Theodor W. Adorno

First published Mon May 5, 2003; substantive revision Mon Nov 4, 2024

Theodor W. Adorno (1903–1969) was one of the most important philosophers, cultural, and music critics in Germany after World War II. Although less well known among anglophone philosophers than many of his contemporaries, such as Hans-Georg Gadamer, Adorno had even greater influence on scholars and intellectuals in postwar Germany. In the 1960s he was the most prominent challenger to both Sir Karl Popper’s philosophy of science and Martin Heidegger’s philosophy of existence. Jürgen Habermas, Germany’s foremost social philosopher after 1970, was Adorno’s student and assistant. The current rise of national-populist and authoritarian politics has led to renewed interest in his work on the social psychology of the mass subject and anti-Semitism. The scope of Adorno’s influence stems from the interdisciplinary character of his research and of Frankfurt University’s Institute for Social Research, where he worked. It also stems from his work as a philosopher and critical theorist, from his large body of music criticism, and from his role as a prominent cultural and social critic and public intellectual in post-war West Germany.

Unreliable translations hampered the initial reception of Adorno’s published work in English-speaking countries. Since the 1990s, however, better translations have appeared, along with newly translated lectures and other posthumous works that are still being published. These materials not only facilitate an emerging assessment of his work in epistemology, metaphysics, and ethics, but also strengthen an already substantial reception of his work in aesthetics and cultural theory. Famous for their modernist, aphoristic style, for instance, in Minima Moralia, and infamous for their perplexing difficulty, for instance with assertions from that work such as “True thoughts are those alone which do not understand themselves” (1951a [2005, 192], reiterated in 1966a [1973, 48]) or “philosophy is not expoundable” (referierbar, 1966a [1973, 33]) and “no philosophical thinking of quality allows of concise summary” (1965a [2005,131]), Adorno’s texts continue to elicit scholarly exegesis and philosophical commentary.

1. Biographical Sketch

Born on September 11, 1903 as Theodor Ludwig Wiesengrund, Adorno lived in Frankfurt am Main for the first three decades of his life and the last two (Müller-Doohm 2005, Claussen 2008). He was the only child of Oscar Wiesengrund, a wealthy German wine merchant of assimilated Jewish background and Maria Calvelli-Adorno, a devout Catholic of Corsican descent. Maria was an accomplished singer and her sister, Agathe Calvelli-Adorno, who lived with the family, a talented singer and pianist: together they provided Adorno a comfortable, sheltered, and highly cultured childhood. As a young man he read Kant and later philosophers weekly with the family friend and cultural critic Siegfried Kracauer. Adorno studied philosophy with the neo-Kantian Hans Cornelius in Frankfurt and music composition with Alban Berg in Vienna. He completed his Habilitationsschrift on Kierkegaard’s aesthetics in 1931, under the supervision of the left-wing socialist and Protestant theologian Paul Tillich and in close intellectual friendship with Walter Benjamin. After just two years as a university instructor (Privatdozent), he was expelled by the Nazis, along with other professors of Jewish heritage or on the political left. Through Benjamin in Berlin Adorno met Gretel Karplus; they married in 1937 shortly before emigrating to the United States.

Having reduced his patronym (which has Jewish connotations) to the initial W., Adorno left Germany in the spring of 1934. During the Nazi era he resided in Oxford, New York City, and southern California. There he wrote several books for which he later became famous, including Dialectic of Enlightenment (with Max Horkheimer), Philosophy of New Music, The Authoritarian Personality (a collaborative project), and Minima Moralia. From these years come his provocative critiques of mass culture and the culture industry. Adorno returned to Frankfurt in 1949 to take up a position in the philosophy and sociology departments (he spent 1952–53 as research director of the Hacker Psychiatric Foundation in Beverly Hills so as not to lose his US citizenship). He quickly established himself as a leading German public intellectual and a central figure in the Institute for Social Research, founded as a free-standing center for Marxist scholarship in 1923. It provided the hub to what has come to be known as Frankfurt School Critical Theory, whose members or associates included Horkheimer, Adorno, Benjamin, Friedrich Pollock, Otto Kirchheimer, Franz Neumann, Herbert Marcuse, Leo Loewenthal, Erich Fromm, and others. Adorno became the Institute’s director in 1958, taking over from Horkheimer, who had served as director since 1930. From the 1950s stem In Search of Wagner, Adorno’s ideology-critique of the Nazi’s favorite composer; Prisms, a collection of social and cultural studies; Against Epistemology, a materialist critique of Husserlian phenomenology; and the first volume of Notes to Literature, a collection of essays in literary criticism.

Conflict and consolidation marked the last decade of Adorno’s life. A leading figure in the “positivism dispute” in German sociology, Adorno was a key player in debates about restructuring German universities and a lightning rod for both student activists and their right-wing critics. These controversies did not prevent him from publishing numerous volumes of music criticism, two more volumes of Notes to Literature, books on Hegel and on existential philosophy, and collected essays in sociology and in aesthetics. Negative Dialectics, Adorno’s magnum opus, appeared in 1966. Aesthetic Theory, the other magnum opus on which he had worked throughout the 1960s, appeared posthumously in 1970. He died of a heart attack on August 6, 1969, one month shy of his sixty-sixth birthday.

2. Early Writings

While studying composition with Eduard Steuermann in Frankfurt and then with Alban Berg in Vienna, Adorno was also fulfilling the institutional requirements to become an academic. Hitler’s seizure of power and the Nuremberg racial laws put an abrupt end to those plans and forced him to leave Germany, but several of his pre-exile writings during the 1930s, strongly influenced by Siegfried Kracauer, Georg Lukács, and above all Walter Benjamin, are significant for understanding his overall philosophy (Buck-Morss 1977).

In a short, posthumously published text from the early 1930s entitled “Theses on the Language of the Philosopher,” Adorno establishes a dilemma which his alternative linguistic theory will obviate. On the one hand he rejects positivist (or “idealist”) theories that sharply distinguish between linguistic form and content, and treat things as merely “functions of thought,” that is, inputs for conceptualist, instrumental reason, and hence maintain that linguistic signification is “arbitrary”; the idealist philosophies of “atomized, disintegrated society” treat truth as adequation and knowledge as the subject’s intentional “communicability” of independent objects via language. On the other hand he also rejects Heideggerian “ontological” neologisms for their abstracting from concrete historical and social relations and their sedimentation in words.

Adorno outlines an alternative theory that maintains the necessary inseparability of form and content and claims “through language history wins a share of truth” because “history and truth meet in the word” (1930s [2007, 35, 36]) according to the ideal of an objective unity of material reality and linguistic expression in the unique “name” for each thing. This “linguistic reality” has historically become divided into the “double character of language”: conceptualist, representational or significatory use (“communicability”) and a non-conceptual, evocative or gestural use (which Adorno will later call “expression” [Ausdruck] and associate with mimetic behavior and art). That is, “concrete, objective” material history has become sedimented in linguistic form, and “truth,” which Adorno conceives as disclosure and as having an historically indexed epistemic access, is revealed by the philosopher’s “hitting upon the word in which such truth dwells at the historical hour” (ibid., 36). In contrast to the “scientific dualism” of word and thing, formal logic and inference, Adorno calls for an explicitly “aesthetic” method of “configurative language”: “a dialectically intertwined and explicatively indissoluable unity of concept and thing” (ibid., 38) which makes disclosive truth possible. In Negative Dialectics he captures this idea with the claim that “In dialectics … the rhetorical element is on the side of content” (1966a [1973, 41]). Recent scholarship has attempted to bring Adorno’s thinking about language (and rationality) into critical discussion with certain Wittgensteinian, pragmatist, and neo-Hegelian strains of anglophone philosophy (Demmerling 1994; Bernstein 2001, 2004; Bowie 2013; Hogh 2017; Freyenhagen 2023).

In his 1931 inaugural lecture upon joining the University of Frankfurt philosophy faculty, “The Actuality of Philosophy,” which can be considered a kind of philosophical manifesto deeply indebted to Benjamin as well as to modernist aesthetic responses to experience under rationalized industrialization (Foster 2020), Adorno rejects Heideggerian fundamental ontology for its implicit idealism and logical positivism for its coercive restiction of experience (Gordon 2016, 37–83). Instead Adorno advocates philosophy as interpretation (Deutung), likening it to riddle-solving: “philosophy has to bring its elements, which it receives from the sciences, into changing constellations … into changing trial combinations until they fall into a figure which can be read as an answer, while at the same time the question disappears” (1931 [1977, 127]; Pickford 2018). His example of the method and its materialist commitment is the recognition by Marx of the structuring role of the commodity form in bourgeois society. The method of discontinuous, non-deductive presentation of material as a way to elicit recognition of an essence underlying socio-historical, and ideological, appearances operates throughout Adorno’s writings, and is elaborated and defended in the programmatic “Essay as Form” (1958 [1991]), Hegel: Three Studies (1963a [1993, 109]), the introduction to Negative Dialectics (1966a [1973: 3–57]), and also thematically in Aesthetic Theory as the “enigmatic character” of art (1970 [1997, 118–135]).

In his 1932 posthumously published paper “The Idea of Natural History” Adorno outlines a philosophy of history comprised of the opposition between figures of necessity and contingency. “Nature” is “what has always been, what as fatefully arranged pre-given being underlies history and appears within history; it designates what is substantial within history”; it names what is taken to be immutable, necessary, and identical. “History” is “a movement that does not play itself out in pure identity, but is one in which the new occurs and gains its true character through what appears in it as new” (1932 [1984, 111]); it is characterized as the new, contingent, non-identical vis-à-vis the “ever-same” of nature. The relationship between these moments is one of dialectical but “discontinuous” tension (ibid., 122): what appears to be fateful and natural might be revealed to have been produced historically as “second nature” and hence contingent; and the new, the advent of the historical, can itself ossify and become second nature. The critic must interpret the semblance of reality as “cipher” and “riddle” to reveal the inherent discrete potentials of “transience” (Vergängnis) (Macdonald 2019a, 58–68). The non-teleological, non-linear and non-synthesizing philosophy of history named “nature-history” recurs in later writings by Adorno (and Benjamin), e.g. the essay “Progress” (1964 [2005]), the lecture course History and Freedom (1964–65 [2006]), and Negative Dialectics: “History is the unity of continuity and discontinuity” (1966a [1973, 320]). Recent thinkers have interpreted the account as a “therapeutic” heuristic for criticizing reality (Whyman 2016) and put the account to work in developing a non-Hegelian idea of historical progress (Allen 2016; Jaeggi 2023).

Adorno’s Habilitationsschrift, Kierkegaard: Construction of the Aesthetic, written 1929–1930 under the direction of Paul Tillich and the influence of Lukács and Benjamin (Morgan 2012, 15–64) and published in 1933, pursues a “redemptive critique” of the Danish philosopher’s writings, which due to their focus on individual existence, were enjoying a revival in existentialist circles, including Heidegger’s fundamental ontology. Occupying the lowest condition within his three-stage dialectical development of the individual subject (aesthetic, ethical, religious), the aesthetic is characterized by Kierkegaard as the realm and attitude of subjective immediacy, hedonism, and irrationality from which the individual consciousness in a state of pure “inwardness” dialectically advances to a self-relation preparatory to a “leap into faith.”

With his book Adorno sought to attack the validity of existentialism, to present a Marxist alternative by analyzing “existence” as a social, rather than individual, category, and to revalue Kierkegaard’s dismissal of the aesthetic by showing how it can be interpreted to reveal objective, social-historical truth. He shows how Kierkegaard’s abstract, idealist inwardness and “objectless dialectic” is unintentionally permeated by socio-historical concrete objectivity. Adorno does this by constructing “objective images” in taking “literally” the metaphors in Kierkegaard’s texts: for example, the intérieur of the bourgeois apartment which “serves only as a metaphor for the nexus of his fundamental concepts. The relation is reversed as soon as interpretation gives up the compulsion of identity [exerted by Kierkegaard’s thought]…” (1933 [1989, 41]). Kierkegaard’s intended use of the image of the “window mirror” in apartment interiors – to invoke speculative reflection – is belied by the unintended presence of the socio-historical world within the apartment, for “the function of the window mirror is to project the endless row of apartment buildings into the isolated bourgeois living room; by the mirror, the living room dominates the reflected row at the same time that it is delimited by it – just as in Kierkegaard’s philosophy the ‘situation’ [the concept of what the completely self-sufficient subject decides upon] is subordinated to subjectivity and yet is defined by it” (ibid., 42) However, the external world of social production and circulation, as mirrored reflections or bourgeois decorations, is present merely as images – semblance –, abstracted from use and appearing as timeless “second nature” to the “objectless inwardness” of Kierkegaard’s dialectic of individual subjectivity, thereby revealing the “truth content,” the concrete historical conditions indirectly expressed within Kierkegaard’s spiritual dialectic of individual self-abnegation (Buck-Morss 1977, 111-121). Adorno as it were resurrects and revalues the lowly aesthetic sphere, by finding the “utopian” character of hope for redemption in the loss of the concrete, the fragmentary, the enigmatic that is cast aside in the dialectic of “objectless inwardness.”

Scholars have pointed out the influence of Kierkegaard’s anti-Hegelianism and philosophical style on Adorno (Morgan 2020) as well as the sympathetic bond underlying early Adorno’s critique, in that Kierkegaard’s philosophy of immediate interiority was a reaction against bourgeois reification inaugurating high capitalism (Gordon 2016).

3. Dialectic of Enlightenment

Written by Adorno and Horkheimer from 1939–1944 while in wartime exile in California, Dialectic of Enlightenment pursues a critique of reason, society, and the self in Western modernity. An initial, hectographic version, accurately entitled Philosophical Fragments, appeared in 1944 in limited quantity. This title became the subtitle when a second version, which mitigated the Marxist, economic vocabulary, was published in 1947 (see editorial apparatus in 1947 [2002, 217–282]). “Adorno frequently mentioned that he saw all his later major writings as excursuses to Dialectic of Enlightenment” (Schweppenhäuser 2009, 32).

Their book opens with a grim assessment of the modern West: “Enlightenment, understood in the widest sense as the advance of thought, has always aimed at liberating human beings from fear and installing them as masters. Yet the wholly enlightened earth is radiant with triumphant calamity” (1947 [2002, 1]). While it is presumed that “freedom in society is inseparable from enlightenment thinking” (ibid., xvi), the development of reason, including the historical period of the Enlightenment in its attempt to liberate people from their self-incurred immaturity, has led to a reversal: the book aims to explain “why humanity, instead of entering a truly human state, is sinking into a new kind of barbarism” (ibid., xiv). As a genealogy of reason, the book recounts the emergence of enlightenment thinking from prior magical and mythological phases of humankind’s history on to its predominant form as instrumental (Weber’s ‘formal-purposive’) reason, the means-end calculation that prevails in industrial capitalism and bureaucratic rationalization such that “enlightenment is totalitarian” (ibid., 5) and the “disenchanted” world takes on qualities of myth: complete immanence dominated by obscure and overpowering fatefulness.

The central claims of the book are that myth and enlightenment, traditionally held to be mutually exclusive concepts governing successive stages in Hegelian historiography, are actually entangled at each stage of reason’s development. Thus the two theses, “myth is already enlightenment, and enlightenment reverts to mythology” (ibid,, xviii), are expounded via an anthropologically inflected periodization. In prehistory, “neither [the unity of nature] nor the unity of the subject was presupposed” (ibid., 6), rather there is a fluidity between them governed by mimesis, “the organic adaption to otherness”: the human seeks to resemble nature by embodying particular qualities (ibid., 148; on the concept of mimesis, see Früchtl 2024). Driven by self-preservation in the face of “mythic fear,” rituals develop which rely on sacrificial substitution (say, a hind for a daughter) to propitiate the gods and control, dominate nature, thereby inaugurating representation, exchangeability, abstraction: “The substitution which takes place in sacrifice marks a step towards discursive logic” (ibid., 6). The tendency intensifies during the historical Enlightenment, in which Kantian epistemology envisages a world of sensuous particulars given in intuition that are subsumed as mere instances under universal concepts operative in abstract laws of nature: what Adorno comes to call “identity-thinking” (Bernstein 2001, 75–234). The result is “the single relationship between the subject who confers meaning and the meaningless object, between rational signification and its accidental bearer” and a closed world of immanence: “Just as myths already entail enlightenment, with every step enlightenment entangles itself more deeply in mythology… The principle of immanence, the explanation of every event as repetition, which enlightenment upholds against mythical imagination, is that of myth itself” (ibid., 7, 8). This development also entails the polarization between science/technology and art: “as sign [in science], language must resign itself to being calculation and, to know nature, must renounce the claim to resemble it. As image it must resign itself to being a likeness and, to be entirely nature, must renounce the claim to know it” (ibid., 13). The image, based on sensuous, qualitative resemblance given in intuition, becomes art, a “refuge” for mimetic comportment (1970 [1997: 53–54]).

The dialectic of enlightenment has phylogenetic and ontogenetic consequences for subject formation, which are explicated in the book’s reading of the Odyssey as a “basic text [Grundtext] of European civilization” (ibid., 37). Odysseus exemplifies the Western subject’s failed attempts to escape the fateful world of mythic powers and thus “the hero turns out to be the prototype [Urbild] of the bourgeois individual” (ibid., 36), whereby “the history of civilization is the history of the introversion of sacrifice … the history of renunciation” (ibid., 43). Emblematic of this thesis is Odysseus’s and his crew’s sacrifices to sail safely past the sirens, mythical creatures who by their sensuous song lure seafarers to their doom. Odysseus commands his rowers to stop up their ears and binds himself to the ship’s mast. Forcing himself to become thing-like, he is promised happiness by the sirens, but it is merely the semblance of happiness, while the rowers, living laborers, are denied even that experience. Thus “the formation of the self severs the fluctuating connection with nature [mimesis], which the sacrifice of the self is supposed to establish” (ibid., 41), and which suspends the goals of rationality to be realized in human history: “At the moment when human beings cut themselves off from the consciousness of themselves as nature, all the purposes for which they keep themselves alive – social progress, the heightening of material and intellectual forces, indeed, consciousness itself – become void, and the enthronement of the means as the end, which in late capitalism is taking on the character of overt madness, is already detectable in the earliest history of subjectivity” (ibid., 42–43).

The book’s bleak description of the enthronement of instrumental reason and the resulting pathologies – domination of external and internal nature, social and economic oppression, reification, etc. – should not, however, lead one to assimilate it to the cultural pessimism of Spengler or Klages, nor should the book’s invocation of “dialectic” lead one to assimilate it completely to the teleological Hegelian dialectic of Phenomenology of Spirit with its linear, triumphalist historiography of the realization of social freedom. The entanglement of myth and enlightenment is such that the dialectic has been suspended (ibid., 32) or, to speak with Benjamin, is “at a standstill.” The “self-destruction of the enlightenment” constitutes an “aporia” (ibid., xvi) and the book speaks at most of intending “to prepare a positive concept of enlightenment which liberates it from its entanglement in blind domination” (ibid., xviii). To do so the book (and Adorno’s subsequent writings) uses metalogical elements of the Hegelian dialectic: determinate negation and conceptual self-reflection. “Determinate negation” (bestimmte Negation) is a productive negation (it has determinate content) that immanently emerges from cognitive failure, contradiction, etc., by rethinking conceptual presuppositions, contexts of application, etc. that – for Adorno – include material, societal conditions (ibid., 18). Hegelian conceptual self-reflection or “the self-reflection of thought” (der Begriff als Selbstbesinnung des Denkens, ibid., 32), acknowledges the self-conscious spontaneous activity of thought, an essential element of autonomy.

In the “Preface” Horkheimer and Adorno emphasize their reliance on these potentials within thought: “if enlightenment does not assimilate reflection on this regressive moment [in rationality], it seals its own fate” (ibid., xvi); “intellect’s true concern is a negation of reification” and “the necessity for enlightenment to reflect on itself if humanity is not to be totally betrayed” (ibid., xvii). There are passages in the book where these Hegelian elements indicate possibilities to exit the aporia. In a chapter on enlightenment and morality, the authors show that the same form of reason, oriented towards abstraction, formalism, and rational self-restriction, inhabits the moral rigorism and disregard of the senses in Kant’s ethics and in the mechanically orchestrated libertinage of the Marquis de Sade; thereby the authors construct just such an opportunity for the self-reflection of thought: “In taking fright at the image in its own mirror, that thought opens to view what lies beyond it … it is the fact that Sade did not leave it to his enemies to be horrified by the Enlightenment which makes his work pivotal to its rescue” (ibid., 92). As with determinate negation, thought’s self-reflection is also extended into materialism by Adorno: reflection can reveal that thought arises from the very corporeal needs and desires that get forgotten when thought becomes a mere instrument of human self-preservation. It also reveals that the goal of thought is not to continue the blind domination of nature and humans but to point toward reconciliation. Thus only a “remembrance of nature within the subject” (ibid., 32), for instance the mimetic impulse as a receptivity to sensuousness, particularity, whatever eludes the subsumptive classifications of identity-thinking – what Adorno calls “the non-identical” – can preserve the self from its reduction to compulsive self-preservation and domination.

Habermas inaugurated an influential line of criticism by objecting to the supposed conflation of instrumental rationality with rationality tout court and rationality with power, and argued for a perceived “normative deficit” in critical theory as practiced in Dialectic of Enlightenment: “it denounces the Enlightenment’s becoming totalitarian with its own tools. Adorno was quite aware of this performative contradiction [i.e., a contradiction between the act of assertion and the content of the assertion] inherent in totalized critique” (1987, 119); practicing “a critique that attacks the presuppositions of its own validity,” the book’s arguments have no “ultimate groundings” or “normative foundations” and must “therefore eschew theory and practice determinate negation on an ad hoc basis” (ibid., 128, 129). Habermas’s own positive theory argues for, alongside instrumental (strategic) rationality, intersubjective communicative rationality oriented toward mutual understanding (Verständigung) that relies on normative presuppositions and the regulative ideal of the “unforced force of the better argument” (Habermas 1984; see also Benhabib 1986). For a defense of Adorno’s “ad hoc” ideology critique against Habermas’s more Kantian variety, see Geuss (1981).

More recently, Allen resists the claim of performative contradiction, emphasizing that the “aporia” and ambivalence at the heart of the book encourages us to remain “as mindful of the dangers of enlightenment as we are of our commitment to it” (2014, 22), while Noppen (2012) interprets the text as preparation for, but not yet elaboration of, a positive concept of enlightenment, and Zuidervaart (2007, chap.4) urges distinctions in the scope of domination and exploitation invoked in the text. Honneth interprets the text as a disclosive critique that uses rhetorical means (narration, myth, chiasmus, exaggeration, etc.) “in order to evoke a new way of seeing the social world” (2000, 124), an approach extended by Freyenhagen ’s (2024) reading of the text as a fictional performance, rather than merely critical description, of the defining aporias of modernity’s self-understanding. Hulatt (2016a) interprets the book’s genealogy not as an internally driven development from mimesis to instrumental rationality but rather as a more complex, tripartite conflict between mimesis, rationality, but also self-preservation as a controlling and ordering principle, which ultimately is relaxed in bourgeois autonomous art’s incorporation of mimesis. Both Hulatt (2016b) and Shuster (2014, 7–41, and 2022) highlight the Kantian epistemology animating Dialectic; Hulatt reads the historical account as a genealogy of transcendental idealism, while Shuster argues that the book’s genealogical account identifies problematic aspects of Kantian self-consciousness and practical agency.

4. Critical Social Theory

Dialectic of Enlightenment presupposes a critical social theory indebted to Karl Marx and Max Weber. Adorno reads Marx as a Hegelian materialist whose critique of capitalism unavoidably includes a critique of the ideologies that capitalism sustains and requires. The most important of these is what Marx called “the fetishism of commodities”: “The social character of activity as well as the social form of the product, and the share of individuals in production here appear as something alien and objective”; “a definite social relation between men assumes the phantasmagoric form of a relation between things” (quoted in Rose 2024, 33). Marx aimed his critique of commodity fetishism against bourgeois social scientists who simply describe the capitalist economy as though it were a natural reality but, in so doing, simultaneously misdescribe it and prescribe a false social vision. According to Marx, bourgeois economists necessarily ignore the exploitation intrinsic to capitalist production. They fail to understand that capitalist production, for all its surface “formal freedom” and “equality in exchange,” must extract surplus value from the coerced labor of the working class. Like ordinary producers and consumers under capitalist conditions, bourgeois economists treat the commodity as a fetish. They treat it as if it were a positively given, neutral object, with an inherent value, that directly relates to other commodities, in independence from the human interactions that actually sustain all commodities. Marx, by contrast, argues that whatever makes a product a commodity goes back to human needs, desires, and practices. The commodity would not have “use value” if it did not satisfy human wants and needs; it would not have “exchange value” if no one wished to exchange it for something else. And its exchange value could not be calculated if the commodity did not share with other commodities a “value” created by the expenditure of human labor power and measured by the socially necessary labor time that is abstracted from the average concrete labor needed to produce commodities of various sorts.

Adorno’s social theory attempts to make Marx’s central insights applicable to “late capitalism.” Although in agreement with Marx’s analysis of the commodity, Adorno thinks his critique of commodity fetishism does not go far enough. Significant changes have occurred in the structure of capitalism since Marx’s time, which require revisions on a number of topics: the dialectic between forces of production and relations of production; the relationship between state and economy; the sociology of classes and class consciousness; the nature and function of ideology; and the role of expert cultures, such as modern art and social theory, in criticizing capitalism and calling for the transformation of society as a whole.

The primary clues to these revisions come from a theory of reification proposed by the Hungarian philosopher Georg Lukács in the 1920s and from interdisciplinary projects and debates conducted by members of the Institute for Social Research in the 1930s and 1940s. Building on Max Weber’s theory of rationalization, Lukács argues that the capitalist economy is no longer one sector of society alongside others. Rather, commodity exchange has become the central organizing principle for all sectors of society. This allows commodity fetishism to permeate all social institutions (e.g., economic, legal, political, cultural, etc.) as well as all academic disciplines, including philosophy. “Reification” refers to the historical situation when the commodity form “becomes the universal category of society as a whole” such that “a man’s [sic] own activity, his own labor becomes something objective and independent of him, something that controls him by virtue of an autonomy alien to man” (Lukács 1971, 86, 87).

Initially Adorno shared this concern, even though he never had Lukács’s confidence that the revolutionary working class could overcome reification. Later Adorno called the reification of consciousness an “epiphenomenon”: what a critical social theory really needs to address is why hunger, poverty, and other forms of human suffering persist despite the technological and scientific potential to mitigate them or to eliminate them altogether. The root cause, Adorno says, lies in how capitalist relations of production have come to dominate society as a whole, leading to extreme, albeit often invisible, concentrations of wealth and power (1966a [1973, 189–92]). Society has come to be organized around the production of exchange values for the sake of producing exchange values, which, of course, always already requires a silent appropriation of surplus value. Adorno refers to this nexus of production and power as the “principle of exchange” (Tauschprinzip); society where this nexus prevails is an “exchange society” (Tauschgesellschaft). Adorno’s diagnosis of the exchange society has three levels: politico-economic, cultural, and social-psychological.

4.1 Political Economy

Adorno’s writings are premised on the claim that the liberal or free market capitalism characteristic of the 19th century has been superseded by “late” or “monopoly” capitalism – a tendency beginning with the global financial crisis of 1873, when industries and utilities consolidated into trusts, monopolies, and cartels –, and eventually “state capitalism,” as the economic “base” became increasingly coordinated with the state. The theory of “administered” or “state capitalism” was developed in a series of articles by Friedrich Pollock, an economist and Institute member who was supposed to contribute a chapter to Dialectic of Enlightenment but never did (Wiggershaus 1994, 313–19). Pollock argued that during the inter-war years in fascist Germany, the Soviet Union, and welfare-state USA, planning and regulation by the state sought to administer production, distribution, and consumption, resulting in increasingly rationalized and bureaucratized political, economic, social and cultural spheres of society, and the emergence of the social category of the “mass” subject.

While during the liberal stage of capitalism, the proletariat existed “half outside” society and thus for Lukács possessed the potential of class consciousness and revolutionary activity as the “subject of history,” in late capitalism society had become “totally integrated” and “societized” (vergesellschaftet, a concept from Weber), either in a totalitarian or democratic form (Adorno 1966b [1969]). Because “material production, distribution, consumption are administered jointly… The totality of the processes of mediation, which amounts in reality to the principle of exchange, has produced a second, deceptive immediacy. This enables people to ignore the evidence of their own eyes and forget the difference and conflict or repress it from consciousness … No overall social subject exists” (Adorno 1969a [2003, 124, trans. mod.]). The “integration” of society (e.g., the “safety net” in welfare-state democracies integrates the proletariat) eliminates the possibility of external or “transcendent” social critique, thus “immanent criticism” or “determinate negation” becomes Adorno’s primary method: “It is no longer possible to adopt a vantage point outside the mechanism that would enable us to give the horror a name; one can tackle it only where it is inconsistent with itself” (ibid., trans. mod.). While Pollock claimed that state capitalism effectively neutralized class conflict and softened economic crises, in the 1940s Adorno criticized him for inadequately appreciating that not only did society remain antagonistic, but that class division (based who does and does not own the means of production) and the asymmetries in political power had intensified in late capitalism, though accompanied by intensified ideological veiling that Adorno associates with fascism: “The latest phase of class society is dominated by monopolies; it tends toward fascism, the form of political organization worthy of it. While it vindicates the doctrine of class struggle with its concentration and centralization, extreme power and extreme impotence directly confronting one another in total contradiction, it makes people forget the actual existence of hostile classes … The total organization of society by big business and its ubiquitous technology has taken such utter possession of the world and the imagination that even to conceive of the idea that things might be otherwise calls for an almost hopeless effort” (Adorno 1942a [2003a, 96]; Cook 1998). Furthermore, no appeal to basic invariant human needs (as in orthodox Marxism) can be made because needs are thoroughly societally mediated: nature and history are inextricably intertwined (Adorno 1942b [2017]). These features of integrated society under state capitalism tend to thwart the emergence of a proletarian class consciousness (Hammer 2005, 54–65; Braunstein 2023).

4.2 Culture

The theory that the social totality is integrated includes one of early Frankfurt School’s most influential concepts, that of the “culture industry.” Orthodox Marxism held that culture, as part of the superstructure, is in some way determined by and reflects the economic base (e.g., relations of production). While ‘authentic’ modernist artworks show relatively greater autonomy from society, individually requiring cognitively exacting and affectively nuanced interpretation of their meaning (see section “Aesthetic Theory”), “Film, radio, and magazines form a system. Each branch is unanimous within itself and all are unanimous together” (1947 [2002, 94]). Produced for the masses, such products interchangeably follow the general logic of the commodity-form under late capitalism: they are planned to produce certain effects (titillation, distraction, excitement) devoid of larger significance, for their use-value has been replaced by their exchange value.

“Culture industry,” in stark contrast from spontaneously produced “popular” or “folk” art, primarily refers to how forms of entertainment function in mass society (1967a [1991, 100ff].): how they are rationalized and standardized in production, distribution, and consumption, according to the “cycle of manipulation and retroactive need” (1947 [2002, 95]). Because mass cultural products function as commodities, they duplicate and reinforce empirical social reality, they pursue “the idolization of the existing order” (ibid., xix): “On all sides, the borderline between culture and empirical reality becomes more and more indistinct” (1942c [1991, 61]). Under liberal capitalism there was a gap between socio-economic reality within which immanent ideology critique could be pursued. Now, cultural products simply duplicate reality, a kind of integration of ideology into the social totality, and there is less and less opportunity for straightforward immanent critique.

In the first essay Adorno wrote in the USA, “On the Fetish Character in Music and the Regression of Listening,” he develops the idea of fetish, from Marx’s commodity fetishism, in light of the workings of radio music and music recordings, which he studied while working for Paul Lazarsfeld and the Princeton Radio Project. The “fetish character” Adorno emphasized comprised the fact that hit songs are evaluated based on the profit they bring as much as the quality of the song, and the fact that consumers listen “regressively,” that is, passively to discrete sensory effects without active intellectual engagement with the product as a complex whole (1938 [1991, 32–3]). Nor is it simply a matter of culturally produced ideological blindness requiring consciousness-raising, as in the earlier stage of capitalism; consumers see through the deception but self-preservation leads them to reify themselves to better adapt to the social totality anyways. In this way too the culture industry “impedes the development of autonomous, independent individuals who judge and decide consciously for themselves” (1967a [1991,104–6]; cf. 1947 [2002, 135–6]). Subsequent commentators have sought to elaborate the cognitive and psychological complexities at work in Adorno’s account of consumers’ reception and in light of arguably changed cultural conditions (Cook 1996; Gunster 2000). Thanks to these complexities, Horkheimer and Adorno see fleeting possibilities for resistence within the integration of culture, for instance in an archaic layer of “stubbornly purposeless” activities such as the carnivalesque energy of the circus and the absurdity in writings by authors like Mark Twain (1947 [2002, 113–114]), in inchoate gestures of self-determination in choosing among the pseudo-individualized options (Mariotti 2016), and in montage and other techniques of discontinuity in avant-garde film (Hansen 2012; De la Fuente 2021).

4.3 Social Psychology

As suggested already in the considerations of how the culture industry’s commodities are consumed, with the concept “dialectical anthropology” (1947 [2002, xix]) Adorno (and Horkheimer) incorporated into his social theory a historically dynamic relationship between subjectivity, as studied by psychoanalysis, and society, as studied by sociology (Dahmer 2012). Adorno’s explorations of that relationship help explain some aspects of his theory of the authoritarian personality and parts of his account of anti-Semitism.

Almost from its inception the Institute pursued a “marriage of Marx and Freud” (Jay 1996, 86–112; Whitebook 2004a), including a practicing analyst, Erich Fromm, among its members. Adorno’s first, failed Habilitationsschrift sought to combine Kant and Freud, arguing that the contents of the unconscious were at least partly determined by social reality (Whitebook 2004b; Bloch 2019), a claim that can also be found operating in several lines of argument in Dialectic of Enlightenment (Sherratt 2002). Adorno’s critique of Fromm’s (and his followers’) “revisionist” psychoanalysis clarified his own position: historicizing Freud’s account of the drives, repression, the Oedipal conflict, narcissicism, etc. showed that “not only the individual but the category of individuality is already a product of society” (1962 [2014, 330]; cf. 1955 [1967–68]); individual intrapsychic developmental conflict is the dynamic site where antagonistic society and antagonistic faculties of the psyche interact.

Adorno and Horkheimer argue that Freud’s theory of subject formation accorded with the earlier period of liberal capitalism, when a bourgeois patriarchal family would elicit an Oedipal conflict in the infant resulting in the splitting off of strong ego from id and the installation of a superego, the psychoanalytic components required by autonomous individuals in the bourgeois era. However, in the age of monopoly capitalism’s massive asymmetry in power, and the integration of state and economy, the patriarch lost his unique authority, replaced by representatives of the state but above all by the culture industry. Under these changed social conditions the individual, in the sense of an autonomous and mature (mündig) person who makes reasoned decisions based on “a painful inner dialogue between conscience, self-preservation, and drives” (1947 [2002, 168]), tends to disappear. The new conditions favor a “new anthropological type” (Adorno 1941 [2009]) that Adorno calls “the authoritarian personality” and “the manipulative character,” characterized by ego-weakness, reified consciousness, susceptibility to identifying with autocratic leaders, a “bourgeois coldness” that deadens mimetic responsiveness (Macdonald 2011), and a regression to unsublimated drives. In sum, for Adorno the authoritarian personality exhibits a profound “inability to have experience” in the sense of consciously perceiving contradiction and dialectical possibility (Adorno et al., 1950 [2019, 973]; cf. Fong forthcoming).

Because the new anthropological type cannot reflectively work through the contradictions and antagonisms of the socio-economic totality, its unconscious anxiety and rage is directed via “false projection” (“the reverse of genuine mimesis,” 1947 [2002, 154]) at those whose stereotyped imago remind it of the renunciations and deceptions incurred in its adaption to the totality. This is one of several kinds of explanation of anti-Semitism in Adorno’s writings; the image of the Jew suggests what has partly escaped self-reification: “happiness without power, reward without work, a homeland without frontiers, religion without myth” (ibid., 164–5; Jay 1980; Rabinbach 2000). In several empirical studies carried out in both the USA and pre- and post-war Germany (Jacobs 2015; Rensmann 2017), the Institute developed techniques for detecting the existence of this new anthropological type, the most famous of these being the Berkeley study that resulted in The Authoritarian Personality: participants were asked questions that indirectly revealed personality propensities according to four metrics: the Anti-Semitism (AS) scale, the Ethnocentrism (E) scale, the Political-Economic Conservativism (PEC) scale, and the fascism (F) scale. Drawing from the analyses in the anti-Semitism chapter of Dialectic of Enlightenment, Adorno surmised that qualities such as conventionalism, submissiveness, aggression, aversion to subjectivity and imagination, superstition/stereotypy, toughness, concern with others’ sexuality, etc., indicated a high F-scale score. Several of these qualities, Adorno reasoned, indicated a personality “syndrome” emerging in childhood, hence deeper and prior to political thought and commitment, and auguring a new social type (Marasco 2018). In a second, unpublished part of his contribution to the Authoritarian Personality, Adorno maintained that the personality type could only be fully understood in the context of its societal conditions (Adorno et al., 1950 [2019, xli-lxvi]).

In a series of writings Adorno outlined the techniques and mechanisms by which the authoritarian personality is psychologically manipulated by fascist politics (e.g., 1943 [2000], 1951b [1991]). In 2019 Suhrkamp published Adorno’s 1967 talk examining the similar tactics used by the new right-wing party emerging at that time in postwar Germany; the essay became a bestseller (1967c [2020]). The Authoritarian Personality has remained a touchstone for social psychology (e.g., Stone, Lederer, and Christie 1993), including contemporary thinkers drawing on Adorno’s work to understand the current rise of popular authoritarianism (Brown, Gordon and Pensky 2018; Abromeit 2022; Weigel 2022).

While Freud was less important to Frankfurt Critical Theorists working immediately after Adorno (and Marcuse) (Whitebook 2004a), recently Critical Theorists have returned to psychoanalysis in order to theorize again the dynamic interplay between psyche and society. Horkheimer and Adorno seemed to have bequeathed social psychology with “the paradox of authority”: to resist authority seems to require the formation of individuals with an autonomous, rational ego, but this formation occurs by internalizing the domination and authority of the father; Jessica Benjamin suggests that “the potential for emancipation be grounded in an intersubjective theory of personality rather than an individual psychology of internalization” (1977, 42–43). Whitebook (1995) reconceptualizes ego-formation through the concept of sublimation. Fong (2016) considers a mostly unconscious source of “authority” to fulfill a kind of autonomy. Allen (2021; Allen and O’Connor 2019) develops potentials from Freudian transference theory, a Kleinian intersubjective, open-ended account of ego-formation, and object relations theory.

5. Negative Dialectics

Several of Adorno’s posthumously published postwar university lecture courses and his Hegel book (1963a [1993]) record his thinking toward his magnum opus, Negative Dialectics, which includes his most sustained presentation of his metaphysical and epistemological claims, as will be considered in this section. These claims, in turn, consolidate and extend the historiographic and social-theoretical arguments already canvassed. As Simon Jarvis demonstrates, Negative Dialectics tries to formulate a “philosophical materialism” that is historical and critical but not dogmatic. Alternatively, one can describe the book as a “metacritique” of idealist philosophy, especially of the philosophy of Kant and Hegel (Jarvis 1998, 148–74; O’Connor 2004 and 2013, 54–109). Adorno says the book aims to complete what he considered his lifelong task as a philosopher: “to use the strength of the subject to break through the deception [Trug] of constitutive subjectivity” (1966a [1973, xx]); cf. 1969b [2005, 247]).

This occurs in four stages. First, a long Introduction (1966a [1973, 1–57]) works out a concept of “philosophical experience” that both challenges Kant’s distinction between “phenomena” and “noumena” and rejects Hegel’s construction of “absolute spirit.” Then Part One (ibid., 59–131) distinguishes Adorno’s project from the “fundamental ontology” in Heidegger’s Being and Time (Gordon 2016, 120–158; Zuidervaart 2024, 55–76). Part Two (ibid., 133–207) works out Adorno’s alternative with respect to the categories he reconfigures from German idealism. Part Three (ibid., 209–408), composing nearly half the book, elaborates philosophical “models.” These present negative dialectics in action upon key concepts of moral philosophy (Kant’s concept of “freedom”), philosophy of history (Hegel’s “world spirit” and “natural history”), and metaphysics. Adorno says the final model, devoted to metaphysical questions, “tries by critical self-reflection to give the Copernican revolution an axial turn” (ibid., xx). Alluding to Kant’s self-proclaimed “second Copernican revolution,” this description echoes Adorno’s comment about breaking through the deception of constitutive subjectivity.

Like Hegel, Adorno criticizes Kant’s distinction between phenomena and noumena by arguing that the transcendental conditions of experience can be neither so pure nor so separate from each other as Kant seems to claim. As concepts, for example, the a priori categories of the faculty of understanding (Verstand) would be unintelligible if they were not already about something that is nonconceptual. Conversely, the supposedly pure forms of space and time cannot simply be nonconceptual intuitions. Not even a transcendental philosopher would have access to them apart from concepts about them. So too, what makes possible any genuine experience cannot simply be the “application” of concepts to a priori structured intuitions via the “schematism” of the imagination (Einbildungskraft). Genuine experience is made possible by that which exceeds the grasp of thought and sensibility. Adorno does not call this excess the “thing in itself,” however, for that would assume the Kantian framework he criticizes. Rather, he calls it “the nonidentical” (das Nichtidentische), and it has a plurality of operational meanings (Thyen 2007; Silberbusch 2018).

The concept of the nonidentical, in turn, marks the difference between Adorno’s materialism and Hegel’s idealism. Although he shares Hegel’s emphasis on a speculative identity between thought and being, between subject and object, and between reason and reality, Adorno denies that this identity has been achieved in a positive fashion. For the most part this identity has occurred negatively instead. That is to say, human thought, in achieving identity and unity, has imposed these upon objects, suppressing or ignoring their differences and diversity. Such imposition is driven by a societal formation whose exchange principle demands the equivalence (exchange value, quantitative and abstract) of what is inherently nonequivalent (use value, qualitative and concrete). Whereas Hegel’s speculative identity amounts to an identity between identity and nonidentity, Adorno’s amounts to a nonidentity between identity and nonidentity (Sommer 2016; O’Connor 2011; Pinkard 2020). That is why Adorno calls for a “negative dialectic” and why he rejects the affirmative character of Hegel’s dialectic (1966a [1973, 143–61]).

Adorno does not reject the necessity of conceptual identification, however, nor does his philosophy claim to have direct access to the nonidentical. Under current societal conditions, thought can only have access to the nonidentical via conceptual criticisms of false identifications. Such criticisms must be “determinate negations,” pointing up specific contradictions between what thought claims and what it actually delivers. Through determinate negation, those aspects of the object which thought misidentifies receive an indirect, conceptual articulation.

The motivation for Adorno’s negative dialectic is not simply conceptual, however, nor are its intellectual resources: his epistemology is “materialist” in both regards. It is motivated, he says, by undeniable human suffering—a fact of unreason, if you will, to counter Kant’s “fact of reason.” Suffering is the corporeal imprint of society and the object upon human consciousness: “The need to let suffering speak is a condition of all truth. For suffering is objectivity that weighs upon the subject … ” (ibid., 17–18). The resources available to philosophy in this regard include the “expressive” or “mimetic” dimensions of language, which conflict with “ordinary” (i.e., societally sanctioned) syntax and semantics. In philosophy, this requires an emphasis on “presentation” (Darstellung) in which logical stringency and expressive flexibility interact (ibid., 18–19, 52–53). Another resource lies in the social-historical relationships among established concepts. By taking such concepts out of their established patterns and rearranging them in “constellations” around a specific subject matter, philosophy can unlock some of the historical dynamic “process stored in the object,” whose identity exceeds the classifications imposed upon it (ibid., 52–53, 162–66).

What unifies all of these desiderata, and what most clearly distinguishes Adorno’s materialist epistemology from “idealism,” whether Kantian or Hegelian, is his emphasis on the “priority of the object” (Vorrang des Objekts, ibid., 183–97). Adorno regards as “idealist” any philosophy that affirms an identity between subject and object by assigning constitutive priority to the epistemic subject. In emphasizing the priority of the object, Adorno repeatedly makes three claims: first, that the epistemic subject is itself objectively constituted by the society to which it belongs and without which the subject could not exist; second, that no object can be fully known according to the rules and procedures of identity thinking; third, that the goal of thought itself, even when thought forgets its goal under societally induced pressures to impose identity on objects, is to honor them in their nonidentity, in their difference from what a restricted rationality declares them to be. Against empiricism, however, he argues that no object is simply “given” either, both because it can be an object only in relation to a subject and because objects are historical and have the potential to change. However, such “real possibilities” (currently realizable transformations) are obscured by ideological obstructions such society’s “context of delusion” (Verblendungszusammenhang) and utopia conceived as merely abstract wishful thinking within second nature as fate (Macdonald 2019a, 23–55).

Under current conditions the only way for philosophy to give priority to the object is dialectically, Adorno argues. He describes dialectics as the attempt to recognize the nonidentity between thought and the object while carrying out the project of conceptual identification. Dialectics is “the consistent consciousness of nonidentity,” and contradiction, its central category, is “the nonidentical under the aspect of identity.” Thought itself forces this emphasis on contradiction upon us, he says. To think is to identify, and thought can achieve truth only by identifying. So the semblance (Schein) of total identity lives within thought itself, mingled with thought’s truth (Wahrheit). The only way to break through the semblance of total identity is immanently, using the concept. Accordingly, everything that is qualitatively different and that resists conceptualization will show up as a contradiction. “The contradiction is the nonidentical under the aspect of [conceptual] identity; the primacy of the principle of contradiction in dialectics tests the heterogeneous according to unitary thought [Einheitsdenken]. By colliding with its own boundary [Grenze], unitary thought surpasses itself. Dialectics is the consistent consciousness of nonidentity” (1966a [1973, 5]).

But thinking in contradictions is also forced upon philosophy by society itself. Society is riven with fundamental antagonisms, which, in accordance with the exchange principle, get covered up by identity thinking. The only way to expose these antagonisms, and thereby to point toward their possible resolution, is to think against thought—in other words, to think in contradictions. In this way “contradiction” cannot be ascribed neatly to either thought or reality. Instead it is a “category of reflection” (Reflexionskategorie), enabling a thoughtful confrontation between concept (Begriff) and subject matter or object (Sache): “To proceed dialectically means to think in contradictions, for the sake of the contradiction already experienced in the object [Sache], and against that contradiction. A contradiction in reality, [dialectics] is a contradiction against reality” (ibid., 144–45).

The point of thinking in contradictions is not simply negative, however. It has a fragile, transformative horizon, namely, a rationality oriented toward an ideal “noetic” disclosure of the non-identical corresponding to Benjamin’s “hope of the name” (Schnädelbach 2007) and a society that would no longer be riven with fundamental antagonisms, thinking that would be rid of the compulsion to dominate through conceptual identification, and the flourishing of particular objects in their particularity: “Were speculation concerning the state of reconciliation allowed, then it would be impossible to conceive that state as either the undifferentiated unity of subject and object or their hostile antithesis: rather it would be the communication of what is differentiated. … In its proper place, even epistemologically, the relationship of subject and object would lie in a peace achieved between human beings as well as between them and their Other. Peace is the state of differentiation without domination, with the differentiated participating in each other” (1969b [2005, 247]). Because Adorno is convinced that contemporary society has the resources to alleviate the suffering it nevertheless perpetuates, his negative dialectics has a utopian reach: “In view of the concrete possibility of utopia, dialectics is the ontology of the false condition. A right condition would be freed from dialectics, no more system than contradiction” (1966a [1973, 11]). Such a “right condition” would be one of reconciliation between humans and nature, including the nature within human beings, and among human beings themselves.

This idea of reconciliation sustains Adorno’s meditations on metaphysics, the final part of Negative Dialectics. Metaphysics, understood as thought about what most fundamentally and generally is, reached its culmination as identity thinking in the planned industrial extermination of Auschwitz, which “confirmed the philosopheme of pure identity as death” (ibid., 362). While Kant’s critical method of transcendental idealism had consigned the concepts of dogmatic metaphysics (God, immortal soul, freedom) to the non-empirical, hence unknowable “intelligible realm,” its “constitutive subjectivity,” composed of a priori forms of intuition and categories of the understanding, constitutes a “Kantian block” delimiting possible experience. Like Heidegger, Adorno bristles against the priority of actuality over possibility in the Western metaphysical tradition (Macdonald 2019a, 103–156), and so his aim is to rescue and legitimate the metaphysical impulse that Kant acknowledged: the ability of mind to transcend in thought that which is given: “And this thinking beyond itself, into openness – that, precisely, is metaphysics” (1965b [2000, 68]). This is one way to understand the role of non-identity and the “primacy of the object” in negative dialectics: as a structural placeholder for whatever leads thought beyond its given forms of cognition: “But the absolute, as it hovers before metaphysics, would be the nonidentical that refuses to emerge until the compulsion of identity has dissolved” (1966a [1973, 406]; Theunissen 2007). “Metaphysical experience” is Adorno’s name for the experience of mind’s self-transcendence beyond what is cognitively given: he relates episodes of it in personal childhood reminiscences (e.g., 1966c [2023]), in Proust’s recollection of village names that seemed to promise fulfillment but do not disappoint when they don’t, and in the distinct phenomenology of “the situation of fruitless waiting” (1966a [1973, 372–76]; 1965b [2000, 143]). Metaphysical experience is “akin to the possibility of freedom” (1966a [1973, 396]), a possibility that, Adorno notes, “is tending to become paler and more desultory” (1965b [2000, 143]), part of his general lament of the “withering of experience” due to reification and administered life (1951a [2005, 40]; Skirke 2012, Gordon 2020).

Adorno develops a complex account of how certain artworks – high modernist, so-called ‘autonomous’ artworks – can also yield something resembling metaphysical experience: “Even at the highest peaks art is semblance; but art receives the semblance … from that which has no semblance [vom Scheinlosen] … No light falls on people and things in which transcendence would not appear [wiederscheine]. Indelible in resistance to the fungible world of exchange is the resistance of the eye that does not want the world’s colors to vanish. In semblance is promised that which has no semblance” (1966a [1973, 404–5, trans mod.]).

6. Aesthetic Theory

Philosophical and sociological studies of the arts and literature, above all music (Paddison 1993), make up more than half of Adorno’s collected works (Gesammelte Schriften). All of his most important social-theoretical claims show up in these studies. Yet his “aesthetic writings” are not simply “applications” or “test cases” for theses developed in “nonaesthetic” texts. Adorno rejects any such separation of subject matter from methodology and all neat divisions of philosophy into specialized subdisciplines. This is one reason why academic specialists find his texts so challenging, not only musicologists and literary critics but also epistemologists and aestheticians. All of his writings contribute to a comprehensive and interdisciplinary social philosophy (Zuidervaart 2007).

First published the year after Adorno died, Aesthetic Theory, his unfinished, second magnum opus, marks the incomplete culmination of his remarkably rich body of aesthetic reflections. It casts retrospective light on the entire corpus. It also comes closest to the model of “paratactical presentation” (Hullot-Kentor in Adorno 1970 [1997, xi-xxi]) that Adorno, inspired especially by Walter Benjamin, found to be the most appropriate compositional principle for his own “atonal philosophy” (Jameson 1990). Relentlessly tracing concentric circles, Aesthetic Theory carries out a dialectical double reconstruction. It reconstructs the modern art movement from the perspective of philosophical aesthetics, and it simultaneously reconstructs philosophical aesthetics, especially that of Kant and Hegel, from the perspective of modern art. From both sides Adorno tries to elicit the sociohistorical significance of the art and philosophy discussed. One could argue that Adorno’s theory of modernism encompasses his philosophical writings as a whole: aesthetics, epistemology, metaphysics, practical and social philosophy, in their relationship to modernity (Hammer 2015; Foster 2016).

Adorno’s claims about art in general stem from his reconstruction of the modern art movement. So a summary of his philosophy of art sometimes needs to signal this by putting “modern” in parentheses. The book begins and ends with reflections on the social character of (modern) art. Two themes stand out in these reflections. One is an updated Hegelian question whether art can survive in a late capitalist world. The other is an updated Marxian question whether art can contribute to the transformation of this world. When addressing both questions, Adorno retains from Kant the notion that art proper (“fine art” or “beautiful art”—schöne Kunst—in Kant’s vocabulary) is characterized by formal autonomy. But Adorno combines this Kantian emphasis on form with a Hegelian emphasis on intellectual import (geistiger Gehalt) and a Marxian emphasis on art’s embeddedness in society as a whole. The result is a complex account of the simultaneous necessity and illusoriness of the artwork’s autonomy. The artwork’s necessary and illusory autonomy, in turn, is the key to (modern) art’s social character, namely, to be “the social antithesis of society” (1970 [1997, 8]; Gordon 2021).

Adorno regards authentic works of (modern) art as social monads: somehow representing society while causally isolated from it. The unavoidable tensions within them express unavoidable conflicts within the larger sociohistorical process from which they arise and to which they belong. These tensions enter the artwork through the artist’s struggle with sociohistorically laden materials (historically sedimented artistic techniques as well as empirical, social elements) to create the artwork’s individual form (Nicholsen 1997; Geuss 1999; Robinson 2018; Pickford 2020). Adorno sees all of these tensions and conflicts as “contradictions” to be worked through and eventually to be resolved. Their complete resolution, however, would require a transformation in society as a whole, which, given his social theory, does not seem imminent.

As commentary and criticism, Adorno’s aesthetic writings are unparalleled in the subtlety and sophistication with which they trace work-internal tensions and relate them to unavoidable sociohistorical conflicts (for individual readings, see Witkin 1998; Plass 2006; Hohendahl 2013, 103–151; Macdonald 2019b). One gets frequent glimpses of this in Aesthetic Theory. For the most part, however, the book proceeds at the level of metacritique—reflections on categories employed in actual commentary and criticism, with a view to their suitability for what artworks express and to their societal implications. Typically he elaborates these categories as polarities or dialectical pairs.

One such polarity, and a central one in Adorno’s theory of artworks as social monads, occurs between the categories of import (Gehalt) and function (Funktion). Adorno’s account of these categories distinguishes his sociology of art from both hermeneutical and empirical approaches. A hermeneutical approach would emphasize the artwork’s inherent meaning or its cultural significance and downplay the artwork’s political or economic functions. An empirical approach would investigate causal connections between the artwork and various social factors without asking hermeneutical questions about its meaning or significance. Adorno, by contrast, argues that, both as categories and as phenomena, import and function need to be understood in terms of each other. On the one hand, an artwork’s import and its functions in society can be diametrically opposed. On the other hand, one cannot give a proper account of an artwork’s social functions if one does not raise import-related questions about their significance. So too, an artwork’s import embodies the work’s social functions and has potential relevance for various social contexts. In general, however, and in line with his critiques of positivism and instrumentalized reason, Adorno gives priority to import, understood as societally mediated and socially significant meaning. The social functions emphasized in his own commentaries and criticisms are primarily intellectual functions rather than straightforwardly political or economic functions. This is consistent with a hyperbolic version of the claim that (modern) art is society’s social antithesis: “Insofar as a social function can be predicated for artworks, it is their functionlessness” (1970 [1997, 227]).

The priority of import also informs Adorno’s stance on art and politics, which derives from debates with Lukács, Benjamin, and Bertolt Brecht in the 1930s (Bloch, Lukács, Brecht et al. 1977; Zuidervaart 1991, 28–43). Because of the shift in capitalism’s structure, and because of Adorno’s own complex emphasis on (modern) art’s autonomy, he doubts both the effectiveness and the legitimacy of tendentious, agitative, or deliberately consciousness-raising art. Yet he does see politically engaged art as a partial corrective to the bankrupt aestheticism of much mainstream art. Under the conditions of late capitalism, the best art, and politically the most effective, so thoroughly works out its own internal contradictions that the hidden contradictions in society can no longer be ignored. The plays of Samuel Beckett, to whom Adorno had intended to dedicate Aesthetic Theory, are emblematic in that regard (Hammer 2015, 132–155).

Arguably, the idea of “truth content” (Wahrheitsgehalt) is the pivotal center around which all the concentric circles of Adorno’s aesthetics turn: “All aesthetic questions terminate in those of the truth content of artworks” but “the truth content of an artwork requires philosophy” (1970 [1997, 335, 341; Zuidervaart 1991; Wellmer 1991, 1–35 ; Jarvis 1998, 90–123; Hammer 2015, 101–131; Hulatt 2016b; Zuidervaart 2024, 101–128). For Adorno (as for Hegel), truth is dialectical, disclosive, and non-propositionally object-oriented, as when one speaks of a “true” friend. The modernist artwork, however, does not fulfill a concept, rather it has a “enigmatic character” because it is a processual “force field” of tensions and tendencies of conceptual polarities: sensuousness and meaning, spirit and constellation, form and content, autonomy and heteronomy, mimesis and rational construction, semblance and expression, etc.. The artwork has social-historical content (its relationship to the societal context in which it was made), which, along with the historical tradition of artistic forms, techniques, genres, etc., is reflected and “sedimented” in the form of the artwork, which in turn indicates the truth content of the work as it unfolds in the ongoing reception of the work. While classical aesthetics sees the balanced, harmonious, organic unified form of aesthetic semblance as embodying the work’s truth content – the Hegelian “sensuous appearing of the Idea,” the underlying essence that is manifested in society’s observable characteristics (for example the ideal of social freedom in the bourgeois age) –, modern art’s truth content is negative and critical, the tendency toward unified semblance (Schein) and meaning interrupted by dissonance, heteronomy, abrupt and particular expression (Ausdruck) eliciting mimetic responses such that Adorno likens artwork and animality (Hofstätter and Steuer 2022).

Philosophical analysis seeks to clarify conceptually the truth content based on the social-historical content and aesthetic material constituting the work’s individual form that in its critical, negative stance both reflects antagonistic late capitalist society and holds onto art’s “promise of happiness” (Finlayson 2012). For Adorno, then, philosophy and art, the experiences of a philosophical text and an artwork, are closely intertwined (Hulatt 2016b, 105–134) . Philosophy “must strive, by way of the concept, to transcend the concept” (1966a [1973, 15]; for theological aspects of transcendence here, see Kaufmann 2000), that is, to indicate by determinate negation that concept and the principle of exchange fail to know the particular, the non-identical, non-conceptual. Art, by way of sensuous intuition, as the “refuge” of mimesis, can reach the particular, the non-identical, but only by way of semblance, falsity: “Art has truth as the semblance of that which has no semblance” (1970 [1997, 132, trans. mod.]). For Adorno philosophical, “metaphysical” experience on the one hand, from the side of the concept, and aesthetic experience on the other, from the side of intuition, grapple with the same problems of rationality, epistemology, and metaphysics, the fateful legacy of the dialectic of enlightenment.

7. Ethics and Politics

7.1 Ethics

Although Adorno published no systematic treatise on moral philosophy, he gave a lecture course in 1963 posthumously published as Problems of Moral Philosophy (1963b [2000]), an earlier lecture course on moral philosophy (1956/57) that has not yet been published, and a 1964–65 lecture course on History and Freedom (1964–65 [2006]) that partly deals with practical philosophy; in some ways these texts are preparatory for arguments made in Negative Dialectics. Moreover, his works, including but not limited to Minima Moralia, are suffused with reflections on normative judgments and even occasional prescriptions such that many readers consider his corpus of writings to be ethical through and through (Bernstein 2001, Seel 2004; to the contrary Tassone 2005), as the attempt to fathom and respond to the industrial, state-organized mass murder that Adorno consistently invokes with the name “Auschwitz” and which he sees as the culmination of the dialectic of enlightenment, reification and identity thinking that reduces every individual to a “specimen” (1966a [1973, 362]).

Adorno’s negativism runs together logical negation and normative rejection: what is “false” is what should not be (Theunissen 2007). A preliminary here is the so-called “normative deficit” or “normativity problem” in Adorno’s thought. This objection, first voiced by Habermas (1987, 119), generalizes to the claim that the normative force in Adorno’s writing is undone by the absence of knowledge of or appeal to a norm or standard which can justify his normative claims (the apparent self-undermining of reason in Dialectic of Enlightenment is an example). In the moral context, the strongest view (Freyenhagen 2013) interprets Adorno claiming that society is “radically evil” (“substantive negativism”) and that in the current social-historical context one can attain no knowledge of the good or right life (“epistemic negativism”), but that knowledge of the bad alone suffices to provide some normative force for social critique (“metaethical negativism”). Hence, “there is life no longer”; “there is no right living in the false [life] [Es gibt kein richtiges Leben im falschen]”; “The whole is the false” (1951a [2005, 15, 39, 50]); “life itself is so deformed and distorted that no one is able to live the good life in it or to fulfill his destiny as a human being” (1963b [2000, 167]). In this situation, all one can do is strive to live “less wrongly”: to know, immanently criticize, and resist the bad (both Freyenhagen 2013 and Setiya 2023 work with verisons of neo-Aristotelian ethical naturalism here). More moderate interpretations argue that Adorno identifies and explicates discrete experiences of happiness and ethical goodness, for instance in idealized childhood reminiscences, “metaphysical” and aesthetic experiences that can serve as empirical sources of normativity without, however, bearing justificatory force (Gordon 2024) or that Adorno’s oblique writing is intended to evoke without naming insights that can serve as a normative basis (Finlayson 2002), or that Adorno’s contemplative phenomenological experiences of objectivity themselves bear positive normative force (Seel 2004; Richter 2019).

For Adorno, under the conditions of late capitalism, moral philosophy is first and foremost negative: “On the question of whether moral philosophy is possible today, the only thing I would be able to say is that essentially it would consist in the attempt to make conscious the critique of moral philosophy, the critique of its options and an awareness of its antinomies” (1963b [2000, 167]). While Adorno considers a variety of established moral philosophies, the primary target is Kant’s as the philosophy of the bourgeois age; this is in keeping with Adorno’s method of “metacritique,” which weaves philosophical criticisms of a theory along with considerations of its social-historical conditions, its “experiential import” (Erfahrungsgehalt). In the model in Negative Dialectics entitled “Freedom, or the metacritique of practical reason,” Adorno seeks to recast Kantian autonomy (the capacity for self-determination via the rational will in accordance with reason) in materialist terms. In the context of the individual, he tends to conflate rational necessity with causal necessity, of dubious philosophical cogency (Pippin 2005; Jütten 2010). He also supplants the transcendental account with a Freudian developmental one (echoing the account in Dialectic of Enlightenment), whereby Kant’s picture of the rational will, operating with pure reason and discounting somatic and psychological incentives, amounts to “the ego’s rule over the id” through repression (1966a [1973, 273]). In the societal context Adorno emphasizes that this picture of autonomy accords with the needs of a burgeoning bourgeois society while demonstrating an ideological character: the absolute separation of intelligible and empirical, which underwrites the purely rational will, is belied by the actual mediation of individual by society, e.g. by social and economic roles which constitute real constraints on freedom (1966a [1973, 152]); as late capitalist society becomes increasingly functionally integrated, these constraints will increasingly constrict: “freedom and unfreedom are not primary phenomena, but derivatives of a totality that at any given time exercises dominion over the individual” (1964–65 [2006, 207]).

Adorno offers an alternative, materialist account of freedom implied by his critique of rational autonomy as repression. He locates freedom in the body, as the “memory of an archaic impulse” before the consolidation into an ego (1966a [1973, 221]; 1964–65 [2006, 213]), as what cannot be attributed to rationalistic explanation, but is a spontaneous “addendum” or “supplement” (das Hinzutretende), prior to the strict division between mental and somatic, hence “intramental” (1966a [1973, 228]) and that, in principle, could be reconciled with reason and a subjectivity properly understood. This alternative conception of freedom has implications for morality: “A new categorical imperative has been imposed by Hitler upon unfree mankind: to arrange their thoughts and actions so that Auschwitz will not repeat itself, so that nothing similar will happen. … the new imperative gives us a bodily sensation of the moral addendum – bodily, because it is now the practical abhorrence of the unbearable physical agony … It is in the unvarnished materialistic motive only that morality survives” (1966a [1973, 365]). “The true primal phenomenon of moral behavior” “occurs when the element of impulse joins with the element of consciousness to bring about a spontaneous act” (1964–65 [2006, 240]), for which Adorno adduces the example of one of the conspirators in the 1944 plot to assassinate Hitler. How exactly to understand this model of practical action has been a topic of careful discussion, as Adorno clearly acknowledges the necessary role of reason (Schweppenhäuser 1993; Bernstein 2001; Freyenhagen 2013, 133–61; Shuster 2014, 71–133). Less a systematic moral theory, Adorno’s call for the unconditional adherence to the moral impulse in part operates in response to Kantian moral rationalism and Adorno’s critique of “bourgeois coldness” (1951a [2005, 26, 74]; 1966a [1973, 263, 347]), the adaptive diminution of empathy and affection that modern society requires, and offers interesting prospects for considering this strain of his ethical thought as a social-historically contextualized ethics of care (Ferrarese 2021).

Fundamentally, Adorno’s thoughts on morality and moral philosophy remain critical, aporetic, and antinomian, for instance between “principle and practice,” as between legal procedural justice and impulsive vengeance in postwar Germany (1951a [2005, 56]; 1966a [1973, 287]). Principles of rational morality, as in Kant, are tailored to the self-reflection in which the modern autonomous subject engages, which simultaneously separates insight from action, exemplified, for Adorno, by Hamlet (1966a [1973, 228]; 1963b [2000, 112–13]). The moral addendum, as perhaps a rudimentary virtue ethics that immediately connects insight and action, is belied by the obsolescence of virtue (1963b [2000, 98]) under the conditions of modern society: value pluralism on the one hand, and interdependent functional integration to such a degree on the other that an agent’s action can be thwarted or its moral worth inverted by conditions outside their control (what Adorno calls the “context of guilt”, Schuldzusammenhang) (Menke 2005). These antinomies illustrate how social conditions undermine moral insight and action, thus Adorno concludes his lecture course: “… anything that we can call morality today merges into the question of the organization of the world. We might even say that the quest for the good life is the quest for the right form of politics, if indeed such a right form of politics lay within the realm of what can be achieved today.” (1963b [2000, 176]).

7.2 Politics

The new categorical imperative encompasses political considerations; according to Adorno, “the misdeeds of Auschwitz were only possible … in a political system in which freedom was completely suppressed” (1964–65 [2006, 202]; Tettlebaum 2005). However, Adorno did not locate the primary danger at the level of the nature of the state or political organization, claiming that the conditions favoring a relapse continued unabated in postwar democratic West Germany (1967b [2005 191–204]), and he was accused by early critics and some of his own students of quietism, aestheticism, and failing to theorize a normative political theory. For Adorno, “the political” cannot be isolated from the larger, integrated social totality, which permeates and affects every aspect of quotidian life and has implications for how immanent critique can be effectuated (Jaeggi 2005; on “internal” critique, which holds norms fixed, vs. genuine “immanent critique,” which can modify norms, cf. Jaeggi 2018). His relationship to Marxism and liberalism is complex (Hammer 2006, 11–48): for instance, he rejects the prospects of the formation of class consciousness in “late capitalism,” and does not share liberalism’s neutral standpoint above rival doctrines of the good, nor its image of a ‘thin’ rational individual with contingent preferences (Geuss 2005); indeed, Minima Moralia can be read as critically registering the eclipse of liberalism (Norberg 2011).

The question of politics arose most forcefully in the student protest movement of the 1960s, some of whose organizers looked to Horkheimer and Adorno for support (Kraushaar 1998). Adorno, in contrast to Marcuse, demurred for political and philosophical reasons. Politically, he judged the situation to be one in which direct revolutionary action had scarce chance of success. Philosophically, in a posthumously published essay on the historical relationship between theory and praxis he distinguished between political action in the service of reasonable ends and “pseudo-activity” that insists on theory’s subservience to concrete praxis as an epicycle of the dialectic of enlightenment (1969c [2005, 259–278]; Berman 2002; Freyenhagen 2014). Scholars continue to elaborate the relationship and prospects between Adorno’s thought and activities and an “activist tradition” in Critical Theory (e.g., Holloway, Matamoros and Tischler 2009; Sebastian 2024 and forthcoming).

On the other hand, Adorno persistently emphasized the political implications of his theory as praxis, e.g. immanent, ideology critique: “[the culture industry] impedes the development [Bildung] of autonomous, independent individuals who judge and decide consciously for themselves. These, however, would be the precondition for a democratic society which needs adults who have come of age [in Mündigen] in order to sustain itself and develop” (1967a [1991, 105]). Given then the diagnosis of integrated social totality under stated administered monopoly capitalism, reification and the new anthropological type, Adorno in his time sees more hope in capacity building than in direct political action. He invokes the German idealist notion of Bildung (socially mediated self-formation, education) to castigate contemporary educational and cultural institutions for purveying a conformist “Half-Bildung”: conveying enough information and relaxation to fulfill society’s functions without inducing any independent thought or personal growth (1959 [1993]). He also invokes Kant’s enlightenment notion of “political maturity” (Mündigkeit), the ability to think for oneself, without the guidance of another, and itself a necessary condition for autonomy in the sense of self-determination that, however, can be cultivated even in situations of limited freedom (O’Connor 2013, 130–135) (against reified consciousness and “coldness” Adorno also speaks of educating toward “unreduced experience”). Cultivating and reinforcing such capacities is “politically necessary,” for “an actual working democracy can only be conceived as a society of politically mature people” (1967d [1971, 107]).

This political imperative underwrites Adorno’s work as a public intellectual. Having closely studied and worked with institutions of the culture industry in the USA (Jenemann 2007), he identified and emphasized moments within the products and technology where incipient gestures of autonomy can be leveraged (Mariotti 2016). When he returned to Germany, he pursued public enlightenment (Aufklärungsarbeit) through diverse media institutions (magazine essays, radio talks and conversations, television discussions, public lectures); this was the counterpoint to his analyses of modernist artworks by which the “truth content” of social antagonisms can be revealed, but which requires precisely the classical Bildung of which most people are cheated. Politically mature people will “not cooperate” (nicht mitmachen) or at least be cognizant of the material and ideological dynamics inducing their participation and conformism. In this way Adorno’s theoretical writings and practical activities constitutes an “ethics of resistance” (Hammer 2005; Pickford 2023).

Scholars have in recent years turned to Adorno as one interlocutor in discussions about the social ontology and politics of identity (see the Adorno and Identity Seminars, Other Internet Resources). Oberle (2018) is an expansive historical study of Adorno’s experiences in exile and his theorizing about subjectivity under the category “negative identity” and its social, economic and political conditions. Okiji (2018) argues that Adorno’s notoriously dismissive analyses of jazz presuppose a subjectivity denied black people; on the other hand, jazz performance exhibits qualities of the avant-garde modernist music extolled by Adorno in a context of a Marxian negativism shared by the Black radical tradition (Kelly 2024 finds problematic differences between Adorno and Black aesthetics). Such studies seem to keep faith with Adorno: “The only thing that can perhaps be said is that the good life [das richtige Leben] today would consist in resistance to the forms of a wrong life [eines falschen Lebens] that have been seen through and critically dissected by the most progressive consciousness” (1963b [2000, 167–8, trans mod.]).

In 1969 shortly before his death and as Germany was being roiled by student unrest, the news magazine Der Spiegel began its interview with Adorno in this way:

Spiegel: “Professor Adorno, two weeks ago, the world still seemed in order…”

Adorno: “Not to me.” (1969d [2002, 14])

There is perhaps no better summary than this of Adorno’s view of the state of the world, nor any better introduction to his thought.

Bibliography

A. Primary Literature

References to the works by Adorno are listed in the following subsections:

  1. Cited Works by Adorno: lists works by Adorno that are cited in the essay, chronologically by date of original publication or, if published posthumously, date of transcript. The abbreviation “GS” or “NS” after an entry indicates where the text can be found in Adorno’s collected writings. “GS” indicates writings published during Adorno’s lifetime and collected in the 20 volumes of Theodor W. Adorno, Gesammelte Schriften, edited by Rolf Tiedemann in collaboration with Gretel Adorno, Susan Buck-Morss, and Klaus Schultz (Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1970–1986). “NS” indicates posthumous works that are appearing as editions of the Theodor W. Adorno Archive in the collection Nachgelassene Schriften (Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1993–).
  2. Works by Adorno Not Collected in Either GS or NS
  3. Adorno’s Published Correspondence
  4. Anthologies of Adorno’s Writings in English

For more extensive Adorno bibliographies, see Huhn 2004, Müller-Doohm 2005, and Zuidervaart 2014, an annotated bibliography.

1. Cited Works by Adorno

  • 1931 [year this lecture was given], “Die Aktualität der Philosophie” [= GS 1]; translated as “The Actuality of Philosophy,” Benjamin Snow (trans.), Telos 31 (1977): 120–133.
  • 1932 [year this lecture was given], “Die Idee der Naturgeschichte” [ = GS 1]; translated as “The Idea of Natural History,” Robert Hullot-Kentor (trans.), Telos 60 (1984): 111–124.
  • 1930s [typescript undated], “Thesen über die Sprache des Philosophen” [= GS 1]; translated as “Theses on the Language of the Philosopher,” Samir Gandesha and Michael K. Palamarek (trans.), in Donald A. Burke, Colin J. Campbell, Kathy Kiloh, Michael K. Palamarek, and Jonathan Short (eds.), Adorno and the Need in Thinking: New Critical Essays, Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 2007: 35–40.
  • 1933, Kierkegaard: Konstruktion des Ästhetischen, Tübingen: J. C. B. Mohr (Siebeck), 1933 [= GS 2]; translated as Kierkegaard: Construction of the Aesthetic, Robert Hullot-Kentor (trans.), Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1989.
  • 1938, “Über den Fetischcharakter in der Musik and die Regression des Hörens,” Zeitschrift für Sozialforschung, 7(3): 321–356 [= GS 14]; translated as “On the Fetish Character in Music and the Regression of Listening,” Maurice Goldbloom (trans.), in Jay Bernstein (ed.), The Culture Industry: Selected Essays on Mass Culture, New York: Routledge, 1991: 29–60.
  • 1941 [year of proposal addressed to Paul Lazarsfeld], “Problem des neuen Menschentypus,” in Robert Hullot-Kentor (ed.), Current of Music. Elements of a Radio Theory, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 2006: 650–660 [= NS I.3]; translated as “The Problem of a New Type of Human Being,” in Robert Hullot-Kentor (ed.), Current of Music. Elements of a Radio Theory, Cambridge: Polity, 2009: 461–468.
  • 1942a [year of typescript], “Reflexionen zur Klassentheorie” [= GS 8]; translated as “Reflections on Class Theory,” Rodney Livingstone (trans.), in Rolf Tiedemann (ed.), Can One Live after Auschwitz? A Philosophical Reader, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2003: 93–110.
  • 1942b [year of typescript], “Thesen über Bedürfnis” [= GS 8]; translated as “Theses on Need,” Martin Shuster and Iain Macdonald (trans.), Adorno Studies 1 (2017): 101–104.
  • 1942c [year of typescript], “Das Schema der Massenkultur” [= GS 3]; translated as “The Schema of Mass Culture,” Nicholas Walker (trans.), in Jay Bernstein (ed.), The Culture Industry: Selected Essays on Mass Culture, New York: Routledge, 1991: 61–97.
  • 1943 [year of typescript], “The Psychological Technique of Martin Luther Thomas’ Radio Addresses” (= GS 9.1); reprinted as Adorno, The Psychological Technique of Martin Luther Thomas’ Radio Addresses, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2000.
  • 1951a, Minima Moralia: Reflexionen aus dem beschädigten Leben, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp [= GS 4]; translated as Minima Moralia: Reflections from Damaged Life, Edmund Jephcott (trans.), London, Verso, 2005.
  • 1951b, “Freudian Theory and the Pattern of Fascist Propaganda,” in Géza Roheim (ed.), Psychoanalysis and the Social Sciences Vol. 3, New York: International Universities Press: 279–300 [= GS 8]; reprinted in The Culture Industry: Selected Essays on Mass Culture, Jay Bernstein (ed.), New York: Routledge 1991: 132–157.
  • 1955, “Zum Verhältnis von Soziologie und Psychologie,” in Sociologica. Aufsätze, Max Horkheimer zum sechzigsten Geburtstag gewidmet. Frankfurt am Main: Europäische Verlagsanstalt: 11–45 [= GS 8]; translated as “Sociology and Psychology,” Irving N. Wohlfarth, New Left Review, 46 (1967): 67–80 and 47 (1968): 79–97.
  • 1958, “Der Essay als Form,” in Noten zur Literatur I, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp [= GS 11]; translated as “The Essay as Form,” in Notes to Literature, Volume 1, Shierry Weber Nicholsen (trans.), New York: Columbia University Press, 1991: 3–23.
  • 1959, “Theorie der Halbbildung,” in Der Monat 11(1959): 30ff. [= GS 8]; translated as “Theory of Pseudo-Culture,” Deborah Cook (trans.), Telos 95 (1993): 15–38.
  • 1962, “Die revidierte Psychoanalyse,” in Max Horkheimer and Theodor W. Adorno, Sociologica II. Reden und Vorträge, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp: 94–112 [= GS 8]; translated as “Revisionist Psychoanalysis,” Nan-Nan Lee (trans.), Philosophy and Social Criticism 40/3 (2014): 309–338.
  • 1963a, Drei Studien zu Hegel, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp [= GS 5]; translated as Hegel: Three Studies, Shierry Weber Nicholsen (trans.), Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1993.
  • 1963b [year this transcribed course was given], Probleme der Moralphilosophie, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1996 [= NS IV.10]; translated as Problems of Moral Philosophy, Rodney Livingstone (trans.), Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2000.
  • 1964, “Fortschritt,” in Harald Delius and Günther Patzig (eds.), Argumentationen: Festschrift für Josef König, Göttingen: Vandenhoeck & Ruprecht: 1–19 [= GS 10.2]; translated as “Progress,” Henry W. Pickford (trans.), in Critical Models: Interventions and Catchwords, New York: Columbia University Press, 2005: 143–160.
  • 1964–65 [year this transcribed course was given], Zur Lehre von der Geschichte und von der Freiheit, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 2001 [= NS IV.13]; translated as History and Freedom, Rodney Livingstone (trans.), Cambridge: Polity, 2006.
  • 1965a, “Anmerkungen zum philosophischen Denken,” Neue deutsche Hefte 107 (1965): 5–14 [= GS 10.2]; translated as “Notes to Philosophical Thinking,” Henry W. Pickford (trans.), in Critical Models: Interventions and Catchwords, New York: Columbia University Press, 2005: 127–134.
  • 1965b [year this transcribed course was given], Metaphysik. Begriff und Probleme, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1998 [= NS IV.13]; translated as Metaphysics: Concept and Problems, Edmund Jephcott (trans.), Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2000.
  • 1966a, Negative Dialektik, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp [= GS 6]; translated as Negative Dialectics, E. B. Ashton (trans.), New York: Seabury Press, 1973.
  • 1966b, “Gesellschaft,” in Hermann Kunst und Siegfried Grundmann (eds.), Evangelisches Staatslexikon, Stuttgart: Kreuz Verlag: 636–643 [= GS 8]; translated as “Society,” Fredric R. Jameson (trans.), Salmagundi, 10–11 (1969): 144–153.
  • 1966c, “Amorbach,” Süddeutsche Zeitung 5/6 (1966), expanded in Ohne Leitbild: Parva Aesthetica, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1968 [= GS 10.1]; translated as “Amorbach,” in Without Model: Parva Aesthetica, Wieland Hoban (trans.), London: Seagull Books, 2023: 13–21.
  • 1967a, “Résumé über Kulturindustrie,” in Theodor W. Adorno, Ohne Leitbild: Parva Aesthetica, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp: 60–70 [= GS 10.1]; translated as “The Culture Industry Reconsidered,” Anson G. Rabinbach (trans.), in Jay Bernstein (ed.), The Culture Industry: Selected Essays on Mass Culture, New York: Routledge, 1991: 98–106.
  • 1967b, “Erziehung nach Auschwitz,” in Heinz-Joachim Heydorn, Berthold Simonsohn, Friedrich Hahn, and Anselmus Hertz (eds.), Zum Bildungsbegriff der Gegenwart, Frankfurt am Main: Verlag Moritz Diesterweg: 111–123 [= GS 10.2]; translated as “Education after Auschwitz,” Henry W. Pickford (trans.), in Critical Models: Interventions and Catchwords, New York: Columbia University Press, 2005: 191–204.
  • 1967c [year this transcribed talk was given], Aspekte des neuen Rechtsradikalismus, in Vorträge 1949–1968, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 2019: 440–467 [= NS V.1]; translated as Aspects oft he New Right-Wing Extremism, Wieland Hoban (trans.), Cambridge, Polity: 2020.
  • 1967d, “Erziehung – Wozu? Ein Gespräch zwischen Th. W. Adorno und H. Becker,” Neue Sammlung 7 (1967): 1–10, reprinted in Adorno, Erziehung zur Mündigkeit. Vorträge und Gespräche mit Hellmut Becker 1959–1969, Gerd Kadelbach (ed.), Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp 1971: 105–119.
  • 1969a, “Spätkapitalismus oder Industriegesellschaft?,” Adorno (ed.), Spätkapitalismus oder Industriegesellschaft? Im Auftrag der Deutschen Gesellschaft für Soziologie, Stuttgart: F. Enke: 12–26 [= GS 8]; translated as “Late Capitalism or Industrial Society?,” Rodney Livingstone (trans.), in Rolf Tiedemann (ed.), Can One Live after Auschwitz? A Philosophical Reader, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2003: 111–125.
  • 1969b, “Zu Subjekt und Objekt,” Stichworte, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp [= GS 10.2]; translated as “On Subject and Object,” Henry W. Pickford (trans.), in Critical Models: Interventions and Catchwords, New York: Columbia University Press, 2005: 245–258.
  • 1969c, “Marginalien zu Theorie und Praxis,” in Stichworte, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp [= GS 10.2]; translated as “Marginalia to Theory and Praxis,” Henry W. Pickford (trans.), in Critical Models: Interventions and Catchwords, New York: Columbia University Press, 2005: 259–278.
  • 1969d, “Keine Angst vor dem Elfenbeinturm,” Der Spiegel 23/19 (5 May 1969): 204–209 [= GS 20.1]; translated as “Who’s Afraid of the Ivory Tower? A Conversation with Theodor W. Adorno,” Gerhard Richter (trans.), Monatshefte 94/1 (2002): 10–23.
  • 1970, Ästhetische Theorie, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp [= GS 7]; translated as Aesthetic Theory, Robert Hullot-Kentor (trans.), Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1997.
  • 1950, Adorno, Theodor W., Else Frenkel-Brunswik, Daniel Levinson, and Nevitt Sanford, The Authoritarian Personality, New York: Harper & Brothers [= GS 8 (partial)]; reprinted with a new Introduction by Peter E. Gordon, New York: Verso, 2019.
  • 1947, Horkheimer, Max, and Theodor W. Adorno, Dialektik der Aufklärung: Philosophische Fragmente, Amsterdam: Querido [= GS 3]; translated as Dialectic der Enlightenment, Edmund Jephcott (trans.), Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2002.

2. Works by Adorno Not in Either GS or NS

  • “Goldmann and Adorno: To Describe, Understand, and Explain” [dialogue with L. Goldman], appendix to Lucien Goldmann, Cultural Creation in Modern Society, introduction by William Mayrl; translated by Bart Gahl, bibliography and appendices compiled by Ilean Rodriguez and Marc Zimmerman, Saint Louis: Telos Press, 1976: 131–147; originally published as La Creation Culturelle dans la société moderne, Paris: Les Editions Denoël, 1971.
  • “Aus einem ‘Scribble-In Book’,” in Christoph Türke (ed), Perspektiven Kritischer Theorie. Eine Sammlung zu Hermann Schweppenhäusers 60. Geburtstag, Lüneburg: Dietrich zu Klampen, 1988: 9–14.
  • “Social Science and Sociological Tendencies in Psychoanalysis,” in Wolfgang Bock, Dialektische Psychologie. Adorno’s Rezeption der Psychoanalyse, Wiesbaden: Springer, 2018: 623–642; typescript of lecture given on 27 April 1946 in San Francisco; Adorno archive: Ts 24850-79.
  • “Ist die Soziologie eine Wissenschaft vom Menschen? Ein Streitgespräch” (with Arnold Gehlen), Südwestfunk and broadcast on SFB on 3 Feb 1965; in Grenz, Friedemann, Adornos Philosophie in Grundbegriffen. Auflösung einiger Deutungsprobleme, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1974: 225–251.
  • “The Jargon of Authenticity” (1963, not in GS), in Rolf Tiedemann (ed.), Can One Live after Auschwitz? A Philosophical Reader, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2003: 163–181.
  • “Crowds and Power: Conversation with Elias Canetti” (1972, not in GS), in Rolf Tiedemann (ed.), Can One Live after Auschwitz? A Philosophical Reader, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2003: 181–201.
  • “Something’s Missing: A Discussion between Ernst Bloch and Theodor W. Adorno on the Contradictions of Utopian Longing (1964),” in E. Bloch, The Utopian Function of Art and Literature. Selected Essays, translated by Jack Zipes and Frank Mecklenburg, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1988: pp.1–17; originally published as “Etwas fehlt…über die Widersprüche der utopischen Sehnsucht,” in Gespräche mit Ernst Bloch, Rainer Taub and Harald Wieser, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1975.
  • “On the Historical Adequacy of Consciousness,” by Theodor W. Adorno and Peter von Haselberg, Wes Blomster (trans.), Telos, 56 (1983): 97–103; originally published as “Über die geschichtliche Angemessenheit des Bewusstseins,” Akzente, 12/6 (1965): 487–497.
  • Towards a New Manifesto (with Max Horkheimer), translated by Rodney Livingstone, London: Verso, 2011, revised edition 2019; originally published as “Diskussion über Theorie und Praxis,” in Max Horkheimer, Gesammelte Schriften (Volume 13: Nachgelassene Schriften 1949–1972), Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1989.
  • “Marx and the Basic Categories of Sociological Theory: From a Seminar Transcript in the Summer Semester of 1962,” Historical Materialism, 26(1) (2018): 1–11.
  • Erziehung zur Mündigkeit. Vorträge und Gespräche mit Hellmut Becker 1959–1969, G. Kadelbach (ed.), Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1971.

3. Adorno’s Published Correspondence

  • Günther Anders. Gut, dass wir einmal die hot potatoes ausgraben. Briefwechsel mit Theodor Adorno, Ernst Bloch, Max Horkheimer, Herbert Marcuse, und Helmuth Plessner, Munuch: C. H. Beck, 2022.
  • Theodor W. Adorno and Walter Benjamin: The Complete Correspondence 1928–1940, edited by Henri Lonitz, translated by Nicholas Walker, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1999.
  • Theodor W. Adorno and Alban Berg: Correspondence 1925–1935, edited by Henri Lonitz, translated by Wieland Hoban, Cambridge: Polity, 2005.
  • Theodor W. Adorno – Eric Doflein Briefwechsel. Mit einem Radiogespräch von 1951 und drei Aufsätzen Eric Dofleins, edited by Andreas Jacob, Hildesheim: Georg Olms Verlag, 2006.
  • Theodor W. Adorno und Ludwig von Friedeburg: Briefwechsel 1950–1969, edited by Dirk Braunstein and Maischa Gelhard, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 2024.
  • “Helmut Heißenbüttel, Radioredakteur. Aus den Korrespondenzen mit Theodor W. Adorno, Arno Schmidt, und Hans Magnus Enzensberger,” Schreibheft, 67 (2006): 163–189.
  • Theodor W. Adorno und Max Horkheimer: Briefwechsel 1927–1969 (4 volumes), edited by Christoph Gödde and Henri Lonitz, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 2003.
  • Theodor W. Adorno und Rudolf Kolisch 1926–1969, edited by Claudia Maurer Zenck, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 2023.
  • Theodor W. Adorno and Siegfried Kracauer: Correspondence 1923–1966, edited by Wolfgang Schopf, translated by Susan Reynolds and Michael Winkler, Cambridge: Polity, 2020.
  • Theodor W. Adorno und Ernst Krenek: Briefwechsel 1929–1964, edited by Claudia Maurer Zenck, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 2020.
  • The Challenge of Surrealism: The Correspondence of Theodor W. Adorno and Elisabeth Lenk, edited and translated by Susan H. Gillespie, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 2015.
  • Theodor W. Adorno and Thomas Mann: Correspondence 1943–1955, edited by Christoph Gödde and Thomas Sprecher, translated by Nicholas Walker, Cambridge: Polity, 2006.
  • “Theodor W. Adorno and Herbert Marcuse: Correspondence on the German Student Movement,” translated by Esther Leslie, New Left Review, 233 (1999): 123–136.
  • Theodor W. Adorno: Letters to his Parents 1939–1951, edited by Christoph Gödde and Henri Lonitz, translated by Wieland Hoban, Cambridge: Polity, 2006.
  • Theodor W. Adorno und Alfred Sohn-Rethel: Briefwechsel 1936–1969, Munich: edition text + kritik, 1991.
  • Theodor W. Adorno and Gershom Scholem: Correspondence 1939–1969, edited with an Introduction by Asaf Angermann, translated by Paula Schwebel and Sebastian Truskolaski, Cambridge: Polity, 2021.
  • Theodor W. Adorno und Lotte Tobisch: Der private Briefwechsel, edited by Bernhard Kraller and Heinz Steinert, Graz: Droschl, 2003.

4. Anthologies of Adorno’s Writings in English

  • The Adorno Reader, ed. B. O’Connor, Oxford: Blackwell, 2000.
  • Can One Live after Auschwitz?: A Philosophical Reader, ed. R. Tiedemann, trans. R. Livingstone et al., Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2003.
  • The Culture Industry: Selected Essays on Mass Culture, ed. J. M. Bernstein, London: Routledge, 1991.
  • Essays on Music: Theodor W. Adorno, ed. R. D. Leppert, trans. S. H. Gillespie et al., Berkeley: University of California Press, 2002.
  • Night Music: Essays on Music 1928–1962, ed. R. Tiedemann, trans. W. Hoban, London: Seagull Books, 2009.
  • Orpheus in the Underworld: Essays on Music, trans. D. Robertson, London: Seagull Books, 2024.

B. Secondary Literature

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  • –––, 2012, “The Artwork and the Promesse du Bonheur in Adorno,” European Journal of Philosophy, 23/3: 392–419.
  • Fong, B., 2016, Death and Mastery: Psychoanalytic Drive Theory and the Subject of Late Capitalism, New York: Columbia Univeristy Press.
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  • –––, 2020, “Adorno’s Inaugural Lecture: The Actuality of Philosophy in the Age of Mass Production,” in Gordon, Hammer and Pensky 2020: 21–34.
  • Freyenhagen, F., 2013, Adorno’s Practical Philosophy: Living Less Wrongly, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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  • –––, 2023, “The Linguistic Turn in the Early Frankfurt School: Horkheimer and Adorno,” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 61(1): 127–148.
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  • –––, 2024, A Precarious Happiness: Adorno and the Sources of Normativity, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
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  • Hansen, M. B., 2012, Cinema and Experience: Siegfried Kracauer, Walter Benjamin, and Theodor W. Adorno, Berkeley: University of California Press.
  • Heberle, R. J. (ed.), 2006, Feminist Interpretations of Theodor Adorno. University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press.
  • Hellings, J., 2014, Adorno and Art: Aesthetic Theory contra Critical Theory, Houndmills, Basingstoke, Hampshire: Palgrave Macmillan.
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  • Hohendahl, P. U., 1995, Prismatic Thought: Theodor W. Adorno, Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
  • –––, 2013, The Fleeting Promise of Art: Adorno’s Aesthetic Theory Revisited, Ithaca, N. Y.: Cornell University Press.
  • Holloway, J., Matamoros, F., and Tischler, S., 2009, Negativity and Revolution: Adorno and Political Activism, London: Pluto Press.
  • Honneth, Axel, 1991, The Critique of Power: Reflective Stages in a Critical Social Theory, trans. K. Baynes, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
  • –––, 2000, “The Possibility of a Disclosing Critique of Society: The Dialectic of Enlightenment in Light of Current Debates in Social Criticism,” Constellations, 7/1: 116–127.
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  • Houlgate, S., and Baur, M. (eds.), 2011, A Companion to Hegel, Oxford: Blackwell.
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  • –––, 2018, Critique of Forms of Life, C. Cronin (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • –––, 2023, Fortschritt und Regression, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp.
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  • –––, 2019a, What Would Be Different: Figures of Possibility in Adorno, Stanford: Stanford University Press.
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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

As of the November 2024 update, Henry Pickford has taken over responsibility for updating and maintaing this entry.

Copyright © 2024 by
Henry Pickford <henry.pickford@duke.edu>
Lambert Zuidervaart

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