilities is that developing and maintaining a skill requires practice (e.g., McGeer 2018; Robb 2020; Shepherd 2021; Fridland 2021). Another influential suggestion concerning what sets skills apart is that their exercise involves “strategic control” (Fridland 2014, 2021). This is to say that “skilled agents are able to modify, adjust and adapt their practical intentions in ways that are appropriate, effective, and flexible given their overall goals” (Fridland 2021, p. 5939). This view allows that knowledge of certain propositions (e.g., ‘it is best to wait with A’ing given my circumstances’) plays an important role in skilled action, without suggesting that skill reduces to propositional knowledge.

Ultimately, accurately accounting for the nature of know how, skill, and their relationship to abilities remains an open and intriguing problem. For further discussion of the relation between ability and know how, see the entry on knowledge how.

2. Distinctions in ability

If one wants to give a theory of ability of the sort described at the outset, it is helpful for that theory to observe some formal distinctions that have been marked in the literature. This section canvasses some of the most important distinctions.

2.1 General and specific ability

The previous section was primarily concerned with distinguishing abilities from other powers. But there is also a distinction to be made within the class of abilities itself. This is the distinction between general and specific abilities (Honoré 1964; Mele 2003).

The distinction between general and specific abilities may be brought out by way of example. Consider a well-trained tennis player equipped with ball and racquet, standing at the service line. There is, as it were, nothing standing between her and a serve: every prerequisite for her serving has been met. Such an agent is in a position to serve, or has serving as an option. Let us say that such an agent has the specific ability to serve.

In contrast, consider an otherwise similar tennis player who lacks a racquet and ball, and is miles away from a tennis court. There is clearly a good sense in which such an agent has the ability to hit a serve: she has been trained to do so, and has done so many times in the past. Yet such an agent lacks the specific ability to serve, as that term was just defined. Let us say that such an agent has the general ability to serve.

The concern of this article will be general abilities in this sense, and unqualified references to ‘ability’ should be read in that way. But specific abilities will also be at issue. This is for at least two reasons.

The first is one of coverage: many of the proposals that are relevant to the understanding of ability, especially the classical ‘conditional analysis’ (discussed in Section 3.1 below), are naturally read as proposals about specific ability in the present sense, and a suitably broad conception of ability lets us keep these proposals within our domain of discussion.

The second reason is more properly philosophical. If we accept the distinction between general and specific abilities, then we want for our account of ability to accommodate both of them, and ultimately to explain how they are related to each other. For this distinction is not plausibly diagnosed as mere ambiguity; it rather marks off something like two modes of a single kind of power. There are at least two kinds of proposals one may make here. One, arguably implicit in many of the ‘new dispositionalist’ approaches to ability (§3.4), is that general ability is in some sense prior to specific ability: to have a specific ability is simply to have a general ability and to meet some further constraint, such as having an opportunity. Another proposal (suggested in Maier 2015) is that specific ability is in some sense prior to general ability: to have a general ability is simply to have a specific ability under a certain range of circumstances.

The idea that there is some sort of bipartite distinction to be made between abilities has been a prominent theme in contemporary work on ability. It has been endorsed and developed, in different contexts, by Whittle (2010), Glick (2012) and Vihvelin (2013). However, the bipartite distinctions introduced by these authors differ from one another in certain respects. How should we interpret this divergence? It could be that there exist several bipartite distinctions and that each proposed view tracks one of these. Alternatively, there might be a single distinction, so that only one of the classifications introduced by these (and other) authors tracks a genuine difference between two modes of ability.

2.2 Further distinctions

Besides the distinction between general and specific abilities, theorists of ability have proposed several further classifications. In this section, we discuss three of them. The first, developed by Simon Kittle (2015) differentiates global and local abilities. Kittle proposes that abilities can be thought of as ‘general’ in two different ways. On the one hand, abilities can be general in the sense already outlined: these are abilities that an agent may be said to possess even if she cannot exercise them given her circumstances. On the other hand, abilities can be ‘general’ (we will henceforth use ‘global’ to avoid terminological confusion) in the sense that they can be exercised across a wide range of possible circumstances. Local abilities, in contrast, can be exercised in only a narrow range of circumstances.

Plausibly, the distinction between global and local abilities isn’t binary but indicative of a spectrum: general abilities may be more or less global. To see this, let us return to the example of the tennis player who has a general (but not a specific) ability to serve. Suppose the tennis player is able to hit a serve only in conditions particularly conducive to playing tennis (e.g., minimal wind; access to a well-maintained court and racket; no distractions). The narrow range of conditions in which the agent can exercise her ability doesn’t make that ability specific. After all, the conditions specified need not actually obtain. But it does make the ability local.

Another, arguably more basic distinction is that between simple and intentional abilities. As Mele (2003) points out, there is a sense in which agents are able to do whatever they in fact do. For example, an agent who rolls a six with a fair die was able (in the simple sense) to do so. Yet there is also another sense of ability which requires that the agent is, in some relevant way, in control (though for a recent objection to the view that there is such a sense of ability see Mandelkern 2024). Mele calls ability in this more controlled sense an intentional ability. How much control over one’s performance is required to have an intentional ability is contentious. As in the case of the previous classification, one might think that the notions of ‘simple’ and ‘intentional’ ability indicate the existence of a gradient rather than a strict binary distinction: agents may have more or less control over the performance of an act.

A third distinction worth mentioning, drawn by Vihvelin (2013), is that between narrow and wide abilities. Narrow abilities are abilities that agents possess in virtue of their internal constitution. Thus, two intrinsic duplicates (governed by the same laws) have the same narrow abilities. In contrast, wide abilities are abilities that agents possess in virtue of the combination of their internal constitution and their surroundings. On first sight, the narrow/wide distinction might appear to coincide with the distinction between general and specific abilities. In each case, one type of ability is possessed only if the agent has the opportunity to exercise it. However, Vihvelin proposes that an agent who lacks a narrow ability to A at a given time may nevertheless have a general ability to A. Such an agent may generally (at most other times) possess the narrow ability to A.

While many questions remain about the best way to carve up abilities, it should be clear that distinctions between different types or senses of ability are important not just in their own right, but also if we wish to explicate certain other phenomena by appeal to abilities. Abilities have been invoked to account for knowledge, concept possession, free will, disability, and other phenomena. If agents can possess more than one type of ability, or possess an ability in various senses, then carefully specifying which type or sense is relevant will be crucial to appropriately account for these other phenomena.

3. Hypothetical theories of ability

The bulk of theories of ability that have been defended in the historical and contemporary literature have been what we might call hypothetical theories. On such views, to have an ability is for it to be the case that one would act in certain ways if one were to have certain volitions. One arrives at different theories depending on how one understands the volitions in question and how exactly these actions would hypothetically depend on them, but nonetheless these views constitute something like a unified family. Given their prominence and unity, it is natural to begin our survey of theories of ability with them.

3.1 The conditional analysis

The most prominent hypothetical theory of ability is what has come to be called the ‘conditional analysis’. In what follows, we will survey that form of analysis, the problems for it, and alternatives to it that are supposed to overcome those problems.

The conditional analysis of ability has at least two aspects. First, S has an ability to A just in case a certain conditional is true of her. Second, that conditional has the following form: S would A if S were to have a certain volition. The precise form such an analysis will take will depend on, first, how we interpret this conditional and, second, which volition figures in the antecedent.

It has been standard in the literature, when this first question has been raised, to understand the conditional as a subjunctive conditional (Ginet 1980), and we will assume in what follows that this is the best form of the conditional analysis. There has been some disagreement about whether it is a might or a would conditional that is relevant (for an account of this distinction, see Lewis 1973, 21–24), as well as about which volition is relevant. In the following, we will take the relevant conditional to be a would conditional, and the relevant volition to be trying, though nothing will hang on these selections, and the points to be raised would apply also to other forms of conditional analysis, mutatis mutandis.

We thus arrive at the following form of the conditional analysis:

(CA)

S has the ability to A iff S would A if S tried to A.

If (CA) were true, it would constitute a theory of ability in that it would say under exactly what conditions some agent has the ability to perform some action without making reference to the idea of ability itself.

The conditional analysis so understood has been subject to a fair amount of criticism, which will be reviewed in the following section. It bears noting, however, just how apt an account of ability it seems at first pass. It satisfies, at least at first approximation, the extensional constraints: there are many actions with respect to which a typical agent satisfies the relevant conditional, and also many actions with respect to which she does not, and these roughly correspond to her abilities. This imposes a demand even on those who wish to reject (CA), namely to explain why, if (CA) is simply false, it so closely approximates to the truth about abilities.

Its approximate satisfaction of the extensional constraints is also plausibly a reason why something like (CA) has found so many thoughtful advocates. It is at least strongly suggested, for example, by the following remarks from Hume’s Enquiry:

For what is meant by liberty, when applied to voluntary actions? We cannot surely mean that actions have so little connexion with motives, inclinations, and circumstances, that one does not follow with a certain degree of uniformity from the other, and that one affords no inference by which we can conclude the existence of the other. For these are plain and acknowledged matters of fact. By liberty, then, we can only mean a power of acting or not acting, according to the determinations of the will; this is, if we choose to remain at rest, we may; if we choose to move, we also may. Now this hypothetical liberty is universally allowed to belong to every one who is not a prisoner and in chains. (8.1; Hume 1748, 72)

Of course, Hume and many of those who have followed him have been attempting to do something rather more than to offer a theory of ability. Hume’s intent was to show that disputes over ‘question of liberty and necessity, the most contentious question of metaphysics’ have been ‘merely verbal’ (8.1; Hume 1748, 72). Whatever we may think of this striking claim, however, there is a dialectical gap between it and the alleged truth of (CA). To anticipate a theme that will be central in what follows, we must be careful to distinguish between, on the one hand, the adequacy of various views of ability and, on the other, the more contentious metaphysical questions about freedom to which they are doubtlessly related. It is the former that will be our concern in this section.

3.2 Problems for the conditional analysis

(CA) says that satisfying a certain conditional is both sufficient and necessary for having a certain ability. There are two kinds of counterexamples that may be brought against (CA): counterexamples to its sufficiency, and to its necessity. Let us take these in turn.

Counterexamples to the sufficiency of (CA) have been most prominent in the literature. Informally, they are suggested by the question: ‘but could S try to A?’ There are a variety of ways of translating this rhetorical question into a counterexample. We may distinguish two: global counterexamples, according to which (CA) might always get the facts about ability wrong, and local counterexamples, according to which (CA) might sometimes get the facts about ability wrong.

Begin with global counterexamples. Let us say that determinism is true at our world. Familiar arguments purport to show that, if this is the case, then no one has the ability to do anything, except perhaps for what she actually does. But if (CA) is true, then agents would have the ability to perform various actions that they do not actually perform. This is a counterexample turning on precisely the kinds of contentious questions about free will and determinism that, as indicated above, we are for the moment setting aside. (We will return to the issues purportedly raised by determinism below in Section 5.1).

It seems, however, that we can show that (CA) is false even relative to premises that are shared between various disputants in the free will debates. This is what is shown by local counterexamples to (CA). One such example is given by Keith Lehrer:

Suppose that I am offered a bowl of candy and in the bowl are small round red sugar balls. I do not choose to take one of the red sugar balls because I have a pathological aversion to such candy. (Perhaps they remind me of drops of blood and … ) It is logically consistent to suppose that if I had chosen to take the red sugar ball, I would have taken one, but, not so choosing, I am utterly unable to touch one. (Lehrer 1968, 32)

Such an example shows that (CA) is false without assuming anything contentious in debates over freedom. It turns rather on a simple point: that psychological shortcomings, just as much as external impediments, may undermine abilities. (CA), which does not recognize this point, is therefore subject to counterexamples where such psychological shortcomings become relevant. We may, if we like, distinguish ‘psychological’ from ‘non-psychological’ ability, and claim that (CA) correctly accounts for the latter (this sort of strategy is suggested, for example, by Albritton 1985). But our ordinary notion of ability, that of which we are attempting to give a theory, seems to involve both psychological and non-psychological requirements. And if that is correct, then Lehrer’s example succeeds as a counterexample to (CA) as a theory of our ordinary notion of ability.

Counterexamples to the necessity of (CA) have been less frequently discussed (though see Wolf 1990), but they also raise important issues about ability. Consider a case where a good golfer misses an easy putt. Given that this golfer tried to make the putt and failed to, it is false that she would have made the putt if she had tried to; after all, she did try it and did not make it. But, as a good golfer, she presumably had the ability to make the putt. So this seems to be a case where one can have an ability without satisfying the relevant conditional, and hence a counterexample to the necessity of (CA).

Here the defender of (CA) might avail herself of the distinction between specific and general abilities. (CA), she might say, is an account of what it is to have a specific ability: that is, to actually be in a position to perform an action. The golfer does lack this ability in this case, as (CA) correctly predicts. It is nonetheless true that the golfer has the general ability to sink putts like this. But (CA) does not purport to be an analysis of general ability, and as such is compatible with the golfer having that sort of ability (an approach very much like this is suggested in Locke 1962). Again, the plausibility of this response will hang on the viability of the distinction between specific and general abilities. And, whatever the merits of this response, the objection to the sufficiency of (CA) remains.

We appear to be at an impasse. On the one hand, the thought that abilities are in some sense hypothetical is a deep and persistent theme in historical and contemporary work on ability. On the other hand, the simplest development of this thought — the conditional analysis (CA) — appears to face obvious and well-known counterexamples both to its sufficiency and necessity, even when we waive the global counterexamples raised by determinism. Which way to go? We might reject the idea that abilities admit of a conditional analysis. Or we might give a somewhat more sophisticated conditional analysis.

3.3 Sophisticated conditional accounts

How might the conditional analysis of ability be made more sophisticated? Since the conditional analysis is a conditional that involves a volition, there are at least two ways one might do this. First, one might be more sophisticated about the nature of the volition: why do we focus on trying? Second, one might be more sophisticated about the conditional: what precisely are the semantics of this conditional?

Donald Davidson takes the first way, and identifies the choice of volition in a traditional conditional analysis as the culprit:

The antecedent of a causal conditional that attempts to analyze ‘can’ or ‘could’ or ‘free to’ must not contain, as its dominant verb, a verb of action, or any verb which makes sense of the question, Can someone do it? (Davidson 1973, 68)

Davidson suggests that we may overcome this difficulty at least by endorsing:

A can do x intentionally (under the description d) means that if A has desires and beliefs that rationalize x (under d), then A does x. (Davidson 1973, 68)

But it is not clear that Davidson’s revision in fact answers objections to the sufficiency of the traditional conditional analysis. For these objections did not essentially depend on a verb of action figuring in the antecedent of the analyzing conditional. Consider Lehrer’s case again. It seems true that if Lehrer’s imagined agent has desires and beliefs that rationalized that action under the description ‘eating a red candy’—namely, adopting the analysis of Davidson 1963, a desire for a red candy and a belief that this action is a way of eating a red candy—she would eat a red candy. But the trouble is precisely that, in virtue of her psychological disability, she is incapable of having this desire, and so cannot perform this action intentionally. Pace Davidson, the traditional objection to the conditional analysis seems to turn not on the specific volition selected but rather on the very idea that ability is to be understood in terms of a simple conditional dependence of action on the will.

This brings us to a second way of responding, which is to suggest that ability instead involves a sophisticated conditional dependence of action on the will. To begin to develop this kind of approach, we can ask: what kind of conditional is at issue in CA? Though this point is not always explicitly recognized, this conditional is a subjunctive or counterfactual conditional: it concerns what would happen if an agent were to try. Much of the canonical literature on the conditional analysis antedates adequate semantics theories of the counterfactual, notably the Stalnaker-Lewis semantics (Stalnaker, 1968; Lewis 1973). In this way, many of the authors in the tradition do not even have the formal resources to explore this second way of responding.

One recent work that addresses these formal questions is (Mandelkern et al. 2017). This discussion proposes an ‘act conditional analysis’ (ACA) on which an agent S is able to perform some act A just in case “there is some practically available action such that if S tries to do it, she does A” (Mandelkern et al. 2017, 314). The (ACA) revises the conditional analysis (CA) by introducing a layer of existential quantification over modality, and introduces a welcome degree of formal sophistication into the discussion of ability claims. For present purposes, however, it bears noting that the authors do not propose to give a reductive account of what it is for an act to be “practically available”, although this is an agentive and indeed abilitative notion (Mandelkern et al. 2017, 318). In virtue of what is choosing a candy practically available to me, but not to the agent described by Lehrer? The authors do not purport to answer the question, but in this sense their proposal remains incomplete as a theory of ability.

Whatever the prospects for this particular proposal, there is a broader methodological point here that ramifies well beyond (CA), and indeed beyond the prospects for a conditional analysis of ability more generally. Any account of abilities owes us, among other things, an account of ability-ascriptions. This is perhaps true of philosophical topics generally, but it is true or ability in particular. Even philosophers who are explicit in their “refusal to take language as a starting point in the analysis of thought and modality” (Lewis 1983, xi) are prone to make explicit appeal to language when the topic turns to ability, as occurs in (Lewis 1976) or (Taylor 1960). When it comes to ability, it is difficult to even identify the topic under consideration without using or mentioning certain phrases, notably ‘can’ and ‘is able to’.

Happily, our understanding of such phrases is steadily improving. While there has long been considerable philosophical interest in expressions such as ‘can’ and ‘is able to’, there is nothing recognizable as a rigorous semantic theory of such terms prior to the foundational work of Angelika Kratzer, recently revised and collected in (Kratzer 2012). Kratzer’s work has been central to natural language semantics, and its significance for philosophical work is still being appreciated. We address the question of whether Kratzer’s semantics might inform a theory of ability in Section 4, where we consider the modal analysis of ability. Here we simply note that the question of whether Kratzer’s account is correct as a theory of agentive modals remains an open one. Any adequate account of ability can be expected to give an account of ability ascriptions, and therefore needs to attend to this ongoing debate in the semantics of modal expressions.

3.4 Alternative hypothetical accounts

If we reject a conditional analysis of ability, we might still give an account of ability that is broadly ‘hypothetical’ in Hume’s sense. The guiding idea of hypothetical accounts of ability is that there is a certain internal relationship between ability and volition, and that this relationship involves a certain kind of dependence. The guiding idea, we might say, is that what it is to have an ability to A is for one’s A’ing to depend mostly or entirely on one’s volitions with respect to A. The conditional analysis (CA) formalizes this insight in a simple way, but it is not the only way in which this might be done.

Several authors have revisited the thought that we may give a broadly hypothetical account of ability, without endorsing the problematic claim (CA). This is the view of ability that has been defended by Smith (2003), Vihvelin (2004, 2013), and Fara (2008). Following Clarke (2009), we may label this view as the “new dispositionalism”.

What unifies the new dispositionalists is that they return to the conditional analysis of ability in light of two thoughts. The first thought is one already noted: that there is a variety of power, dispositions, that is similar in many respects to abilities. The second thought is that there are well-known problems of giving a conditional analysis of dispositions, in light of which many authors have been inclined to reject the long-assumed link between dispositions and conditionals. Taken together, these thoughts yield a promising new line on abilities: that though we ought to reject the conditional analysis of abilities, we may yet defend a dispositional account of abilities.

Why ought we reject the conditional analysis of dispositions? Consider the following analysis of the disposition to break when struck:

(CD)

x is disposed to break when struck iff x would break if x were struck.

Despite the intuitive appeal of (CD), there appear to be at least two kinds of counterexamples to it. First, consider a crystal glass that, if it were about to be struck, would transform into steel. This glass is disposed to break when struck, but it is not true that it would break if struck — the transformation renders this false. This is a case of finking, in the language of Martin (1994). Second, consider a crystal glass stuffed with styrofoam packaging. This glass is disposed to break when struck, but it is not true that it would break if struck — the packaging prevents this. This is a case of masking, in the language of Johnston (1992). In light of such cases, it seems we ought to reject (CD).

The bearing of these points on our earlier discussion of the conditional analysis is the following. There appear to be quite general problems for giving a conditional analysis of powers. So it may be that the failures of the conditional analysis of ability were not due to any fact about abilities, but rather to a shortcoming of conditional analyses generally. One way of overcoming this problem, if this diagnosis is correct, is to analyze abilities directly in terms of dispositions.

Such an analysis is proposed by Fara (2008), who argues:

S has the ability to A in circumstances C iff she has the disposition to A when, in circumstances C, she tries to A. (Fara 2008, 848)

The similarity of this analysis to the conditional analysis (CA) is clear. (Note that other new dispositionalists, notably Vihvelin and Smith, are sympathetic with the idea that conditionals do in the end have a central if complicated role to play in the analysis of dispositions, so their departure from (CA) is in a way less radical than Fara’s.) This raises several immediate questions, such as whether this analysis can overcome the problem of sufficiency that plagued those approaches (see Fara 2008, 851–852 for an affirmative answer, and Clarke 2009, 334–336 for some doubts). But a larger question looms, which is whether the abilities of agents can indeed be analogized to the dispositions of objects.

One way of bringing out what is missing is by appeal to the idea that there seems to be a connection between my abilities, in the sense of ability that is relevant to free will, and what is up to me. Clarke claims that this sort of connection fails on the new dispositionalist view of ability:

Although the presence of a fink or mask that would prevent one’s Aing is compatible with having a general capacity (the unimpaired competence to A), there is an ordinary sense in which in such circumstances an agent might well be unable to A …. If there is something in place that would prevent me from Aing should I try to A, if it is not up to me that it would so prevent me, and it it is not up to me that such a thing is in place, then even if I have a capacity to A, it is not up to me whether I exercise that capacity. (Clarke 2009, 339)

Thus the objection is that, while the new dispositionalist has perhaps offered a theory of something, it is not a theory of ability.

How should the new dispositionalist respond? One thought is that we are here again encountering the distinction between general and specific abilities. The new dispositionalist might contend that, while the agent described by Clarke lacks the specific ability to do otherwise, she has the general ability to do otherwise, and that it is this general ability of which the new dispositionalist is giving an account.

Other important recent work has pursued the resources for a broadly hypothetical account of ability in new ways. Notable here is (Jaster 2020), who defends a “success view” of abilities, which in a simplified version holds:

S has an agentive ability to A if and only if S A’s in a sufficiently high proportion of the relevant possible situations in which she intends to A.

Jaster’s analysis is non-conditional but is nonetheless hypothetical in the broader sense suggested here. It does not identify abilities with dispositions, though it shares formal features with certain treatments of disposition ascriptions, notably, as Jaster notes, that of (Manley and Wasserman 2008). Along with the other work cited above, it suggests that the development of some kind of broadly hypothetical analysis of ability remains a lively and open research program.

4. Non-hypothetical theories of ability

A second broad family of theories of ability is non-hypothetical. Proponents of non-hypothetical accounts reject the idea that ability is best characterized in terms of a link between an agent’s volitions and actions. The most established non-hypothetical account, especially within the logic and linguistics literature, is the modal analysis of ability. According to the modal analysis, ability claims are possibility claims: claims about what an agent does in some non-actual state of affairs (or ‘possible world’). We discuss the modal analysis and some of the challenges it faces in detail below. Besides the modal analysis, there is a further class of non-hypothetical theories that has come to receive increasing attention. Theories in this class differ from the modal analysis in that they do not take ability to be straightforwardly analysable in terms of what an agent does in some other possible world. We turn to this new class of non-hypothetical analyses in §4.4.

4.1 The modal analysis

Intuitively, claims about ability are tightly connected to claims about possibility. It is in some sense a truism that someone is able to perform some act just in case it is possible for her to perform it.

To develop this purported truism, begin with the thought that for S to have an ability to A it is necessary, but not sufficient, that it be possible that S does A. This claim will be contentious for various more specialized sorts of possibility, such as nomic possibility or practical possibility. But if we may help ourselves to the idea of possibility simpliciter (‘metaphysical possibility’), then this claim appears plausible. (We will survey some challenges to it below in Section 4.2.) In contrast, it seems implausible that this sort of possibility is a sufficient condition: there are any number of acts that that are metaphysically possible to perform that an agent might nonetheless not be able to perform.

This suggests a natural hypothesis. To have an ability to A is for it to be possible to A in some restricted sense of possibility. As nomic possibility is possibility relative to the laws of nature, and epistemic possibility is possibility relative to what an agent knows, so may ability be possibility relative to some independently specifiable set of conditions.

To render this hypothesis precisely, we may employ the formal framework of ‘possible worlds,’ which offers an elegant and powerful semantics for modal language. On this framework, a proposition is possible just in case it is true at some possible world. We can then say an agent is able to A just in case she A’s at some world (or set of worlds) that satisfy some independently specifiable set of conditions.

We thus arrive at the modal analysis of ability:

(MA)

S has the ability to A iff S does A at some world (or set of worlds) satisfying condition C.

(MA) is actually not itself an analysis but rather a template for a general family of analyses. Different members of this family will be distinguished by the different candidates they might propose for C, as well as whether they quantify over individual worlds or sets of worlds. Nonetheless, these analyses demonstrate sufficient theoretical unity that they may be viewed, at an appropriate level of abstraction, as a single approach to the analysis of ability.

Two points about (MA) bear noting. First, sometimes ‘modal’ is used loosely to describe phenomena that are connected to possibility (and necessity) in some way or other. The proponent of (MA) is concerned with modality in a stricter sense: she proposes that ability may be analyzed in terms of the precise framework of propositions and possible worlds just adumbrated. The opponent of (MA), in turn, grants that ability has something to do with possibility but denies that any such analysis succeeds.

Second, while (MA) has been presented as an alternative to (CA), (CA) is arguably just one particular version of (MA). For, as noted above, (CA) appeals to a subjunctive conditional, and the standard semantics for the subjunctive conditional (developed in slightly different ways in Stalnaker 1968 and Lewis 1973) involve quantification over possible worlds. Specifically, (on Stalnaker’s version) a subjunctive conditional is true just in case its consequent is true at the world where its antecedent is true that is otherwise maximally similar to the actual world. In these terms, (CA) is roughly equivalent to the following:

(CA_modal)

S has the ability to A iff S does A at a world at which S tries to A that is otherwise maximally similar to the actual world.

This is patently a version of (MA), with ‘S tries to A and is otherwise maximally similar to the actual world’ serving as condition C.

If this is correct, then most discussions of the analysis of ability in the twentieth century have focused on a special and somewhat idiosyncratic case of a much broader program of analysis, namely the program of giving a modal analysis of ability. The considerations brought forth in the remainder of this section, in contrast, are concerned with the general case.

4.2 The modal analysis: extensional adequacy

There are two questions that might be raised for this proposal about ability. First, does ability indeed admit of some kind of modal analysis? Second, if it does, how exactly are we to spell out the details of that analysis — in particular, how are we to articulate condition C? Let us begin with the first, more basic, question.

According to (MA), performing an act at some possible world (or set of worlds) is both necessary and sufficient for having the ability to perform that act. One way of challenging this claim is to deny the necessity claim: that is, to argue that it is sometimes the case that an agent is able to perform an act that she does not perform at any possible world.

This is an argument that has in fact been made by several authors. Descartes, for one, appears to have argued that God is such an agent (Curley 1984). A genuinely omnipotent being, one might argue, should be able to perform any act whatsoever, even the impossible ones. This view of omnipotence is contentious, but it is not clear that it should be ruled out formally, by the very analysis of ability, as (MA) does. Spencer (2017) argues that even non-omnipotent agents may sometimes have the ability to perform acts that they do not perform at any possible world.

Let us grant, however, that the possibility of performing an act is a necessary condition for performing that act, and that in this sense an attribution of ability entails a possibility claim. Another way to object to (MA) would be to challenge the sufficiency claim. Specifically, one might question whether there is any specification of C such that every agent who does A at a world (or set of worlds) that satisfies C is able to A. Before addressing this question, let us briefly review some proposed articulations of C.

To begin with, one might suggest that what an agent is able to do just is what is possible for her to do relative to the past and the laws of nature (van Inwagen 1983), or else what is possible relative to all agential-level facts (but not all physical-level facts) (List 2014). In each case, condition C specifies that relevant worlds share some of their features with the actual world. Note that the above specifications aim to capture in the first place what it takes to have a specific ability. General ability would seem to require a rather different analysis.

Alternatively, on a seminal account introduced by Lewis (1976) and refined in Kratzer’s treatment of ‘can’ (1977, 1981, 2012), C is contextually determined. This is to say that whether a statement of the form ‘S has the ability to A’ is true depends on the context in which it is made. To illustrate this point, consider the following example. Suppose that it is possible for Jane to ride her bike given various stable facts about her internal constitution, but not given the fact that her bike was stolen. On the contextualist specification of (MA), whether these facts about Jane and her environment suffice to say that she has the ability to ride her bike depends on the precise fact about Jane the ability claim is meant to pick out. In some contexts, we are concerned with what Jane is able to do (almost) precisely as things stand. In others, we care about what she can do quite generally, independently of whether she has access to the right resources. Condition C differs depending on these interests. An advantage of this approach is that it can be employed to provide truth conditions for general and specific ability claims alike.

Regardless of its appeal as a semantics for ability ascriptions, one might be skeptical of the promise of this contextualist version of (MA) as an analysis of ability in the material mode. In particular, while it may seem plausible that ability claims expressed in different contexts track different features of an agent, one might think it implausible that an agent’s possession of abilities associated with those features depends, metaphysically speaking, on the interests of speakers in some context.

Returning now to whether (MA) provides a sufficient condition for ability, some theorists have argued that there is no possible specification of C such that every agent who A’s at a world that satisfies C is able to A. For instance, Schwarz (2020, see also Willer 2021) proposes that no particular specification of C guarantees that the agent’s Aing is, in the right way, under their control. Put differently, it being possible (relative to some set of facts) that an agent A’s doesn’t seem to ensure that the agent can actively bring it about that they A.

Since there are countless possible specifications of C, showing definitively that (MA) cannot provide a sufficient condition for ability is a difficult task. Still, the objection points to a broader concern: even if we can specify C such that (MA) delivers a sufficient condition for ability, it remains to be seen whether this can be achieved without appeal to some other agentive modal notion in the process (for discussion see Maier 2015). Suppose, for example, that for (MA) to specify a sufficient condition, the relevant restriction can only be formulated as follows: ‘for S to be able to A is for it to be possible that S A’s relative to what is within S’s power to do’. Since this version of (MA) appeals to the ability-adjacent notion of what is within an agent’s power to do, it arguably fails to provide a reductive analysis of ability in terms of S’s Aing at some (set of) possible world(s).

4.3 The modal analysis: logical considerations

A different way to resist the view that ability admits of a modal analysis is developed in a prescient discussion by Anthony Kenny (Kenny 1975; the presentation of Kenny here is indebted to the discussion in Brown 1988). Kenny argues that, if something like (MA) is indeed true, then ability should obey the principles that govern the possibility operator in standard modal logics. Kenny claims that ability fails to satisfy the following two principles:

(1)

\(A \to \Diamond A.\)

Informally, (1) expresses the principle that if an agent performs an action, then she has the ability to perform this action. This is, Kenny argues, false of ability.

(2)

\(\Diamond(A \lor B) \to (\Diamond A \lor \Diamond B).\)

Informally, (2) expresses the principle that if an agent has the ability to perform one of two actions, then she has the ability to perform either the first action or the second action. This is, Kenny argues, false of ability.

Let us begin with (1). Kenny claims that this principle is false in light of cases like the following: ‘A hopeless darts player may, once in a lifetime, hit the bull, but be unable to repeat the performance because he does not have the ability to hit the bull’ (Kenny 1975, 136). This kind of ‘fluky success’ has been extensively discussed in the philosophical literature — perhaps most famously in Austin (1956) — in order to make a variety of points. Kenny’s insight is to observe that these simple cases tell against the modal analysis of ability, as they violate an axiom of many modal logics, namely any system as strong as the system T (for an introduction to various systems and their axioms, see the entry on modal logic).

A simple response to this point is to deny that T (or any stronger logic) is the correct logic for ability. To deny this is still to allow for a treatment of ability within the framework of possible worlds. Notably, the modal logic K is one that fails to validate (1). A natural response to Kenny’s first point, then, is to say that K, rather than T or some stronger system, is the correct modal logic of ability.

This response is not available, however, in response to Kenny’s second objection. Recall that objection was that (2) is true of possibility but not of ability. Here the retreat to weaker modal logics will not work, since (2) is provable on the weakest standard modal logic, namely K. Yet the parallel claim does not seem true of ability. Kenny gives the following example:

Given a pack of cards, I have the ability to pick out on request a card which is either black or red; but I don’t have the ability to pick out a red card on request nor the ability to pick out a black card on request. (Kenny 1975, 137)

This then appears to be a case where S has the ability to A or B but lacks the ability to A and lacks the ability to B. So it appears that (2) is false of ability. In light of this Kenny concludes that ‘if we regard possible worlds semantics as making explicit what is involved in being a possibility, we must say that ability is not any kind of possibility’ (Kenny 1975, 140).

To appreciate Kenny’s conclusion, it is instructive to work through why precisely this is a counterexample to (MA). Consider an agent S who has the ability to pick a red card or a black card, but does not have the ability to pick a red card or the ability to pick a black card. According to (MA), S has the ability to A iff S does A at some world (or set of worlds) satisfying condition C. Consider the case where (MA) appeals to a single world, not a set of worlds. If S has the ability to pick a red card or pick a black card, then by (MA) there is a world w satisfying condition C where S picks a red card or black card. Then either S picks a red card at w or S picks a black card at w. Then, applying (MA) now in the other direction, S has the ability to pick a red card or S has the ability to pick a black card. But that, by assumption, is not the case. Since (MA) is the only substantive premise appealed to that argument, (MA) must be rejected.

Note that this argument turned essentially on adopting the version of (MA) which appeals to a single world, rather than a set of worlds. So one way of responding to this objection is by appealing to sets of worlds in the modal analysis of ability. Modal accounts that appeal to sets of worlds are ‘non-normal’ in the sense that they do not satisfy the axiom K, but they remain true to the letter of (MA) as well as the spirit of modal analyses generally, insofar as they avail themselves only of possible worlds and quantification thereover. This type of view has been proposed by Mark Brown, who argues that, if we take accessibility relations to hold between a world and a set of worlds, then we may capture talk of ability within a possible worlds framework that is broadly in the spirit of standard views (Brown 1988; for recent proposals along these lines see Kikkert 2022; Storrs-Fox 2023). Views of this type aim to capture that not just any instance of S’s Aing entails that S was able to A. Instead, an agent must succeed reliably enough across certain nearby worlds for their Aing to count as sufficiently controlled.

Alternatively, we may take this point to militate in favor of a return to hypothetical theories of ability, since, at least on Lewis’s view of subjunctive conditionals, it may be that a disjunction follows from a counterfactual claim without either of its disjuncts following from that claim (Lewis 1973, 79–80).

4.4 Alternative non-hypothetical accounts

The foregoing has indicated serious concerns about the adequacy of two orthodox approaches to ability: the conditional analysis (CA), and the modal analysis (MA), of which (CA) is arguably just a special case. This raises the question of what a non-hypothetical and non-modal account of ability and its attribution might look like.

Since abilities are a kind of power, one natural idea is to analyze ability in terms of some better understood power. As we have seen in Section 3.4, this is the route the new dispositionalist takes when she proposes to analyze abilities in terms of dispositions. However, where the new dispositionalist subsequently gives a hypothetical account of dispositions, proponents of other power-based views characterize the type of power in terms of which they analyze ability in a non-hypothetical manner.

A first non-hypothetical analysis of ability as a kind of power can be found in the work of Barbara Vetter (2013, 2015). On Vetter’s view, to have an ability is to have a certain kind of potentiality. Both agents and objects may possess potentialities, and their possession of these potentialities is more fundamental, metaphysically speaking, than what goes on at other possible worlds. Unlike traditional dispositions, which involve a dyadic relation between a stimulus and a manifestation (for example: a glass is disposed to break when struck), potentialities involve a monadic relation to a manifestation (for example: a glass has the potential to break). On first sight, this makes potentiality well-suited to account for ability. Abilities, like potentialities, appear to involve a monadic relation to an act (e.g., I am able to play tennis). One challenge for this view is that Vetter takes potentialities to obey the principles of possibility that caused trouble for (MA) (see §4.3). This means that an explanation of why ability violates these principles must be sought outside of its being a kind of potentiality.

A different power-based view is suggested by Helen Steward, whose work emphasizes the traditional notion of a “two-way power” (Steward 2012, 2020; see also Alvarez 2013). Steward argues that actions are exercises of two-way powers— “powers which an agent can exercise or not at a given moment, even holding all prior conditions at that moment fixed” (Steward 2020, 345). These are to be contrasted with one-way powers, which manifest whenever their manifestation conditions are realized, as a fragile glass that breaks whenever it is struck. Unlike the new dispositionalists on the one hand and Vetter on the other, Steward sees a fundamental asymmetry between agents, who are bearers of two-way powers, and mere objects, who are bearers only of one-way powers. It is natural then to think that what it is to have an ability is to have a two-way power of a certain kind, and that a theory of ability should follow from an account of agency in terms of two-way powers.

Still other approaches to ability reject (CA) and (MA) while rejecting also the thought that having an ability is having some other kind of power — be it a disposition, a potentiality, or a two-way power. One such account is developed by John Maier (2018, 2022), who argues that ability is best understood in terms of options. Roughly, options are those acts that are open to an agent at a given time. Importantly, what it takes for an action to be open to an agent is not further analyzable in terms of quantification over possible worlds. To have a general ability, according to Maier, just is to have a particular pattern of options. This view thereby runs counter to many other accounts of ability, including new dispositionalist views and Vetter’s potentiality-based account, which take general abilities to be fundamental.

Finally, a fourth type of non-hypothetical account might be gleaned from Lewis’ posthumously published compatibilist account of abilities. Lewis’ analysis, roughly, is that S has the ability to perform an action A just in case there is some basic action, B, such that (i) doing B would constitute doing A, and (ii) there is no obstacle to S’s doing B. The problem of giving a theory of ability then becomes the problem of giving a theory of obstacles, something at which Lewis, in his outline, makes a beginning (see Beebee et al. 2020 for further discussion).

It is something of an open question whether on this proposal, ultimately, facts about abilities reduce to facts about what happens at other possible worlds. What is clear is that this proposal, if it can be understood as a form of (MA) at all, would constitute a significantly more complex modal analysis than that suggested by Lewis in earlier work (1976). Lewis’ proposal is an inspiration for further research in at least two ways. First, it indicates that Lewis, a systematic philosopher of modality, saw the problem of giving an analysis of ability as a significant outstanding project. Second, it demonstrates that genuinely novel approaches remain available and the project of giving an analysis of ability may yet be in its early stages.

5. Applying the theory of ability

Thus far our questions about abilities have been formal ones: we have been asking what it is to have an ability, without concerning ourselves with the substantive work that a theory of ability might have to do. But abilities are in fact central to a range of philosophical topics. Let us therefore consider some applications of a theory of abilitiy.

5.1 Ability and the free will debates

Perhaps the most prominent substantive role for a theory of ability has been the uses to which accounts of ability have been put in the free will debates.

Questions about abilities have figured most prominently in debates over compatibilism. ‘Compatibilism’ is used in many ways, but let us understand it here as the thesis that the ability to perform actions one does not perform is compossible with the truth of determinism, which we may take to be the view that the facts about the past and the laws jointly determine the facts about the present and all future moments, or what we might call compatibilism about freedom and determinism. Insofar as compatibilism, so understood, has been explicitly defended, these defenses have often made appeal to theories of ability, notably the conditional analysis and its variants.

In our discussion of the conditional analysis, we distinguished between global and local counterexamples to hypothetical theories of ability, where the former appealed to the fact that any such theory would render ability compatible with determinism which, according to the objector, it is not. These counterexamples are in a certain way dialectically ineffective: if someone doubts whether determinism is in fact incompatible with ability claims, these kinds of counterexamples will not convince her. But compatibilitsts have often been guilty of what seems to be the opposite mistake. Namely, they have offered theories of ability which show abilities to be compatible with determinism, and have argued from this to the claim that such abilities are indeed compatible with determinism.

The shortcomings of this strategy are nicely diagnosed by Peter van Inwagen. After surveying the local counterexamples that arise for various hypothetical theories of ability, van Inwagen imagines that we have arrived at the best possible hypothetical theory of ability, which he labels “the Analysis”. van Inwagen then writes:

What does the Analysis do for us? How does it affect our understanding of the Compatibility Problem? It does very little for us, so far as I can see, unless we have some reason to think it is correct. Many compatibilists seem to think that they need only present a conditional analysis of ability, defend it against, or modify it in the face of, such counter-examples as may arise, and that they have thereby done what is necessary to defend compatibilism. That is not how I see it. The particular analysis of ability that a compatibilist presents is, as I see it, simply one of his premisses; his central premiss, in fact. And premisses need to be defended. (van Inwagen 1983, 121)

van Inwagen’s point is that, provided the incompatibilist has offered arguments for the claim that such abilities are incompatible with determinism—as, in van Inwagen’s presentation, the incompatibilist has—the production of an analysis is as yet no answer to those arguments. For those arguments are also arguments, inter alia, against the compatibilist’s favored account of ability.

There are, then, at least two obstacles for the compatibilist who wishes to appeal to an account of ability in defense of compatibilism. First, there is the general difficulty of actually giving an extensionally adequate theory of ability. Now there is also van Inwagen’s point just outlined, namely that arguments for the incompatibility of abilities and determinism are, inter alia, arguments against any theory of ability that is congenial to the compatibilist. Taken together, these points seem to pose a serious obstacle to any theory of ability that is both compatible with determinism and in accord with our ordinary judgments about what ability requires.

One response is to make a distinction between two kinds of compatibilist project. (Compare Pryor 2000 on responses to skepticism). One project is to convince someone moved by the incompatibilist’s arguments to retreat from her position. Call this ambitious compatibilism. For precisely the reasons van Inwagen gives, it is doubtful that any theory of ability will suffice for a defense of ambitious compatibilism. There is another project, however, that the compatibilist might be engaging in. Let us say that, for some reason or other, she herself is not convinced by the incompatibilist’s argument. She is still left with an explanatory burden, namely to explain, if only to her own satisfaction, how it could be that abilities are compatible with the truth of determinism. Here the compatibilist’s aim is not to convince the incompatibilist of the error of her ways, but simply to work out a satisfactory conception of compatibilism. Let us call this modest compatibilism. This distinction is not often made, and it is not always clear which of these projects classical compatibilists are engaged in. If the latter project is indeed part of classical compatibilism, then we may grant many of the above points while still granting the theory of ability a central place in defenses of compatibilism. For it may be that, though a theory of ability is of no use to the ambitious compatibilist, it has a crucial role to play in the defense of modest compatibilism about freedom and determinism.

Finally, in addition to bearing on questions about freedom and determinism, a theory of ability can be expected to have something to say about another issue central to the free will debates, namely the metaphysical conditions on moral responsibility. Consider so-called ‘Frankfurt cases’. These are cases due to Frankfurt (1969), where an agent chooses to and performs some action A while at the same time there is some other action B such that, had the agent been about to choose B, an ‘intervener’ would have altered the agent’s brain so that the agent would have chosen, and performed, A instead. One question about such cases is whether the agent, in the actual sequence of events, had the ability to B. Frankfurt’s intuition, and that of most others, is that she did not. Given the further claim that the agent is nonetheless morally responsible for doing A, this case appears to be a counterexample to what Frankfurt calls the Principle of Alternative Possibilities (PAP): an agent is morally responsible for Aing only if she had the ability to perform some action other than A.

In recent years, several philosophers — notably the new dispositionalists such as Smith (2003), Vihvelin (2004, 2013), and Fara (2008) — have advocated revisiting our judgments about such cases in light of the theory of ability. As noted in Section 3.4, these authors suggest that the ability to do otherwise should be understood dispositionally, as something that persists even in the presence of certain counterfactual interveners. When applied to a Frankfurt case, this view seems to imply that the agent in question does have the ability to do otherwise after all. We might restate the question raised by these discussions as follows: should ‘ability’ in (PAP) be understood as general ability, or specific ability? If general ability is what matters, then Frankfurt cases may indeed not tell against (PAP), for the agent retains the general ability to do otherwise. If it is specific ability that matters, however, the challenge to (PAP) stands (see also Whittle 2010). This is a vital question for understanding the purported connection between ability and questions of moral responsibility, whichever theory of ability we accept.

5.2 Ability and disability

An altogether different yet equally important area in which theories of ability may be thought to take on an explanatory role is the philosophy of disability. In particular, some authors propose that to have a disability just is to lack some ability or set of abilities. Let us call this the ability-based view of disability. If the ability-based view is correct, then developing an accurate theory of abilities should help us gain a better understanding of disability too. As it turns out, several complex issues arise in trying to make this view precise.

To begin with, proponents of ability-based views disagree on the abilities that matter when it comes to disability. On the one hand, there are views with a central naturalistic component, which take the relevant abilities to be determined by a species norm. On these views, to be disabled is to lack an ability to do things that individuals in one’s reference class (e.g., human adults) are ordinarily able to do (Buchanan et al. 2000, p. 286; see also Boorse 2010). Thus, a person who is deaf is disabled on this view because they lack the ability to hear other people’s voices, which is something that most others in their reference class are able to do. On the other hand, there are evaluative views, which take the abilities that are relevant to disability to be determined by some political, ethical, or social criterion. For example, one might hold that the abilities that matter when determining whether someone is disabled are those we are entitled to as a matter of justice (Begon 2023), those that are important for well-being (Nussbaum 2006), or those we are socially expected to have (Jenkins and Webster 2021). Whether a deaf person is disabled depends, on these views, on whether they lack abilities that are relevant given the view’s preferred social or political criterion.

It bears emphasizing that the distinction between naturalistic and evaluative ability-based views is not as neat as the above passage may seem to suggest. Some authors combine elements of each approach. For instance, one might hold that only the lack of some subset of species-normal abilities is relevant to disability. Which subset is relevant may then be determined by political or social concerns.

Both naturalistic and evaluative approaches have been challenged. Here, we will focus on two challenges for ability-based view of disability more generally. The first challenge, raised by Elizabeth Barnes (2016), is that there are various conditions that we consider to be disabilities but that do not clearly result in a lack of ability. Take, for instance, fibromyalgia, a condition that tends to manifest as fatigue and chronic pain. On first sight, it is not obvious which abilities a person with this condition lacks. In response, some have suggested that there is a clear set of abilities that a person with this condition lacks if we consider abilities to perform temporally extended actions. Both fatigue and chronic pain may interfere with one’s ability to work a 40-hour week, for instance (see Gregory 2020).

A second challenge arises on the common assumption that having abilities is valuable. If abilities are valuable, and disability just is a lack of abilities, this would seem to imply that disability is a “bad difference” (Barnes 2016). That claim conflicts with the judgments of many members of the Disability Pride Movement, who perceive disability as something to be celebrated rather than as a negative form of bodily difference or a special type of disadvantage. There are several ways in which proponents of an ability-based view might respond to this worry. Firstly, some authors simply insist that disability is a ‘bad difference’. In fact, they argue, this observation helps justify spending resources on accommodations for disabled people. Secondly, some proponents of evaluative views claim that lacking socially expected abilities does not by definition make one worse off, even if it does put one at risk of marginalization (Jenkins and Webster 2021). Defining disability as a lack of socially expected abilities may thus be thought to be compatible with the Disability Pride Movement’s celebration of bodily difference. Finally, one might accept that having abilities is valuable, yet reject the idea that having more abilities is always preferable. If having more abilities isn’t always good, then lacking some abilities isn’t always bad.

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disability: definitions and models | action | compatibilism | conditionals | dispositions | incompatibilism: arguments for | knowledge how | logic: modal

Acknowledgments

We are grateful to the many people who have provided feedback on this entry since its initial publication in 2009. JM would especially like to thank John Bengson, Vanessa Carr, Luca Ferrero, John Martin Fischer, Romy Jaster, Simon Kittle, Michael Nelson, Helen Steward, Barbara Vetter, Kadri Vihvelin and Ann Whittle. Thanks finally to the SEP Editors for their assistance.