Academic Freedom

First published Sat Oct 17, 2026

The organizational form that came to be called “universities” developed over the course of the 11th–13th centuries in western Europe. From an early date they differed from other forms of educational institutions such as cathedral schools by virtue of their corporate self-governance, a degree of independence from both the Catholic Church and political authorities. That degree varied and was always contested, but the normative commitment to it (and willingness to defend it) shaped what has become one of the longest-lasting of medieval European institutions.

“Academic freedom” as a system of professional norms, explicit commitments, and sometimes legal rights draws on that tradition, but is much newer, dating only to the 19th century in Germany and the 20th century in the influential articulation it found in the United States. The idea resembles in some respects liberal rights such as freedom of speech, but it was not derived from those rights. It is acknowledged and defined in some international charters and in the domestic constitutional law of some countries, but the main development of the idea has been extralegal. It is variously thought to be essentially a corporate right of universities, or disciplines, or units within universities; a guild-like privilege of the professoriate; a system of professional ethics for internal university governance; or a special kind of individual human right. Its grounding is nearly as contested. This conceptual and normative muddiness belies a substantial, albeit incomplete, consensus on core practices and commitments.

Broadly speaking, that consensus includes rights of individual scholars to research, to study, and to teach within universities, according to their intellectual and professional judgment, subject to professional and disciplinary standards about method but not subject to orthodoxy as to conclusions. It concomitantly includes the autonomy of academic units— universities as such, but also larger scholarly communities such as disciplines, and smaller units such as departments or faculties— to govern themselves in setting such standards. Non-orthodoxy and scholarly associational self-governance will be recurring themes of the entry.

Academic freedom is thus interesting as a hybrid concept: corporate and individual, derived inductively from institutional practice but normatively systematized, having something of the character of internal professional ethics and something of the character of general rights-claims.

It is moreover of interest to philosophers, and not only because professional philosophers today are generally academics employed in universities. The broad freedom of inquiry that partly inspires academic freedom is the kind of ideal we retrospectively attribute to the Socratic foundations of western philosophy. With less anachronism and more historical certainty, we can say that philosophers were among the key figures who developed and articulated the university-centered idea of academic freedom: Wilhelm von Humboldt in the 19th century, John Dewey in the 20th. In recent decades philosophers have played a less central role in thinking about it, with scholars in the professional disciplines of law and education more often taking the lead. There are, however, signs of renewed philosophical interest in the last decade (Lackey ed. 2018a), due in part to an upsurge in violations of, challenges to, and confusion about academic freedom and its worth.

1. History

Beginning with the Universities of Bologna (1088 CE), Oxford (1096), and Paris (1150)— these are conventional dates for what were in all cases gradual institutional developments (Rashdall 1895)— and with a rapid proliferation thereafter, medieval European scholars clustered together in associations that became increasingly formal and corporate. They began as self-reinforcing local clusters: a few expert instructors drawing students to a city, the paying clientele of students in turn creating demand that encouraged instructors. Formalization on the contemporaneously developing guild model of masters and apprentices paid benefits: the ability to negotiate terms with host cities, but also the ability to confer widely-legible credentials by admitting a newly trained scholar as a master in turn.

By the 1150s, the reality of the scholarly community at Bologna was clear enough to be recognized by a grant of imperial privilege, the Authentica Habita of Holy Roman Emperor Frederick Barbarossa, subsequently inserted into the Corpus Iuris Civile as a general provision of the Roman civil law. Some of the protected rights reflected existing, if contested, practice, including the always-controversial right for scholars to be tried by internal tribunals or else clerical ones rather than local civil courts. But also among the protected privileges were, crucially, freedom of movement, the right of scholars not to be molested, taxed, or to have their goods seized in travelling to and from Bologna. The norm was subsequently generalized to scholars at other universities as well.

First Bologna and then other universities drew students from across Latin Catholic Europe. Bologna was for centuries the preeminent institution for education in the recovered Roman civil law as well as in canon law, and that shared training in turn helped to spread civil law as legal practice far and wide. Paris came to hold a similar status in the study of theology, providing a path to advancement in clerical offices for students from across the Catholic world. The evolution of their institutional forms was stamped by the fact that they brought many foreigners into the cities where they were located. Indeed the English and French word nation derives from a kind of corporate organization of students by countries of origin within universities, from the Latin natio to be born. At Bologna the distinction was simply between Italians and non-Italians, and at Oxford northerners and southerners, but most famously at Paris, French, Normans, Picards, English, and later Germans. But this cosmopolitan fact was vulnerable to the complex political and jurisdictional patchwork of medieval Europe; travel over long distances involved passing through the territories of many different rulers. The norm of free travel extended by the Authentica Habita was thus an important piece of protection of university scholars qua scholars.

In the 1200s, both popes and Emperors further confirmed the corporate autonomy and self-governance of universities, guaranteeing a degree of immunity from local civil or ecclesiastical interference. The institutions so recognized came to be known as studia generale, educational institutions marked by openness to non-local students; instruction in arts and in at least one of the higher faculties; and instruction in large part by qualified masters. (Studium generale is the closest medieval category to, in our sense, “university;” universitas was a generic term for encompassing corporate organizations in the civil law.) The practice of confirmation of autonomy was a deliberately imitative one. One way in which a school might elevate its claim to be a studium was with a papal bull incorporating by reference, in the standard example, the privileges and rights held by the University of Paris.

This spread of a category of institutions, studia generalia, made possible the rule of mutual recognition. The ius ubique docendi recognized the right of a master trained at one university to teach at another without being subject to further examination by the second. Ius ubique docendi evolved through a combination of customary deference to older universities and papal confirmation of the status of newer ones. Despite that partly-papal origin, once the norm was in place, it created a kind of self-governance of the academic profession as a whole. Scholarly qualifications were set, not by local political or religious authorities, but by the expectations of those who themselves had scholarly qualifications. The practice allowed for an institutionally decentralized and yet somehow unified body of scholars, and engendered a longstanding expectation that this scholarly community possessed self-governing authority beyond that held by an individual studium.

These norms were not self-enforcing, and were far from universally respected. Over half a millennium of political and religious contestation, civil or religious authorities (or both) were often too powerful in practice to ignore. Those with authority over university governance were often allied to, or eager to curry favor with, some powerful faction. Detailing this history lies far outside the scope of this article. The point of interest is not that the norms were inviolable or universally adhered to, but that they existed at all, and persisted despite those political and religious conflicts, despite both the medieval power of the Church and the early modern power of the Crown.

These medieval and early modern practices — institutional self-governance for the studium, collective scholarly definition of expectations for the profession, and some kinds of immunity for the person of a scholar— encompassed a great deal of what we today call academic freedom, but hardly all of it. They carved out what is sometimes called libertas scholastica (Vozar 2025), the liberty of the school, on analogy with the libertas ecclesia, the freedom of the corporate church from imperial and civil interference established by the outcome of the Investiture Controversy. Norms of individual scholarly autonomy, including (though not only) freedom within the university itself, drew on different traditions and were not clearly articulated until the 19th century.

Libertas philosophandi, the freedom of the individual philosopher to think and inquire free of the demands of orthodoxy, was an early modern idea, not a medieval one (Sutton 1953). Galileo appealed to such an idea a few times, and Spinoza introduced the phrase into the philosophical vocabulary (Sutton 1953). It was sometimes invoked in early modern universities, but was far from being universally embraced, and tellingly was not understood as a distinctive norm of university life (Vozar 2025). The ideal of unconstrained philosophical inquiry had ongoing appeal through the Enlightenment, but in the “Republic of Letters” rather than in universities as such.

The liberal individualist philosopher and Prussian educational reformer Wilhelm von Humboldt did the key work of infusing a university with a commitment to individual scholarly liberty, a fusion that became academic freedom in the modern sense. In creating the new University of Berlin as an institution committed not only to teaching but also to original research, including in the liberal arts, he articulated akedemische Freiheit, which combined Lehrfreiheit, the freedom to teach according to one’s best understanding, and Lernfreiheit, a freedom of students to learn in a self-directed way without mere memorization, recitation, and indoctrination. Lehrfreiheit encompassed freedom of research inquiry as well as freedom to teach according to one’s judgment, since that judgment should be informed by such inquiry. In that sense, Humboldt considered research a slightly subordinate part of the university’s core mission, supporting the teaching enterprise rather than rivalling it.

Humboldt’s reforms nonetheless initiated the development of what became the model of the research university. It spread past Berlin through Prussia and Germany over the course of the nineteenth century, then began to influence educational innovations in the United States in particular. Johns Hopkins University was founded in 1876 and the University of Chicago in 1890, both private institutions explicitly inspired by the German system, offering the research-based Ph.D. across the arts and sciences disciplines. Those disciplines themselves began to be organized in nationwide associations dedicated to the advancement of research in their respective fields: economics (1885), history (1889), philosophy (1900), political science (1903), and so on, typically led by scholars coming from the German tradition or from one of its new American offshoots, rather than from the older teaching and denominational institutions. Over the rest of the twentieth century, the research university became the dominant model of elite institutions of higher education around the world.

John Dewey received his Ph.D. from Johns Hopkins and joined the Chicago department of philosophy just a few years after the latter university’s founding. During his decade at Chicago, he wrote the first in-depth English-language account of academic freedom, not putting forward any claim to invention (he referred to “the questions summed in the phrase academic freedom,” taking for granted that the phrase was familiar), but setting forth a unified account of its meaning and justifications. The argument noted the accelerating pace and clear value of research in the natural sciences. Dewey stressed the need for comparable progress in the “social and moral sciences,” progress that could only be hoped for if those disciplines cast off the weight of dogma and orthodoxy, as astronomy had once done and evolutionary biology was in the course of doing. He characterized “freedom of inquiry and instruction” as the key distinction between universities and other institutions whose “purpose is to disciple rather than to discipline.” (1902 [2024, 52]) Impairing that freedom, he identified as dealing “a vital wound to the university itself.”

Dewey later created the opportunity to give his ideas a lasting impact in 1915 when he cofounded (with the German-trained Johns Hopkins philosopher Arthur Lovejoy), and became the first President of, the American Association of University Professors (AAUP). The formation of the AAUP came in the wake of a wave of faculty firings, mostly in the social sciences, mostly on grounds of political views and statements that were unacceptably radical in the eyes of university leaders, trustees, or donors. While overt religious heterodoxy had traditionally been professionally dangerous in the denominational American teaching colleges, the new research universities faced increasing demands to impose specifically political orthodoxy. Professional disciplinary associations, individually or jointly, initially took the lead in investigating and criticizing such violations. The AAUP replaced those ad hoc solutions with a permanent committee on academic freedom, and— crucially— an account of the general principles. Dewey wasn’t himself an author of the 1915 “Declaration of Principles on Academic Freedom and Academic Tenure,” but it is thoroughly faithful to the ideas he had laid out in 1902.

The AAUP account differs at least in emphasis from Humboldt’s vision in a few ways. One is that it focuses on Lehrfreiheit, the rights of professors, and explicitly brackets (without denying) Lernfreiheit, the freedom of students. A second is its defense of “extramural utterances,” speech to the general public. And a third is the distinctively Deweyan attitude toward both research and extramural speech, as being useful in informing democratic politics with the benefit of expertise. Each of these will be discussed later in this article.

The 1915 Declaration, the subsequent 1940 AAUP “Statement of Principles on Academic Freedom and Academic Tenure,” and an intervening 1925 joint “Statement of Principles on Academic Freedom and Academic Tenure” between the AAUP and several associations of universities and colleges, have together set out the most influential understanding of the concept and its values, not only in the United States but eventually worldwide. Much subsequent development in the US has taken the form of official commentaries on the 1940 principles. With the twentieth-century rupture in the tradition of academic freedom in German universities, it was the AAUP rules and norms that informed later international documents (Magna Charta Universitatum 1988, UNESCO 1997). The concepts that emerged, although contested, are widely shared across national and institutional contexts. As Beaud (2020, 612) puts it, “the language differences do not threaten the existence of a universal idea of academic freedom. Just as there is a single ‘idea of the University’ which enables us to understand that we are talking about the same subject, regardless of where the institution exists, there is a single ‘idea of academic freedom… Proof of the universality of academic freedom can be seen in the way it resists legal or economic requirements in regard to university structuring. It survives regardless of the legal status of universities, be they mostly state-funded, as are the majority in France, Germany and the rest of Europe, or mostly privately funded, as in the United States. In both cases, academic freedom must be acknowledged; only the type of threat to academics themselves changes.” The tradition that runs from Humboldt through Dewey and the AAUP to UNESCO and the Magna Charta Universitatum is not univocal but it is continuous and coherent enough to allow analysis of a concept in part through the institutional documents.

In the debates and disagreements that will be surveyed below, the AAUP principles are sometimes the object of interpretive dispute, and are usually a shared point of reference. Differences between the 1915 and 1940 statements, or differences of emphasis between the 1940 statement and subsequent interpretations, are sometimes important, but in general it is common in the literature to treat all of these as varying articulations of a shared underlying set of norms.

2. Core ideas

2.1 Principles and institutions

The combined AAUP principles include three core freedoms and two institutions necessary to their realization. The freedoms are, in the 1915 phrasing, “freedom of inquiry and research; freedom of teaching within the university or college; and freedom of extramural utterance and action.” The last will be explained in section 4. The AAUP statement suggested that the freedoms of research and of teaching were the most widely understood aspects of the principle, and the most secure. (The former, at least, probably remains true.) Applications and details may be complicated, but there is something intuitively accessible about the idea that academic freedom means both that scholarly instructors may make their own decisions about what and how to teach, and that scholarly researchers may make their own decisions and about what and how to research, free to follow their arguments and evidence where they lead. “Free” here means both that the decisions aren’t dictated above, whether by university leadership or by state officials or, in an earlier time, by a church; and that scholars won’t be punished (again, by any of those actors) for the decisions they make or the conclusions they reached. “Punishment” encompasses a variety of consequences: not only criminal punishment, but firing, salary cuts, denial of promotion or raises, the elimination of positions, and so on.

While this point is perhaps not as widely understood, it is important to stress right away: in the context of academic freedom, the freedom to teach and research is always the freedom to do so in accordance with relevant scholarly standards. That fact leads to the two institutions: the security of tenure (Shils 2017), with eventual permanent appointment; and decision-making by the scholarly community.

These two institutions are, in the AAUP understanding, deeply connected to each other: any dismissal for cause from academic employment must be approved by a judicial committee “chosen by the faculty senate or council, or by the faculty at large.” Allegations of professional incompetence must be evaluated by members of the department and other relevant departments, and by specialists from the broader academic profession. That is, only the scholarly community can be trusted to police the limits of secure academic appointment. The two institutions are also the crucial guarantors of the freedoms. If the freedom to research and teach are the freedom to do so in accordance with professional standards, there needs to be someone to set and, if needed, enforce those standards. Only fellow members of the profession are authorized to set those standards, or to evaluate compliance with those standards.

The freedoms are facets of a rule against orthodoxy; the institutions are those of academic associational self-governance. These two aspects fit together. Freedom of research is the freedom to pursue inquiry where the argument and evidence lead. The appropriate scholarly community is responsible for adjudicating standards of argument and evidence, distinguishing academic research from fraud, falsehood, or fantasy. Freedom of teaching is the freedom to use one’s best pedagogical judgment in teaching the questions and methods that mark a field of study; the field of study itself is shaped by both the intramural scholarly community, e.g. a department, and the extramural, e.g. a discipline.

This does introduce a tension at the outset. At some point associational self-governance runs into the individual scholar’s freedom from orthodoxy. An orthodoxy may, after all, be subscribed to and enforced by a department (or centre, college, faculty, and so on; henceforth “department” should be understood as a shorthand for “authoritative self-governing academic unit,” with all the variety that entails in practice and in names). What happens when an individual scholar wants to teach, or study, in ways disapproved of by the relevant governing scholarly community, whether that be a department or centre, a faculty or university, or a field or discipline? No simple answer seems acceptable. Freedom of research must not encompass the freedom to commit research fraud or plagiarism. Freedom of teaching must not mean that the instructor can disregard curricular needs and their job description to teach astrology in lieu of the first semester of an astronomy sequence. But academic freedom that entirely lacks individual libertas philosophandi intuitively seems to miss the point; we want freedom for individual minds, not for committees. This entry will not try to resolve this tension in any general way, and various views it surveys will have different implications for resolving it in particular cases.

Although the norms of academic freedom they describe are in this sense partly institutional, the AAUP statements are silent on questions of ultimate enforcement. That is, they do not discuss whether academic freedom ought to be protected by law, still less whether it ought to be protected specifically by employment contract law, or by constitutional law, or by statute. The content of the principles is to that extent separated from the question of their official status and mechanisms of guarantee. While the statements’ detailed discussions most often focus on the specific case of the firing of an individual professor, and thus on academic freedom as against the university acting as an employer, the principles are in no way limited to that case. They imply a thorough rejection, for example, of direct state control over the content of university curricula, or the regulation by criminal law of the conclusions of scholarly research. Whether those limitations on state action are to be secured through the forbearance of political actors, through constitutional protection, through any particular governance structure for public universities, and so on is similarly unaddressed.

Some (Finkin 1988, Rabban 2024, Finkin and Post 2009) have argued that institutional self-governance demands a fourth freedom, extrapolating a freedom of intramural speech about university business, “faculty speech that does not involve disciplinary expertise but is instead about the action, policy, or personnel of a faculty member’s home institution” (Finkin and Post 2009, 113). The practice of self-governance requires the ability to debate and dissent, and thus the collective institution that guarantees academic freedom requires an individual immunity from punishment for speech about a university’s internal affairs. There has been some movement toward formalizing recognition of this principle (AAUP 2006). It is, however, generally thought that scholarly self-governance has been eroding in practice, as an increasing proportion of scholarly instruction is offered by contingently employed faculty who lack permanent status within the university, as official institutions are reformed or abolished by state actors, and as effective decision-making is gradually centralized in a class of professional managers and administrators (Brown 2015, Scott 2019). United States federal courts have denied that intramural speech by public university employees is protected by the First Amendment in the way that speech connected to research or teaching is, even when institutions of faculty governance are in place (Porter v. Board of Trustees of North Carolina State University 2023).

Across all of these freedoms, academic freedom demands what Pettit’s (2001) useful analysis frames as “content-independence.” Mere liberty as non-interference, Pettit’s traditional conceptual foil, might be had if one’s own wishes happen to align with those of the power-holder. But, Pettit objects, even the person who thereby is able to do just as they wish does not seem to be properly free. They are free to do just as they in fact wish, but would not be free to do otherwise; they are not free to do whatever they wish. Content-independence is the contrary condition, in which the actor’s freedom to act (or speak, or believe, etc.) is not dependent on the content of the action (or speech, or belief).

Academic freedom requires content-independence with respect to conclusions. Scholars who are able to pursue their research when, if, and because its conclusions are compatible with the political views of the party that governs the province, state, or nation-state lack academic freedom, even though (while their conclusions are in favor) they will not suffer any adverse action that would prompt internal, judicial, or AAUP-style external review. They can’t confidently begin genuinely open-ended long-term inquiry knowing that either the party in power might change or that they might reach a heterodox conclusion.

This allows us to see again why associational self-governance is joined to non-orthodoxy. When confronted with the question “isn’t this particular view of a professor too far? Aren’t there some outrageous ideas that pass the limits of academic freedom?” the defender of academic freedom changes the subject to a jurisdictional claim: only the body of peer scholars is eligible to make that judgment, and their judgment should depend on quality of research, argument, inquiry, and methods rather than the content of the conclusions. This move preserves content-independence, and in principle secures scholarly intellectual autonomy against shifts in the political winds. It does so, however, without claiming absurdly that there are no standards or limits anywhere to be found. It insists only that the limits will not be content-based, and that the question of whether some particular content is too controversial is an irrelevance. It allows for the difference between good and bad scholarship, but not that between orthodox and heterodox conclusions.

Pettit’s companion concept of “context-independence” moves one level of abstraction higher. An actor might have content-independent freedom due to some fragile fact about the power-holder: personal favor, or the power-holder’s mood, or the political coalition that happens to be in power. “Context independence” is the contrary of that: a freedom to act that is not contextually dependent on the character of the power-holders.

A considerable degree of context independence is necessary for, and maybe built into the idea of, academic freedom. I say “a considerable degree” because the context-independence criterion may not admit of anything other than degrees. We are all vulnerable to sufficiently-radical changes of political context, and the political context for higher education has indeed undergone such radical changes in many times and places, including some where academic freedom initially seemed quite secure. In such moments, retroactivity is common. The new, or newly-radicalized, political authorities do not only prospectively censor future research. They routinely penalize scholars for their past work: with termination or imprisonment in more extreme cases, with refusal of continued funding or promotion in milder ones. The shadow the future casts on the present means that we can never be certain of our context-independent academic freedom here and now. But differences of degree are tremendously important. There is a difference between the scholar whose current content-independent academic freedom is vulnerable to a change in the context of who holds the post of department head and the one for whom it depends on the context of whether their nation-state suffers a violent revolution.

2.2 Professional structure

The original AAUP 1915 principles proclaimed that “It is, in short, not the absolute freedom of utterance of the individual scholar, but the absolute freedom of thought, of inquiry, of discussion and of teaching, of the academic profession, that is asserted by this declaration of principles.” “The academic profession” is a conceptually slippery actor, difficult to pin down or operationalize, although with roots in the ius ubique docendi and its principle of mutual recognition. The slipperiness and difficulty here is reflected in ongoing puzzles about quite who has rights under academic freedom, against whom.

Academic freedom in practice encompasses a variety of actors’ liberties against a variety of other actors. It would be entirely standard to describe all of the following as violations:

  1. A state prohibiting universities as institutions from having a particular department or center from offering classes on a particular subject, or conversely mandating instruction in a particular political position.
  2. A university regulation prohibiting professors from using a particular textbook in their class.
  3. A university department denying a professor reappointment on the grounds that their research findings contradict those of more senior or powerful members of the department.
  4. University administrators disallowing a department’s preferred faculty hire on grounds of the prospective hire’s political views.
  5. A state research funding agency prescribing the political conclusions that supported research must reach.

That is, even before we reach any complicated cases at all, we find that academic freedom may reasonably be claimed by individual scholars, by universities as institutions, or by scholarly units within universities, against universities, scholarly units, or the state. In some of these cases, we might want to be able to name particular individual scholars as the actors violating other scholars’ freedom: the voting members of the department in (3), the dean, head, or provost in (4) who is also a member of the professoriate. Some of these core cases involve threats to a scholar’s employment, others do not. Some are freedoms claimed against the state, others are not.

Not all of these examples are entirely uncontroversial; the Canadian Association of University Teachers (CAUT), that country’s counterpart to the AAUP, flatly declares that “Academic freedom must not be confused with institutional autonomy… Academic freedom is a right of members of the academic staff, not of the institution.” This seems to leave cases of type (1) outside the concept. This is a minority position, associated with a particular adversarial understanding of the relationship between scholars and the university as their employer. Its existence, though, and the fact that it is subscribed to by a credible institutional actor, further indicates how complicated it can be to pin down the concept’s structure.

The AAUP, by contrast, originally denied that academic freedom was a rule of employer-employee relations, because it denied that university professors were mere employees at all. Members of university faculties “are the appointees, but not in any proper sense the employees, of” the universities’ respective governing boards. It analogized scholars to holders of a public office, who must be able to fulfill the responsibilities of that office: “So far as the university teacher’s independence of thought and utterance is concerned— though not in other regards—the relationship of professor to trustees may be compared to that between judges of the federal courts and the executive who appoints them.” This understanding recalled the inherited corporate model of the medieval university (Finkin and Post 39), which considered academic staff as members of the associated corporate body, not employees of it. The ongoing influence of this model persists in the central emphasis on faculty governance. Academics qua professionals, like lawyers or doctors qua professionals, make up the body qualified to judge each other, and they do so in collectively self-governing groups from departments to university senates to disciplinary associations. On this understanding, academic freedom can’t be a rule of employment regulation, because construing scholars as employees already subordinates them inappropriately.

Today the AAUP operates as a hybrid: both a professional association and a labor union, with increasing weight toward the union side as time passes. The leading international instrument with respect to academic freedom, the UNESCO statement of 1997, is explicitly a declaration about the employment of higher education teaching personnel. As a matter of external legal understanding rather than internal practice, the academic freedom of scholars against their institution is standardly construed as part of the contract of employment, whether or not that employment contract is collectively bargained for.

A focus on the employment rights of the individual scholar might sacrifice the ability to analyze relationships between the institutional university and the state, or between the department or center and the university. But it might gain in exchange a clear understanding of the stakes of other core cases. Restrictions on what is taught in the classroom become unacceptable conditions of employment for the individual instructor rather than, say, intrusions on the curricular autonomy of a disciplinary department, or illegitimate state interference with the autonomy of the university. The wrong of a restriction on academic freedom is done to the individual researcher or instructor, whether because their employment is terminated or because it is conditioned on unacceptable restrictions.

3. Foundations and justifications

An evolved set of practices is something different from a principle simply derived from a more fundamental principle. The practices may not neatly lend themselves to unified, unitary justifications. If academic freedom were nothing but a distinctive tradition of university life, then it might be a mistake to look for a straightforward justification of it. Rather, like the practices of academic regalia, one might have to settle for history and genealogy, along with some rules internal to the practice.

The difficulty is that academic freedom is not only a practice, but also a basis for normative demands when it is not respected. This includes demands for privileges that are not widely available outside the university: lifetime tenure of employment, for example, and a combination of internal intellectual self-direction with external financial support (whether through direct state expenditures, tax-subsidized charitable contributions, or both). When a university fires a tenured professor for reaching unpopular conclusions, or a state actor restricts the content of what can be taught on campus, academic freedom gives ground for complaints that can’t be overcome with a simple “now the practice is different.” Those complaints in turn can be met with a further demand for justification. Yes, say the internal or external authorities, we are violating the self-understood rights of some academic personnel, but why should we defer to that self-understanding in the face of competing values, principles, or even conveniences?

Moreover, different justifications can yield different, sometimes conflicting, applications of the principles. When confronted with hard cases, or even with easy cases but actors who don’t recognize the principles’ force at all, questions of justification are therefore unavoidable, even at the risk of oversimplifying the actual practices. That being said, Singer (2025) argues for the possibility of hybrid and pluralistic approaches, denying a need for a once-and-for-all choice between the austere Newman/ Oakeshott view described below of universities as being driven by their internal purposes and meanings, and an account like Dewey’s that is based on social benefit. He offers instead a thoughtful account of universities as heteronomous: properly governed by a mixture of parochial reasons and external purposes.

3.1 For its own sake

The purposes and justifications of academic freedom cannot be neatly disentangled from the purposes and the institution in which it is situated: the university. In the nineteenth century John Henry Newman (1873 [1996]) famously and influentially disclaimed any narrowly instrumental justifications of the university’s work, whether in terms of Christian virtue or of professional training or of socially useful technological research or other extramural purposes. The goal of the institution as he saw it was the teaching of liberal knowledge; the broadening of the mind associated with such teaching was as much a good in itself as bodily health. Since a university education provides such broadening, no further justification is necessary. Economic or technological or moral benefits might be had as side effects, and it was to the good if they were, but the purpose of the institution could not be subordinated to those goals.

In a different idiom, Michael Oakeshott (1989 [1950]) held a similar view. “A university is not a machine for achieving a particular purpose or producing a particular result; it is a manner of human activity… A university, like everything else, has a place in the society to which it belongs, but that place is not the function of contributing to some other kind of activity in the society but of being itself and not another thing. Its first business is with the pursuit of learning— there is no substitute which, in a university, will make up for the absence of this— and, secondly, its concern is with the sort of education that has been found to spring up in the course of this activity.”

Although Newman rejected and Oakeshott viewed with wariness what has come to be understood as the research mission of the university, that mission too has often been understood in his terms. The discovery of new knowledge, like the apprehension of old knowledge, is a good in itself, independent of the ancillary benefits it might bring about. By the same token, defenses of academic freedom very often rest on the nature of the university as an organization, and on the inherent, internal goods that it serves.

Rorty (1996), despite his allegiance to Deweyan pragmatism in some respects, rejects reliance on a notion of a search for objective (“mind-independent”) truth altogether. He instead embraces something more akin to Newman’s or Oakeshott’s position. He justifies academic freedom as a matter of the best social practice of a university. “The point is not whether disinterested and objective inquiry will lead to correspondence to mind-independent reality, but how to keep the Old Guard from freezing out the Young Turks while simultaneously preventing the Young Turks from wrecking the university. A healthy and free university accommodates generational change, radical religious and political disagreement, and new social responsibilities, as best it can. It muddles through.” This muddling through must be university business, and outside interference will make a mess of it.

Although Rorty does not elaborate the image, we can see how the rules of muddling through might require both the Young Turk’s freedom of the individual scholar and the Old Guard’s ability to associationally govern disciplines, curricula, and the university as an institution. Fish (2014) elaborates a closely related view, a practice-dependent one about academic freedom as the professional ethic of a particular kind of institution rather than an instrument for the pursuit of truth, democracy, reform, or any other external good.

While Rorty and Fish are to different extents skeptical of the idea of truth at all, such truth-skepticism is not a necessary basis for this kind of account of academic freedom. (Newman certainly would have rejected it.) The associational self-governance of disciplines, the dependence of academic practice on the idea of modes of inquiry appropriate to each discipline, and the fact that many disciplines (especially but not only in the humanities) are difficult to map onto the search for “mind-independent” truth add up to a plausible sense that university practice would be upset by too close a connection to truth-seeking. The nested self-governance of a university as a collection of sites of inquiry is not compatible with holding every site of inquiry to the self-understanding of physics.

The twentieth century’s massive expansion of higher education, and of public financial support for it, however, depended on other arguments. The discovery of new knowledge might be a good in itself, but the discovery of medical treatments, militarily useful technologies and strategies, economically efficient policy reforms, and so on has particular value from an external point of view. Students are improved by learning new knowledge, but it’s convenient if the knowledge they happen to learn makes them skilled engineers or doctors, or capable speakers of foreign languages for which intelligence agencies need translators. Neither the public support for research nor the public investment in affordable student access to higher education has ever been indifferent to the particular content of what was taught or learned, and Newman’s austere view has not been the one advocates of such support have ever embraced.

3.2 Dewey: democratic truth-seeking

That austere view was not Dewey’s, although his strong distinction between institutions of disciplines and institutions of disciples is compatible with Newman’s and Oakeshott’s views. While all three reject the idea that universities aim at particular conclusions, Dewey does hold that universities aim at some end outside themselves: social and political usefulness of a broad sort, particularly in democracies. This was of a piece with his pragmatic understanding of truth itself, an understanding that was deeply tied up with the process of structured inquiry. Social usefulness comes from knowledge that is more warranted rather than less, and the research university is the site par excellence of the advancement of such knowledge.

Academic freedom, thought Dewey, is like the freedom of debate that characterized democratic politics, but complements it by orienting toward the pursuit of truth through disciplined inquiry. This allows for scholars to enrich democratic politics through the sharing of conclusions reached via scholarly expertise. The two goals were not in tension for Dewey; the scholarly experts should advise the demos, not rule directly, and on his democratic theory, democratic politics itself is a kind of collective search for knowledge. Nor does scholarly expertise imply fixity or an end to disagreement of the sort that would impair democracy. The scientific approach that treats conclusions as provisional and truth-claims as tentative sat comfortably with Dewey’s own pragmatic conception of knowledge. Expert scholarly knowledge could inform and improve, but never replace, democratic politics. These ideas animate the AAUP documents up through 1940. In current times, Robert Post (Post 2012, Finkin and Post 2009) and David Rabban (2024) are closely associated with these Deweyan ideas as to academic freedom’s normative justifications. Post is probably the leading contemporary scholar of academic freedom and its justification, and his articulation of it has kept something like Dewey’s hybrid model at the center of the literature.

The next two subsections will consider truth-seeking and democratic (or liberal-democratic) arguments in turn, but it is important to keep in mind that Dewey and the original AAUP statements did not sharply distinguish them.

3.3 Truth-seeking

One might think of the key modern developments that yielded the practices and norms of academic freedom in this way. Libertas philosophandi, the idea of free philosophical inquiry across intellectual fields including natural, moral, and metaphysical philosophy even when conclusions might offend against received religious views, was a principle of truth-seeking. It was opposed for a long time by those who located truth in revelation and who identified truth-seeking as involving substantial deference to epistemic authorities, including the Catholic Church. But at least according to the self-understanding of Enlightenment philosophers such as Kant, such doctrines were gradually outgrown over the course of European early modernity. A respect for the conscientious thought of someone who sought an independent understanding of truth provided a moral foundation for free inquiry; a revulsion at the tools of inquisition, censorship, and enforced orthodoxy provided a political basis; and an appreciation for the progressive and cumulative intellectual advances of natural philosophers offered the prospect of practical benefits.

The key change in the nineteenth and twentieth centuries was to bring such ongoing truth-seeking activities within the institutional walls of universities, and to join the vocation of discovering knowledge to that of preserving and transmitting it. The university professor became a researcher as well as a teacher; and the necessary implication was that he (at the time, always “he”) needed the same freedom from orthodoxy that earlier extramural philosophers had (Finkin and Post 2009, ch. 1). When combined with the prospect of useful scientific and technological advancement, the idea that the search for truth requires open inquiry that is unconstrained by outside interference has perhaps been the most effective defense of academic freedom against external actors.

Its efficacy in moral, political, and social fields of inquiry has been less. Central to Dewey’s and the original AAUP’s argument was that truth-seeking in those fields was as important as in the natural sciences, and required the same protections. (See Lynch 2018 for a contemporary reconstruction and defense.) Truth-seeking as such has been a central justification for academic freedom (Shils 2017)

3.4 Liberal and democratic justifications

A set of norms first articulated as official policy in 19th-century Prussia would seem unlikely to be uniquely grounded in liberal or democratic principles. Even in this origin, however, there are potential connections. We must be careful about closely mapping Humboldt’s policies in 1809 onto his youthful liberal individualist and perfectionist political philosophy (1792) that John Stuart Mill and Harriet Taylor Mill (1859) brought to wider attention after Humboldt’s death. In the earlier work, Humboldt explicitly and forcefully rejected any program of national education as necessarily tending toward uniformity and conformity of the sort that he thought fatal to true human development, Bildung; by 1809 he must have changed his mind about at least that much.

Nonetheless, it is plausible to see the protections for self-directed thought, inquiry, learning, and teaching he proposed for the University of Berlin as being inspired by the same romantic individualism and pluralism. Both the emphasis on self-directed study for the student and the great latitude for instructors to choose what to teach arguably surpassed what became normal in the discipline-and-department structured research universities of Dewey’s day. He, of course, joined the idea of truth-seeking (in his distinctive pragmatist fashion) to the hope of democratic self-government by a well-informed people benefiting from competent expert advice.

We could perhaps describe the freedom of students to learn and develop as individuals in liberal terms, the freedom of researchers to advance knowledge for the public good, free of the limitations of orthodoxy, in democratic terms, and the freedom of extramural speech as partaking of both. Developments after Dewey’s day, however, have tended to run the liberal and democratic strands together, just as many descriptions of freedom of speech do; the interest in the individual speaker’s autonomy about what to say and the interest of a democratic polity in free and open debate might not need to be disentangled.

In the 20th century, such combined liberal democratic justifications for academic freedom became common and explicit, both in the United States and, after World War II, in western Europe. Freedom of speech, of expression, and of open debate are widely accepted as core liberal and democratic principles. Robert Jackson, an associate justice of the U.S. Supreme Court who also served as a Nuremberg prosecutor, famously held that “if there is any fixed star in our constitutional constellation, it is that no official, high or petty, can prescribe what shall be orthodox in politics, nationalism, religion, or other matters of opinion”. (West Virginia v Barnette 1943) If the rejection of imposed orthodoxies is a fundamental demand of liberal democratic constitutionalism, then the non-orthodoxy requirement of academic freedom could be just a particular application of it. Subsequent mid-century jurisprudence confirmed the implication, calling academic freedom “a special concern of the First Amendment, which does not tolerate laws that cast a pall of orthodoxy over the classroom” Keyishian v. Board of Regents, 385 U.S. 589, 603 (1967) (see also Wieman v. Updegraff, 344 U.S. 183 (1952), Sweezy v. New Hampshire, 354 U.S. 234 (1957)).

This is partly a matter of jurisprudential convenience. In the United States, unlike postwar (West) Germany, academic freedom as such is not mentioned in the list of constitutionally protected rights. Freedom of speech and freedom of religious exercise are, and courts have gradually articulated a general right of free expression and a rule prohibiting imposed orthodoxy on that basis. That provides U.S. courts with an entry point into disputes about universities that they might otherwise lack. But it is not only that. Mill and Taylor’s (1859) liberal defense of freedom of speech, for example, genuinely does rest on an understanding of open inquiry and debate that can encompass scholarly inquiry (Bilgrami 2015), even though it doesn’t do so explicitly. And practically speaking, the reasons states have for violating freedom of speech and expression characteristically concern the content of what is being said. State actors are particularly likely to restrict speech that they deem politically heterodox or subversive; and they are, if anything, particularly exercised when such speech happens in a university setting. The overlap of cases in which the state violates academic freedom and the state violates freedom of speech or expression is substantial. Millian arguments may not be able to justify the whole institutional apparatus of academic associational self-governance, but they provide powerful reasons for non-orthodoxy principles, especially as against the state.

So, the connection between academic freedom and freedom of speech or expression persists, and is not confined to jurisprudential settings of constitutional convenience. Whittington (2018, 141) explicitly holds that that “academic freedom is a specialized application of general free speech principles”. There are difficulties with taking that understanding too far (Moody-Adams 2015, Scott 2017, Levy 2024). Indeed, there are important arguments that the two values come into genuine conflict, because the standardless open-endedness of free speech undermines the commitment to structured inquiry according to scholarly standards (Simpson 2020). There remain, however, obvious attractions to it. Whatever the many disputes over how best to ground freedom of speech, it does not seem to depend on particular medieval institutional inheritances. At least in liberal democracies it commands widespread popular assent as well as special constitutional protection. If academic freedom can be founded on the freedom of speech and debate that characterizes liberal democratic society at large, that further suggests that universities as such might provide an education in democratic citizenship through their teaching. From a variety of political perspectives (Bromwich 2015, Ben-Porath 2023, Pettit 2018) some defenders of academic freedom have sought to treat it as a particular instantiation of broader ideals of free expression.

3.5 For reformist or critical social good

A very different sort of external justification in terms of the interests of the wider society comes from what Fish (2014, 12) calls the “academic freedom as critique” school, a school whose primary exponent is Judith Butler (2006, 2017). Butler’s recurring concern is that universities provide free and protected spaces for critical thought, “critical in the sense that it is a form of questioning presuppositions, tracking forms of power, but also imagining possibilities of transformation” (2017).

The Dewey/ AAUP vision of academic freedom’s contribution to social improvement rested on the ability of disciplinary social science to progress through the application of disciplined methods of inquiry. As Scott (2019, 19) puts it, “academic freedom protects those whose thinking challenges orthodoxy; at the same time the legitimacy of the challenge— the proof that the critic is not a madman or a crank— is secured by membership in a disciplinary community.”

Butler (2006), by contrast, emphasizes the extent to which such disciplinary standards may themselves be inappropriately conservative, reinforcing existing power relations and ideologies. Butler argues that, at least in part, the justification for the special professional autonomy of scholars rests on their ability to break out of such constraints and conventional views. Butler acknowledges the tradeoff involved, and accepts it, preferring to sacrifice disciplinary authority over methods of inquiry for the sake of protecting the possibility of radical social criticism.

In the two decades since Butler first made this argument, a still-small but steadily-growing share of analysts of academic freedom have reached similar conclusions, not necessarily following Butler’s own critical theory-inflected analysis but responding to the increased centrality of extramural political questions— including racial equality in the United States as well as the Israel/ Palestine conflict— to on-campus questions about academic freedom. The non-neutrality of social, political, and institutional status quo and the need for academic freedom to be structured in ways that especially protect its critics have been themes emphasized by Bérubé and Ruth (2022), Wong (2024), Thermitus (2024), and Campbell (2024). If this literature does not necessarily offer a clear institutional alternative to the disciplinary self-governance model, it does at least seem to offer an ethos that is in tension with it. The vision of academic freedom that it offers is one that will prioritize the protection of socially and politically radical or subversive views, and will treat disciplinary standards with a hermeneutics of suspicion when they threaten to constrain such views.

This perspective is also relevant to the discussion of institutional neutrality below in section 6.1.

4. Extramural speech

The various foundational justifications surveyed in section 3 are revealed as meaningfully different in the case of freedom of extramural speech.

“Extramural” should not be taken to refer only to speech that takes place outside the physical boundaries of the university. Sometimes it means that, but political speech outside the walls of the core academic spaces of the classroom, laboratory, and library— outside the contexts of formal teaching, research and its dissemination, and knowledge preservation— is usefully thought of as “extramural” even if it takes place within the university’s boundaries. This qualification will be especially important in thinking about student protest as a form of political speech, which we will discuss below in sections 4 and 5. But it also applies, e.g., to a professor writing an op-ed or social media post from within their on-campus office.

For Dewey, that freedom had as its core meaning the communication of expert knowledge to a wider democratic public. The judgments of the expert might be wrong, of course; knowledge is always provisional and tentative, and we should expect ongoing advances. But it’s a responsibility of the scholar and an expectation of the democratic public that the best knowledge available at any given time should be made available. The AAUP’s 1915 declaration treats extramural speech primarily in this Deweyan way. The 1940 principles make no reference to expertise, but continue to stress that scholars’ “special position in the community imposes special obligations” not to bring the profession or the university into disrepute.

It is not until 1964 that the AAUP committed to the general principle “that a faculty member’s expression of opinion as a citizen cannot constitute grounds for dismissal unless it clearly demonstrates the faculty member’s unfitness for his or her position. Extramural utterances rarely bear upon the faculty member’s fitness for the position.” That near-irrelevance of speech as citizens to the evaluation of scholars is today defended especially by Fish (2014), and stands in tension with Dewey’s imagined role for the social scientist in public debate.

According to the 1964 AAUP principles that now represent the dominant view, extramural political speech is particularly strongly protected under academic freedom, just for the reason of its irrelevance to the scholarly mission. Whether one is, in Weber’s example, a Catholic or a Freemason (Weber 1917 [2004, 21]), or in our day a supporter of Israel or Palestine, is no grounds at all for an evaluation of one’s scholarship. A university’s adverse actions against a scholar— firing, suspension, or nonrenewal; reduced pay; denial of promotions or administrative leadership positions; a bad grade or expulsion for a student— should only be made on scholarly grounds. Thus, extramural speech should never be the basis of such an action.

But this is difficult to reconcile with Dewey’s vision that the university professor holds a kind of office with a special responsibility to translate their knowledge into public benefit, and that this is at least as true of scholars in the political, social, and moral sciences as it is of those in the natural. That vision sat more comfortably with the AAUP’s 1915 account that emphasized a “peculiar obligation” for scholars to engage in responsible, verifiable, and temperate extramural speech, a need for quasi-scholarly virtues even when not speaking in scholarly venues. Finkin and Post (2009) work to bridge the gap, arguing that the ideal of responsible extramural speech cannot become an excuse for institutions to punish merely unpopular speech, which is what would happen if they had authority outside scholarly walls.

In the last decade, two additional arguments have put strain on the dominant position in theory, at the same time that outright violations of freedom of extramural speech have become more and more common in practice.

The first of these concerns extramural speech under the cover of scholarly expertise. If extramural political speech is especially strongly protected without demands of scholarly responsibility, it is in part because of the thought that such speech is irrelevant to scholarship. But this is often not how the speech is presented. Scholars engaged in extramural speech can and do make a point of emphasizing their academic credentials, even when they are genuinely irrelevant to the matter at hand. More confusingly, they do so even when the subject matter is slightly, or tangentially, or easily mistaken by the general public as being, within their field of expertise. As researchers, scholars’ areas of special knowledge can be quite narrow. As public commentators, they can affect expertise on a much wider range of questions to an audience that can’t easily know better. In the natural sciences, every biologist might purport to be an expert in a disease epidemic and how to respond to it, every geologist or chemist on the impact of pollutants on climate change. Other newsworthy topics routinely invite the same kind of amorphous claims to specialized knowledge from social scientists, philosophers, and legal scholars. The special case of responses to diseases and climate change have attracted particular notice, partly because it can be easier to spot the gap between real and purported expertise in the natural sciences. A specialist in canine oncology is not an expert in human virology and vaccinations. But the issue is more widespread than that.

The other fact placing strain on this understanding of extramural speech as protected because irrelevant is an increasing emphasis by universities themselves, and sometimes by the governments or granting agencies that fund them, on public-facing scholarship, knowledge translation, and public impact as part of the professional responsibility of researchers. If such public engagement is part of scholars’ jobs, then it cannot be at the same time irrelevant to their jobs. This raises questions that have not yet seriously begun to be answered about how public engagement, which stands outside peer review and clear disciplinary standards, should be viewed from the perspective of academic freedom. If it is a professional responsibility, how can it be unbound by scholarly standards of responsibility? Can a university separate itself from controversial or outrageous statements by scholars whom it encourages to speak on public questions?

5. Students and Lernfreiheit

5.1 The classroom

The principle of students’ academic freedom faded from central view in the tradition established by the AAUP principles (but see Van Alstyne 1965, Rabban 2024, Reichman 2025). And some of the animating spirit behind Lernfreiheit now seems anachronistic. The pedagogical shift away from rote memorization and repetition, and toward a student’s freedom to choose classes and courses of study, has been widespread in the liberal arts, but not so universal as to ever come to seem like a fundamental principle. Introductory courses in many subjects involve a great deal of memorization; some disciplines and institutions have very structured curricula with sequenced coursework. While it seems reasonable to say that an unstructured curriculum without strict distribution and sequencing requirements leaves students greater freedom, there is no live tradition of describing that as academic freedom.

Other aspects of Lernfreiheit remain part of academic freedom debates, however. One is a freedom from indoctrination, particularly political and religious indoctrination, in the classroom. Weber (1917) emphasized it in his account of science as a vocation, noting the power imbalance between a lecturer and listeners. Religious and political advocacy, he maintained, belonged out in the world, between equals who can argue with one another openly. Even in subjects centrally concerned with social, political, and moral questions, Weber held to a strong distinction between teaching facts about the various positions and indoctrination as to what values to hold. The principle of a stable balance between the instructor’s academic freedom to teach and the student’s not to be indoctrinated seems clear enough in Weber’s telling. It faces objections, however, from both directions, arguments that risk either the freedom to teach or the freedom to learn swallowing the other up.

Instructors are jealous of their authority over their syllabi, lectures, and discussions, and surveillance of the conduct of their classes immediately triggers academic freedom concerns. To the extent that students are thought of as outside the protections of academic freedom, the freedom to teach as one sees fit comes to look like an indefeasible one. Indeed, Weber’s own account made no reference to mechanisms of enforcement, arguably treating it as a matter of the instructor’s appropriate conscientious professional ethic. We see something similar in the 1940 AAUP Principles: “Teachers are entitled to freedom in the classroom in discussing their subject, but they should be careful not to introduce into their teaching controversial matter which has no relation to their subject,” a proviso that in later decades was deemphasized. This raises the possibility that the freedom from indoctrination is unenforceable, not much more than a pious hope. The defense of the instructor’s academic freedom even more sharply challenges Weber’s account if one rejects his strong fact-value distinction, or holds that neutrality is an ideological obfuscation that serves to privilege the political status quo. Those taking this critical position deny that teaching can or should refrain from the embrace of substantive values at all.

The mirror image of that challenge is the belief that even the presentation of facts can amount to a political bias on the part of instructors, and that students (or their parents) have a valid claim against instruction that tends to undermine existing political or religious beliefs. As a general proposition this can’t be sustained. A freedom from indoctrination is entirely unlike a freedom from exposure to ideas, texts, facts, or interpretations that lead the student to question their prior doctrine. The latter freedom can only be upheld by remaining outside of the classroom altogether. Still, it has become a common complaint about higher education, with conservative students (or their parents, or their parents’ political representatives) holding that any exposure to, for example, the history or social science around racial inequalities tends to become “indoctrination” in left-leaning ideologies about victimhood and injustice. In this challenge, the freedom to teach is swallowed up by an expansive understanding of the student’s right not to have their views challenged.

One further line of thought about the balance between freedom of instruction and students’ legitimate interests is not typically put in terms of students’ academic freedom, though it might be and sometimes is. It concerns the various ways in which a classroom might be unwelcoming, exclusionary, or hostile toward groups of students. A pedagogical approach might fail to accommodate students with some types of disabilities. Assigning texts that express racist attitudes could make the learning experience unacceptably hostile to students belonging to racialized groups. An instructor’s casual in-class sexism could chill the willingness and ability of women to take full part in it. The professor’s views in their published research or extramural writings could raise doubts on the part of some students that they would be judged fairly in class. And so on.

Many of the disputes about academic freedom in the last decade or two revolve around questions like these, e.g., the arguments about giving “trigger warnings” before teaching texts with content that might be experienced as exclusionary or might provoke trauma on the part of students, or about guarding classrooms as “safe spaces” for the protection of students (Callan 2016; Conly 2018; Easton 2018; McGowan 2018, and see s 6.2), as well as speech codes governing campus life more broadly. The general tendency of these debates has been to set academic freedom and inclusion or equity against each other. But at least for intramural classroom questions, things may be otherwise if we understand a classroom to include both Lehrfreiheit and Lernfreiheit. To the extent that we understand the practices in question as being barriers to accessing coursework, these questions about course content might require balancing academic freedoms against academic freedoms rather than other normative goals overriding academic freedom (Bérubé and Ruth 2022, Ben-Porath 2023, Thermitus 2024, Campbell 2024). More broadly, the elision of academic freedom with Lehrfreiheit may artificially expand the idea of instructors’ academic freedom, to the neglect of legitimate student academic freedom interests that constrain instructors’ legitimate authority.

5.2 Protest

As we have seen, very different justifications have been offered for the place of freedom of extramural political speech as a part of academic freedom. In Dewey and the earliest versions of the AAUP principles, the emphasis was on the provision of scholarly expertise to inform democratic debate and official policymaking. A second view, and one that fits more comfortably with AAUP statements in the mid to late 20th century, deemphasizes the professional character of extramural utterances, and aligns them more closely with the general freedom of speech and expression of citizens defended by liberal accounts of civil liberties, and by most liberal democracies’ constitutions.

When we think about students as bearers of academic freedom, the question of extramural political speech quickly spills over into cases that are often only metaphorically, not literally, extramural: organized political protest, often on university campuses themselves. Memories of the last decade of protests over the Israel-Gaza conflict and university responses to it and in support of racial justice are currently vivid, but the current debates about campus protests recall the 1980s protests against apartheid in South Africa, 1960s and 70s protests against the Vietnam War and for civil rights, and so on. Protests and riots were not unknown at medieval universities, long before they could be framed in the language of academic freedom or freedom of speech.[1]

On the one hand, if students have academic freedom, then their freedom of extramural speech ought to be respected. This has intuitive appeal: a student’s op-ed in the student newspaper or their comments on political question on social media is irrelevant to the evaluation of their work as scholars. The instructor assigning a grade or the advisor deciding whether to pass a thesis must not penalize students for such things. By the same token, a university as a whole should not penalize student scholars qua student scholars for the side they take in political or religious controversies. On the other hand, the only-metaphorically-extramural character of much of the speech that makes up student protest, and the use of disruptive tactics, seems to raise other questions. When protests happen on-campus, even if they concern off-campus events, the core academic activities may be affected or even threatened. Protest tactics can include blockading classrooms, vandalizing libraries, raiding and damaging laboratories, and shouting down speakers, all infringements on the core intramural academic spaces and, it would seem, the academic freedom of others. Other kinds of occupations— encampments in outdoor spaces, sit-ins in administration buildings— do not impact academic spaces in the same way, but do eventually impinge on other people’s abilities to carry out academic functions. Universities (or in more extreme cases, police or armed forces) need not target the particular political content of speech in order to respond to disruptive tactics that threaten the academic freedom of others. This, of course, leaves unresolved the question of how to respond.

Gersen and Gersen (2026) work through many perspectives on an imaginary case, aiming to survey in a general way the values and questions at issue around protests and academic freedom. Estlund (2018) argues that the conflict between even disruptive speech and the free speech or academic freedom values at universities is easily overstated. Eisgruber (2025) similarly argues that the conflicts are usually manageable, and are not as severe as the public may think. They both acknowledge that some genuine conflict remains, however. Nussbaum (2018) emphasizes the importance in thinking about protests of distinguishing protected speech from disruptive protests, construing the latter as a form of civil disobedience. As in the general case of civil disobedience, she argues, there is an implied willingness to accept legitimate punishment in response. In an earlier generation, Shils (2017), among others, argued for the categorical unacceptability of protests that are disruptive of academic spaces or functions.

6. Contested issues

This entry has been more concerned with fundamentals than with particular applications or with contemporary controversies (on the latter see Levy 2026). A full survey of the range or disputes about the limits, meaning at the margin, or countervailing considerations to academic freedom is beyond its scope. Important questions about public or private research funding; research programs and teaching programs that cross the boundaries of existing (e.g. disciplinary departmental) self-governing academic units; authority over admissions; changing institutional and management structures; and research ethics are all left to the side. The following two controversies are thus only examples drawn from a much larger set.

6.1 Institutional neutrality

The connection between academic freedom and a freedom from orthodoxy is sometimes argued to place sharp limits on universities or their sub-units (departments, etc.) taking official stands on contested political or (with the exception of sectarian institutions) religious questions. One longstanding view, most famously summarized in the University of Chicago’s Kalven Report (Kalven et.al. 1967), holds that universities should not take such stands, except when questions of academic freedom itself or of the university’s core interests as a corporate actor are at stake. Such institutional neutrality is said to help guarantee that no political opinion will count as orthodox, and so none can be prohibited as heterodox, by a university. In the Kalven Report’s language, “The instrument of dissent and criticism is the individual faculty member or the individual student. The university is the home and sponsor of critics; it is not itself the critic.” The view expressed in the Kalven Report was a longstanding one (see discussion in Levy 2026) and continued to be discussed and debated without special reference to Chicago or the Kalven Report for a long time (Machlup, Metzger, and Sullivan 1971; Graham and Montefiore, eds. 1975; Kleinig 1976) but over the course of decades, the Kalven Report eventually became the standard reference point and articulation of it.

Debates about institutional neutrality sometimes blur into the question of whether the content of the education provided to students can be neutral, or whether the fact of university’s existence as a social institution means it is so entangled in the political world that there can be no real possibility of neutrality (Soucek 2026), or whether the concept of neutrality would imply that a university has no institutional values of its own, including educational ones, although Kleinig (1976) argues that questions such as these are mostly red herrings. Similarly, Kolakowski (1975) argues that neutrality in those deeper and more difficult senses is not needed in order to make sense of the fundamental need to prevent universities from becoming vehicles for political propaganda. In recent years, many universities have made commitments to neutrality, but some (including Princeton, Brown, and Vanderbilt) have turned to neighboring principles such as “restraint” in the use of institutional voice in order to deflect the charge that “neutrality” implies an absence of substantive institutional values at all.

The connection between institutional neutrality or restraint on voice and academic freedom is disputed. Some (Stone 2015, 8) have gone so far as to hold that “at the very core of academic freedom is institutional neutrality,” that a university that “advocate[s] positions not integrally related to higher education itself” intrinsically “stifles free and open discourse.” Others (Ginsburg 2023, Whittington 2024b, Levy 2026) have defended it as a prophylactic measure, ensuring non-orthodoxy and making it more publicly credible with a rule disallowing formal political orthodoxy. This view does treat neutrality as advisable and helpful for the protection of academic freedom without equating the two.

The AAUP (2025), however, “has never determined that the neutrality of institutions is either necessary for, or incompatible with, the principles of academic freedom,” and continues to hold that the question is a contextual one. Post (2023) argues for a position like this one. He charges the advocates of institutional neutrality with overclaiming necessity for what is actually a contingent relationship between neutrality and academic freedom. He calls for restraint in the use of institutional voice rather than a “mechanical” doctrine of neutrality, and holds that the distinction is not merely verbal.

Critics of the Kalven Report and related ideas emphasize the entanglement in fact of calls for neutrality with right-wing extramural political movements actively opposed to academic freedom, and the uses of it as a slogan to silence faculty or student dissent or to constrain instructional freedom (Medeiros 2019; Brewer and Young 2025; Soucek 2026). Dea (2026) offers an important and measured recent account, denying the possibility of full neutrality, justifying a basic posture of restraint in institutional voice in the face of intellectual pluralism within the university, but making an affirmative case for broader exceptions to that restraint than Kalven (or perhaps Post) would allow. She replaces the Kalven report’s specific exceptions— matters concerning academic freedom itself or the interest of the university as a corporate institution— with a more general principle of proximity. Universities’ substantive statements should be limited to “matters in which they are morally or materially implicated.” Dea acknowledges that this is a standard that does not admit of bright-line rules: “Proximity is relative, if anything is, and universities are large, complex organizations that are implicated in many activities. Must universities take stands against factory farming or in favour of veganism in virtue of their food services operations? At what point does the connection become so tenuous that a public statement is no longer appropriate? What is to be done in the case of sincere disagreement among members? Unsurprisingly, there are no simple answers to these questions” (193). But, she argues, they are the appropriate questions, and sometimes they will call for important differences from Kalven’s recommendations. Whereas neutrality and restraint are somewhat different approaches to the question of when universities should not institutionally speak, Dea offers her proximity model as a way to think about when it should. A university’s particular location on unceded indigenous land, for example, leaves that particular university proximate to the injustices of settler colonialism in ways that other universities might not be.

6.2 Visiting speakers

The core cases of academic freedom involve members of a university’s scholarly community engaging in research or teaching. A university is, however, a site of a great deal more speech than those, not all of it by members of that scholarly community, and indeed not all of it by members of any scholarly community. Visiting speakers are usually guests of some unit of the university or of the institution as a whole. They range from world leaders or celebrities addressing graduation and convocation ceremonies to scholars from other universities giving lectures or research workshops to political activists addressing student clubs. On-campus actors, most often but certainly not always students, may object to such a speaker’s presence, whether because of the expected content of the planned talk, the content of the speaker’s ideas in general, or the speaker’s other history, e.g. politicians who (at least according to the objectors) violated human rights or committed war crimes. They may call for prospective rules that would prevent objectionable speakers. They may call for an existing talk to be cancelled, or physically obstruct it, or shout the speaker down. Cases like these have attracted a great deal of public discussion and commentary for more than a decade, especially in the U.S. and U.K. Are these violations of academic freedom?

One might think that only visiting scholars fall within the core activities defended by academic freedom. The discussions above of extramural speech, protest, student academic freedom, and the relationship between academic freedom and liberal democratic values, however, all canvassed ideas that push academic freedom in the direction of a broader climate of free speech and open debate (Whittington 2018b, Ben-Porath 2022, Eisgruber 2025). This might cut both ways; both visiting speakers and protestors engage in speech, and universities might face obligations to protect both. I have argued (Levy 2024) that talks by outside speakers generally should not be analyzed in terms of the speaker’s own academic freedom, but rather that of the inviting unit. Others (Conly 2018, Simpson and Srinivasan, 2018) defend demands for and practices of “no-platforming” on academic grounds. They argue that academic associational self-governance, universities’ obligations to scholarly methods, and their commitment to the pursuit of the truth justify denying an institutional platform to speakers whose speech is hateful or otherwise odious at least when it is also false or unscholarly.

As mentioned above in s5, for more than a decade, many disputes about supposed tradeoffs between academic freedom or freedom of speech (not always carefully distinguished) on one hand and equity or inclusion on the other has involved the concept and language of “safe spaces” (Callan 2016; Conly 2018; Easton 2018; McGowan 2018). The spaces vary, from a dormitory, a club, or a classroom up to the level of a university campus as a whole. The threat against which the need for safety is asserted might be particular speech, or it might be a speaker who is deemed dangerous for things they have spoken or written elsewhere. The understanding of “safety” at work can vary as well, from arguments that some speech acts are literally violent, to an account of so-called “microaggressions” that cumulatively cause harm, to an idea of safety that includes equal status and dignity.

But the character of the threat is most often similar: words that tend toward the denigration of an already-disadvantaged group, typically on grounds of identity categories such as race, gender or gender identity, ethnicity, religion, or sexual orientation. In order to ensure that members of such groups— usually students, but not necessarily so— can be fully and fairly included in academic life, speech that undermines their status and standing must be excluded. Disputes over safe spaces do not only apply to visiting speakers, but they are perhaps its most frequent subject, and certainly when the argument is to exclude a person rather than particular words or ideas. A visiting speaker’s access to campus spaces is discretionary, in a way that is not true for members of the university’s own scholarly community. The ideas of safe spaces and no-platforming thus overlap substantially. Assertions of the need for a safe space might also, however, be applied against speech by an instructor or a fellow student in a classroom, or against a professor who has engaged in offensive extramural speech, or against internal communication by university leadership, dormitory advisors, and so on.

The idea that words could threaten safety has come in for sustained criticism, often invoking the Mills’ justification of unconstrained debate. Ben-Porath (2022) has criticized these approaches in general. I have argued (2024) for a metaphorical understanding of “spaces” as encompassing the various units of a university exercising associational self-governance, and for the legitimacy of constraints within those units against a background of a broader university setting in which speech is more open and unconstrained. Warnick et. al (2026) have instead emphasized the physical spatiality of a campus, and proposed disaggregating the question of a safe space into various different spaces and locations, with different norms appropriate to each.

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Acknowledgments

Ava-Udeane Ellis, Amelia Lang, and Natalie Pennisi provided valuable research assistance for this article. Financial support for their assistance was provided by an Internal Social Sciences and Humanities Development Grant from McGill University, and (for Ellis) by a McGill Arts Undergraduate Research Award funded by the Mark W. Gallop Research Internship Award and by the Research Group on Constitutional Studies.

Copyright © 2026 by
Jacob T. Levy <jacob.levy@mcgill.ca>

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