ʿAyn al-Qudat

First published Wed Oct 30, 2024

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt was a first-rate philosopher, Sufi master, theologian, legal judge, poet, and scriptural exegete. He was a highly innovative author who wrote in both Arabic and Persian, and whose ideas in so many domains, from cosmology and metaphysics to epistemology and love theory, left an indelible mark upon later Islamic thought. His writings in Persian had a lasting influence upon various Sufi figures and orders in Persia, the Ottoman Empire, and particularly India, while his Arabic writings were studied in intellectual circles throughout the Muslim east into the early modern period, and were even influential during the time of the British Raj.

1. Life, Writings, Execution

Abū’l-Maʿālī Muḥammad b. Abī Bakr al-Hamadānī was born in the Iranian city of Hamadan in 1097. He received his early legal and theological training in the Shāfiʿī and Ashʿarī traditions respectively and excelled in a variety of other subjects, including philosophy, logic, Arabic and Persian poetry, Sufism, and mathematics, studying the latter with the famous poet, mathematician, and philosopher ʿUmar Khayyām (d. ca. 1124). He became a legal judge likely before the age of twenty, earning the title “ʿAyn al-Quḍāt” or “the most eminent judge”. ʿAyn al-Quḍāt was already a well-known author by this point, having written several no longer extant treatises in rational theology and mathematics, and a still extant one-thousand-line Arabic love poem (Rustom 2023a: 1–4).

By his own recounting, in 1112 ʿAyn al-Quḍāt experienced a crisis of certainty not unsimilar to that of Abū Ḥāmid al-Ghazālī, who had died the year before. After immersion in Ghazālī’s writings for a period of four years, our philosopher regained his spiritual bearings and dedicated himself more entirely to the inner life. In 1119 he came into contact with Ghazālī’s younger brother, Aḥmad Ghazālī (d. 1126), who was one of the most prominent Sufi teachers in Persia at that time (for whom, see Lumbard 2016). ʿAyn al-Quḍāt excelled on the Sufi path (see entry on mysticism in Arabic and Islamic philosophy) and was appointed by his own master as a spiritual guide (murshid; Persian, pīr) at the time of his death.

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt authored about sixteen works in Arabic and Persian, seven of which have survived. One of his Arabic books is Shakwā’l-gharīb (The Exile’s Complaint), a short apology written in 1129 (in prison) against the charges of heresy leveled against him (see below). His other book in Arabic, which was extremely influential upon the later Islamic intellectual tradition, is entitled Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq (The Essence of Reality). He remarkably wrote this dense 100-page work of philosophical Sufism in a matter of three days at the age of twenty-four. Among other things, Essence of Reality represents the first full-out philosophical defense of mysticism in the Islamic intellectual tradition, developing the work of Avicenna (d. 1037) and Ghazālī and in many ways anticipating the perspective of later philosophical Sufism associated with the name of Ibn ʿArabī (d. 1240) and his school (for which, see Ali 2022).

Thankfully, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s two most important Persian works are in our possession. By far the most famous of these is his masterpiece completed in 1127, the Tamhīdāt (Paving the Path) (substantial selected translations in Rustom 2023a). Written in a highly poetic and stylized form of Persian that is at once mesmerizing and mysterious, the book contains most of ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s mature philosophical, theological, legal, and mystical positions, and is fundamentally concerned with the themes of non-duality and self-knowledge (Ariankhoo & Rustom 2023).

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s other book in Persian, completed just before his death, is generically known as Nāma-hā (The Letters) (substantial selected translations in Rustom 2023a). The work amounts to a collection in three volumes of letters he wrote to his students, disciples, and various friends who worked for the Seljuq government. The letters contain a wealth of information regarding not only ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s main ideas, but also reveal their author to have been a caring spiritual guide and teacher to various kinds of individuals, from advanced Sufis to novices still learning the basics of Islamic law and theology. The Letters also demonstrate the degree to which ʿAyn al-Quḍāt was an acute critic of the Seljuq government’s corrupt financial and social practices, which were the key factors that led to his state-sponsored execution.

In 1128, a legal edict or fatwa was issued by state-funded religious officials, recommending ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s execution on account of his “heretical” theological views and alleged claims to divinity. The only contemporaneous record we have of the details of this accusation comes from ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s own writings, particularly his Exile’s Complaint. He shows in this work how the charges brought against him were completely sloppy and untenable, taking as they did ʿAyn al-Quḍāt to task for some of his theological and philosophical positions defended in Essence of Reality that were deeply indebted to Ghazālī’s rational theology—an irony, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt notes, because Ghazālī was sponsored and championed by the same Seljuq state (Shakwā’l-gharīb: 9–10). Incidentally, the Seljuqs seem to not have cared about/been aware of ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s Persian writings, particularly Paving the Path, which defends positions that could much more easily have been deemed as “heretical” by those seeking to discredit his orthodoxy.

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt explains that the Seljuqs were not at all concerned with his beliefs and religious teachings. The real cause for his imprisonment was the Seljuq’s frantic need to silence him on account of his vociferous and very public castigations of the Seljuq state’s corrupt financial practices and various other forms of social injustice, including their abysmal lack of care for the poor. As ʿAyn al-Quḍāt notes, his case was not looked upon sympathetically by the many religious scholars who supported the fatwa against him because they were jealous of him on account of his having completely outshined them in popularity and in scholarship (Rustom 2023a: 4–7).

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s death was personally overseen by the Seljuq Vizier Qawwām al-Dīn Abū’l-Qāsim Dargazīnī (d. 1133), who viewed the execution as an opportunity for his own professional advancement. At the same time, he knew that ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s death would leave his main enemy vulnerable—a Seljuq finance officer named ʿAzīz al-Dīn (d. 1133), who was a disciple of ʿAyn al-Quḍāt (see Safi 2006: chapter 6).

Having spent a part of 1129 in a prison in Baghdad, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt was moved to another cell in his native Hamadan, where he was publicly executed on the order of Sultan Maḥmūd b. Malikshāh (d. 1131) on May 6/7, 1131. At some point in the twelfth/thirteenth century, a tomb was constructed for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt. The site was regularly visited by Sufi pilgrims until its destruction during the reign of the Safavid dynasty (1501–1736).

2. Knowledge, Soul, Limits of Reason

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s epistemology and psychology are intimately connected, revolving around the concepts of self-recognition, the inner self, the heart, and the limits of reason. He begins by making a distinction between knowledge (ʿilm) and recognition (maʿrifa; Persian, maʿrifat) (for the latter, see Chittick & Rustom forthcoming). Whereas conventional knowledge pertains to discursive duality and separates the knower from the objects of their knowledge, recognition pertains to non-discursive unity, bridging the gap between the knower and the objects of their knowledge.

To understand the distinction between discursive duality and non-discursive unity, consider Avicenna’s discursive theory of knowledge. It begins with the premise that all knowledge involves either forming concepts (taṣawwur) through definitions, following the Aristotelian method of identifying the genus (jins) and specific difference (faṣl) of an object, or affirming the truth (taṣdīq) of a statement through syllogisms. At a basic level, there is discursive thinking (i.e., thinking that involves subjects and predicates), where the intellect systematically builds syllogisms using both internal and external senses such as sight, memory, and imagination, and grasps intelligible concepts by identifying the middle terms. According to Avicenna, the self, understood as the theoretical intellect, contains several degrees, each of which represents a higher level in the process of intellection that reaches its perfection in the acquired intellect (al-ʿaql al-mustafād). The theoretical intellect requires an external agency (i.e., the Active Intellect) to actualize its ability to grasp universals. The Active Intellect acts like the Sun that illuminates human intellectual faculties and makes it possible for them to move from potentiality to actuality. (A great deal of contention exists among Avicenna scholars regarding the process of acquiring intelligible forms, with some strongly supporting “abstraction” and others opting for “emanation” (see Hasse 2014 and Black 2014). In contrast to the abovementioned emanationist account, abstractionists argue that meanings are abstracted from a non-conceptual transaction between our senses and the world, leading to a version of the “myth of the given”, i.e., empirical knowledge resulting from the mind’s innate ability (Azadpur 2020)).

For all its merits, the Avicennan theory of knowledge and knowledge acquisition would still be confined to ʿilm rather than maʿrifa from ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s vantage point. As will be seen, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt does not deny the validity of conceptual knowledge, but “recognition” for him implies a higher mode of cognition that one has to acquire through the “eye of the heart” (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §125). What is “recognized” are the truths and realities of things as buried deep down in one’s own soul, and from this angle of vision “recognition” (maʿrifa) comes close in meaning to Platonic recollection (anamnesis) (for which, see Silverman 2003 [2022]).

This closeness in meaning between recognition and recollection is evidenced by the fact that ʿAyn al-Quḍāṭ agrees with Plato insofar as the soul (i.e., the deepest and uncreated layer of the soul) is the locus of previous acquaintance with the realities of things (ḥaqāʾiq). The soul possesses knowledge of the realities of things before the state of its embodiment, and hence “recognition” involves the act of rediscovering this forgotten knowledge. However, the precise nature of this knowledge is left unexplained, apart from the fact that it involves some sort of deep intuition about the self. This would be a task left to the likes of Shihāb al-Dīn al-Suhrawardī (d. 1191) and the followers of Ibn ‘Arabī, such as Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Qūnawī (d. 1274), Dāwūd al-Qayṣarī (d. 1350), and Shams al-Dīn Fanārī (d. 1430).

The view of these successors of ʿAyn al-Quḍāt becomes clear when contrasted with Avicenna’s rejection of Platonism and his own theory of knowledge. For Plato, Forms are independent, self-subsisting realities, which are the basis for his theory of recollection. Avicenna rejects universals understood as Platonic Forms for a number of reasons, not the least of which is that they are vulnerable to the third man argument (see the discussion in the entry on Plato’s Parmenides, §4.3)). In place of Platonic Forms, he countenances the existence of ante rem universals within the celestial Intellects, which are instrumental for Avicenna in the reception of universals and, hence, knowledge. However, he remains silent on a crucial point made by the Sufi metaphysicians following in the wake of ʿAyn al-Quḍāt. According to them, all genuine knowledge of universal realities necessitates the universalization of the would-be knower’s mode of existence. That is, knowledge, ultimately, is a mode of being (Cancelliere 2019: 125).

While certainly not Plato’s theory of the Forms and knowledge, this account of knowledge does have its affinities. Knowledge for those in the tradition of ʿAyn al-Quḍāt is not the reception of something distinct from the self as Avicenna would have it—a mode of knowledge that is essentially dualistic in that the receiver and what is received, namely, universal objects of knowledge in the celestial intellect, are distinct; rather, in Platonic fashion, the knower comes to recognize the objects of knowledge that have been inherent and essentially are the very self of the knower, which had hitherto been unrecognized.

This brings us back to ʿAyn al-Quḍāt for whom recognition is a higher mode of knowing that fundamentally can only be acquired through spiritual practice, thereby leading to the opening of the eye of inner vision which transcends the limits of conventional ways of knowing and leads to true self-knowledge (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §125). ʿAyn al-Quḍāt cites the famous story of Moses and Khidr from the Qur’an (a staple theme in Sufi literature) to flesh out the difference between knowledge and recognition. For instance, the Quran (18:65–82) mentions the story of Moses meeting a stranger (often identified as Khiḍr, a possessor of special knowledge), who baffles him by performing such actions as killing a boy and sinking a boat. The Quran graphically describes Moses’ disgust at such acts: “You have certainly done a horrible thing!” (Quran 18:74). Khiḍr later reveals that he killed the boy because he would grow up to be a disbeliever and would bring much hardship to his parents, who were true believers. Moreover, he knew that God would favor the parents with a more virtuous and caring child. As for the boat, Khiḍr informs Moses that there was a tyrant ahead of the boat’s owners, and that this tyrant was known to forcefully seize undamaged boats. From this story, Sufis often deduce intuitive knowledge that apparently contradicts our discursive thinking involving common sense notions of morality and knowledge.

While discussing the complexities of self-recognition, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt presents an intriguing view regarding the body-soul relationship. On the one hand, he disagrees with Avicenna and his followers who deny the soul’s preexisting the body; on the other hand, he maintains that no good argument has been offered to support this position, noting that his certainty on the issue is based on maʿrifa. The human intellect can only understand the existence of the soul by examining the body and its attributes, such as the soul’s ability to cause perception and movement, which are common traits among all living beings. Our perception of the soul’s continued existence after its separation from the body is based on analyzing intellectual perception, considering the soul as the locus of knowledge. Since knowledge is indivisible, says ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, “the division of its locus is inconceivable”, leading to the conclusion that the soul cannot be destroyed (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §150). Here again, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s affinity with Platonism becomes apparent. Based on the concept of anamnesis, Plato too has Socrates conclude that there exists a doctrine of pre-existence. Like ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, he utilizes the idea of pre-existence to support arguments for the soul’s indestructability and immortality (particularly in Phaedo 69e–84b).

Moreover, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt argues against Avicenna’s position concerning the manner in which a body’s specific constitution acts as an accidental cause for a particular soul’s emergence into the sublunary realm. He argues that the soul precedes the body, and that the states of a soul change when it inhabits a body (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §149–150). At a more subtle level, souls are characterized by their limitless degrees of diversity (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §153). For some souls, there is no intermediary between them and God (e.g., the souls of prophets). It can be argued, for example, that the state of the soul changes according to a host of various environmental factors; God, by contrast, is above any kind of temporal change. ʿAyn al-Quḍāt acknowledges such objections, but argues that since God created people in His own image, it is possible for at least some souls to reflect God’s all-encompassing perfection or, to put it another way, to reflect His image more directly. At the same time, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt is quick to note that “with the exception of a few souls, there are many intermediaries between their existence and the existence of the First” (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §155). Regardless of the relationship of the soul to God, every soul is implicated in a causal chain that proceeds from the spiritual to the sensible realms.

Being trained in the rational sciences, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt is aware that at its highest level, his treatment of the nature of the heart and divine consciousness transcends the limits of discursive thinking. From one perspective, the intellect or human reason (ʿaql) is an essential instrument by which truth can be measured against falsehood and right can be discerned from wrong. From another perspective, when an intelligent person embraces a purely empirical attitude concerning immaterial entities, eschatological matters, and the nature of God’s radiating self-awareness, he gropes at the impossible:

Reason is a valid scale, and its measurements are certain and real with no unreality in it; and it is a just scale: it is inconceivable that it can ever be unjust. Having said that, when an intelligent person desires to weigh everything against reason, even the matters of the next world, the reality of prophecy, and the realities of the Beginningless divine attributes, that is a desire for the impossible. (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §187, with slight modifications)

In making his case for the suprasensory nature of this higher mode of knowing, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt borrows a phrase made popular by Ghazālī, namely “the stage beyond reason” (al-ṭawr warāʾ al-ʿaql). In relation to the reasoning faculty, the stage beyond reason (or what he also calls “stages beyond reason”) is as the soul is to the body (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §185). This special vantage point is itself accessed through inner purity and expansiveness of the heart:

When your heart has expanded for faith in the unseen, God will cause a light to pour into your inner self, the likes of which you have not witnessed before. This is one of the traces of that stage that appears after the stage of reason. So intensify your search, for that alone is what you need in order to find! (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §176, with slight modifications)

The stage beyond reason presents many difficulties to our ordinary, discursive intelligence, much like the way primary concepts are utterly unknowable to the bodily senses (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §178). Indeed, it is the senses themselves that stand in the way of accessing this stage of knowing, which can only be obtained by those who have arrived at true recognition. To highlight the directness of the kind of knowing conferred by the stage beyond reason, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt employs a common Sufi sensory image, again bequeathed by Ghazālī, namely that of “tasting” (dhawq). Tasting can convey to embodied people the affect-like nature of recognition, but it too falls short, trapped as it is in language (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §122). In the final analysis, recognition for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt leads to a state of perception (idrāk) in which the subject/object dichotomy dissolves and the perceiver themselves “become” the objects of perception and in fact the Perceived Itself (Nāma-hā: 1:213–214; 3:397). Moreover, in this world, the stage beyond reason can only be accessed by those who have attained true self-recognition (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §§184–185). ʿAyn al-Quḍāt writes:

O chevalier! So long as a person is in sense perception, his perception can only be a finite attribute. When he reaches intellectual perception, the individual parts of his objects of perception will become infinite. But when he reaches recognition, he will be the objects of perception: the individual parts will be boundless, and in his perception the infinity of the intellectual world will become finite. (Nāma-hā: 1:213–214; translations from this work are adapted from Rustom 2023a: passim)

3. God, Existence, Attributes

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s metaphysics begins with Ultimate Reality, commonly referred to as the Self/Essence (al-dhāt) in Islamic thought. In line with his epistemology as articulated in the previous section, he notes the difficulty in saying anything about the Self, since It is the absolute and infinite reality transcending all thought and description (Tamhīdāt: 269). The Absolute is the “Reality of reality” in which there is no trace of multiplicity, potentiality, or actuality. It is more like a geometrical point that cannot be divided into anything, even though “existence” emerges from It in the most perfect of ways (Tamhīdāt: 337; Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §33). The supra-sensory reality called the Self or the Eternal (al-qadīm) is beyond human perception, but Its existence can nevertheless be logically demonstrated:

“Certain truth” [cf. Quran 69:51] in proving the Eternal lies in demonstrating It by way of that existence which is the most general of things, for if there were not an Eternal in existence, there would, fundamentally, not be an existent in existence whatsoever. This is because existence divides into that which encompasses the originated and the Eternal, that is, into that whose existence has a beginning and that whose existence does not have a beginning. If there were no Eternal in existence, there would, fundamentally, not be that which is originated, since it is not in the nature of that which is originated for it to exist by virtue of itself. Indeed, that which is existent by virtue of itself is the Necessary Existent. And that which is necessary in itself cannot be conceived as having a beginning. (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §31)

As has already been demonstrated (Maghsoudlou 2016), ʿAyn Quḍāt often draws from Avicenna when incorporating rational arguments into his philosophical Sufi worldview. The text just cited is a fine example of how the Avicennan division of existence (wujūd) into the necessary and the contingent gets reinterpreted in philosophical Sufism via kalām or Islamic rational theology (for more on this, see McGinnis & Acar 2023). Existence is divided into that which is eternal and without a beginning and that which originates in time. If we consider any existent entity or process in the universe, we find that it is both changing or temporal. However, something which originated in time must need an external cause to initiate its existence since it cannot exist by virtue of itself. Hence, we must assume an entity that is eternal and exists by virtue of Itself, namely an entity that is self-caused. Moreover, since this entity is necessary in Itself, It is self-sufficient and does not depend on another cause for Its existence. It also transcends temporal boundaries since time involves change, and change is bound up in contingency. ʿAyn al-Quḍāt further says:

Thus, it can be said: [1] “if there were an existent in existence, it would necessarily entail that there be an Eternal in existence”. This is a certain premise: it is inconceivable for anyone to doubt it. Then it can be said, [2] “existence is clearly known”. This is the second premise, which, like the first premise, is certain. Thereafter, [3] the existence of an Eternal existent necessarily follows from these two firm premises. Such is the demonstrative proof of the Eternal by way of existence. Be it succinct or extended, a further exposition is inconceivable. (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §31)

This is a version of Avicenna’s famous burhān al-ṣiddiqīn (“the demonstration of the ever-truthful”) proof for the existence of God, except that ʿAyn al-Quḍāt uses the terms ḥudūth (temporal origination) and qidam (eternity) instead of the modal terms wujūb (necessity), imkān (possibility), and imtināʿ (impossibility). The premises that ʿAyn al-Quḍāt invokes are uncontroversial, since even the radical skeptic has to admit that there is existence even if he were to posit that reality is some kind of simulation and not “real” as such. Similarly, we may disagree about the nature of existence, but it would be hard to argue that existence itself came out of pure nothingness (not relative nothingness). This is true even when we are trying to explain cosmogenesis through quantum gravity or, at bare minimum, certain laws of physics. That is, those laws and initial conditions cannot be nothing (it is apt to note here that some contemporary physicists believe in the eternal or cyclical nature of the universe).

However, one might argue that there is nothing wrong in imaging a contingent initial natural causal state—contingent either because the existence of the entities involved in that initial state is contingent, or because at least some of the properties of the entities involved in that initial state are contingent (Oppy 2013). But for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt and many others in the Islamic intellectual tradition, contingent beings, by definition, lack “eternal necessity”, which necessitates their existentiation (ījād) through something that must have eternal necessity in itself. And only being or existence (wujūd) fits the bill. Take any entity, such as a triangle: it possesses an “essential” but not “eternal” necessity. That is, in every possible world, the definition of a triangle will hold, but that does not necessitate its “eternal” existence. Even if we grant an infinite chain of contingent beings, the series cannot become necessary except through another cause, which ultimately proves that the series of a chain of contingent beings necessarily terminates in that whose existence is necessary in Itself.

Although from one point of view, the Divine Self is beyond names and descriptions, from another point of view, It manifests Itself and hence enters into a relationship with the cosmos. These relationships are indefinite, and each one of them can be described through a given divine name or attribute. Moreover, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt avers, the divine names have a specific spiritual significance for the traveler or wayfarer on the Sufi path (sālik), since they are associated with subtle states that are closely linked to his action in the world:

God has a thousand and one names, and in every name He discloses Himself in a thousand ways. Every kind of self-disclosure gives rise to a state in the wayfarer, and every state brings forth a subtlety and a different action in him. (Nāma-hā: 1:74)

A perennial theological problem that arises here is the question of how God’s oneness can remain uncompromised in the face of multiple divine names. That is, if God is one, how does His having multiple attributes and names not introduce multiplicity in Him? ʿAyn al-Quḍāt seems to follow the standard Ashʿarī position regarding the relationship between the Essence and Its attributes. He acknowledges the difficulty in holding the position that seeks to affirm the divine attributes while also asserting that they do not negate the Essence’s unity and simplicity. He thus prefers to think of the divine attributes as subsisting in the Divine Essence (Tamhīdāt: 304), giving the analogy of the sea and its drops by suggesting that the statements, “A drop is other than the sea” and “A drop is from the sea”, are both correct (Tamhīdāt: 336). Similarly, water is called by different names in different languages, but they all refer to the same object, which is to say that the Essence is called by many names that all refer to the same reality (Tamhīdāt: 263).

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt has more to say about the relationship between God’s Essence and Its attributes by positing that each attribute is a perfection of the Essence that pertains to a specific manifestation of the Essence in a perspectival (iʿtibārī) way. The Essence can hence be described by “power” if we consider the existents as objects of power, “desire” if we consider the existents as the objects of desire, and “knowledge” if we consider the existents as objects of knowledge (Nāma-hā: 1:144). In other words, the entire universe can be described as a self-objectivation of the Essence, which encompasses everything:

Thus, since this Essence is related to the effusion of the existents that emerge from It, and it is known that they are contingents and that it is undoubtedly the Necessary who brings the contingent into existence, it is called “power” from the standpoint of this relation between It and the existents, and sometimes it is called “desire” from the standpoint of another relation. But the weak-minded think that there is a difference between power and the Powerful, and desire and the Desiring! This is the very limit of rational reflection. (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §81, with a slight modification)

Another way to explain the divine attributes would be to say that divine attributes such as knowledge imply that everything comes into existence through God’s knowledge. Similarly, divine power means that something comes into existence from Him. According to ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, there is no conflict between these two attributes, even though people understand them to be distinct by way of habit (Nāma-hā: 1:178).

Although ʿAyn al-Quḍāt talks of different categories of being, namely the necessary and the contingent, being or existence ultimately is one. More importantly, being or existence is identified with the very reality of the Essence. And since contingent beings cannot have being through themselves, they must have their being through another, namely the Necessary. This means being is one, despite the existence of multiplicity. Like Ghazālī before him (see Chittick 2012: 72), this insight leads ʿAyn al-Quḍāt to conclude that “there is no self in existence other than He” (Nāma-hā: 1:232–233), a point for which he argues as follows:

Your existence is not outside of two possibilities: either it subsists on its own or through the existence of something other than itself. If it subsists on its own, then there is no distinction between your existence and God’s existence because there is not more than one being in existence that subsists on its own…. And whatever does not subsist on its own but subsists through something else does not have [real] existence. Thus it necessarily follows that there is not more than one being in existence, and that one existence is God. (Nāma-hā: 3:398)

According to ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, nothing exists independent of God since an independent order of existence alongside God’s would introduce two different orders of reality, each with its own rules of existence. But since the multiplicity of entities that we encounter do not display absolute unity, the implication is that existence belongs only to God (Nāma-hā: 3:397). ʿAyn al-Quḍāt explains this further by drawing attention to the Quran, which states that all things other than God are perpetually evanescent. He gives the analogy of a form in a mirror which is observation-dependent, perishing as soon as the observer turns his gaze away from the mirror (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §95; see also section 6). The oneness of being as conceived by ʿAyn al-Quḍāt means that all existent things are mysteriously plunged in God’s all-encompassing existence and that they derive their ontological sustenance from God, who is none other than being itself.

A corollary to this position is that nothing can be there aside from being/existence. But this does not spell a form of pantheism, since ʿAyn al-Quḍāt is careful to note that although God shares “withness” or coextensivity (maʿiyya) with things, nothing shares the rank of withness with God’s existence (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §116). This argument leads him to commit to the position that God is ontologically and logically prior to everything. Ultimately, for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, being’s necessity, uniqueness, and oneness means that only God truly exists, while all other things only appear to exist—existing relationally at best—as they derive their existence from God. For ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, this truth requires spiritual insight to fathom, since conventional ways of knowing are incapable of demonstrating it. But for the person of realized inner vision, he sees God as being with all things, while at the same time being both logically and ontologically prior to them (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §141).

4. Selfhood, Inwardness, Heart

The Sufi idea of maʿrifa or recognition is often related to a well-known Arabic maxim, “He who recognizes himself, will recognize his Lord”. With this saying in mind, our philosopher drives home the fact that those who do not have self-recognition (attained through self-cultivation) can never recognize God, thus remaining strangers to their true selves:

One must recognize himself so that he may recognize his Lord. They do not have self-recognition, so how can they have recognition of God?! They are estranged. (Tamhīdāt: 178; translations from this work adapted from Rustom 2023a: passim)

But self-recognition that leads to a knowledge of God cannot be had through the self qua self. Rather, one should strive to know God through God. This is because the self, i.e., the lower self, stands in the way of true knowledge of God. The seeker must therefore seek self-recognition through God, who lies at the root of human consciousness:

But you are with yourself. When you find something, it is like finding yourself. The seekers and lovers of God seek Him through Him. So they find Him through Him. The veiled ones seek Him through themselves. So they see themselves, and have lost God. What do you hear? Do not consider this a trifling statement! (Tamhīdāt: 319)

For ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, “through Him” specifically means “through God’s light”. Since light is synonymous with existence, it is the source through which one can come to know one’s own self. Such an insight between the relationship between light and existence anticipates Suhrawardī’s well-known theory of light and its manifestation (ẓuhūr), which is used to explain consciousness (see the entry on Suhrawardi). But for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, since the universe manifests God’s names and attributes, by directing one’s gaze to it, the seeker can come to a knowledge of the divine. But God’s light is equally displayed in the heart of the seeker, and hence by delving into one’s inner being, which in turn reflects the universe, one may attain true self-recognition (Tamhīdāt: 273). Moreover, in self-recognition, the knowing subject no longer posits an “other” or “object” outside of themselves to be known. The more they recognize their true self, the more will they recognize its contents, which are God’s attributes buried deep within their soul (Rustom 2023a: 153–158).

As alluded to already, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt places a premium on a person’s finding and knowing God through their inner self. The way to God is always open to a real seeker (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §176), which itself implies sincerity in the act of seeking (ṭalab) and discipleship (Persian, irādat), namely the guidance of a realized spiritual master. It is important to note here that for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, the spiritual path is not simply “out there”, awaiting discovery. Rather, the path to Ultimate Reality is inside the self, moving from guidance that is “outside” the self (i.e., the help of a spiritual master) to the more inward cultivation of self-recognition, namely inwardness.

It comes as no surprise to learn that ʿAyn al-Quḍāt underscores the need to look within to find the true self, which is synonymous with the immanent divine presence. He makes it clear that the path to God is neither on earth nor in the heavens, nor in any posthumous states. Rather, the path to God is to be found in the inner recesses of one’s selfhood (Tamhīdāt: 24). The more one journeys the spiritual path, the more one comes to realize that one is not the seeker but the one who is sought. That is, it is not a person’s desire that takes them to God since God’s desire is prior to their desire (Tamhīdāt: 19). Such a call for an inward turn does not mean one should neglect the legal and outward aspects of religion identified with the Sharia (i.e., the Divine Law). Rather, the Sharia itself is now redefined in terms of inwardness because for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, the Sharia is “the straight path of reality, and anyone who missteps on the path loses his own reality and throws himself into error”. And this because “the path is the inner reality of the human being” (Tamhīdāt: 289–290).

Closely related to inwardness is the notion of the “heart” (qalb; Persian, dil), which is a standard term in Sufi psychology (see Nasr & Ogunnaike 2024). Sufis such as Ghazālī distinguish between the physical heart, which pumps blood, and the subtle, spiritual heart, which is the locus of perception (see Faruque 2023). Others describe it as the center of human emotions by placing it in the middle of the Platonic tripartite soul, with reason on top and appetite at the bottom. At the deepest level, the heart is identified with the consciousness of the divine at the center of one’s being, and it is this dimension of the heart that occupies ʿAyn al-Quḍāt attention:

The seekers of God search for Him inside their selves because He is in the heart, and the heart is in their inner reality. This is strange to you, but whatever is in the heavens and on the earth, God has created all of it in you. (Tamhīdāt: 287)

Anyone who circumambulates the heart will find the goal, and anyone who errs and loses his way on the path of the heart will become so distant that he will never find himself. (Tamhīdāt: 24)

Search for the heart and grab hold of it! (Tamhīdāt: 146)

Alongside being the locus of the divine presence, the heart has a self-reflexive ability to know itself and to come to see itself as being uniquely suited to being the object of the divine gaze (Persian, naẓargāh-i khudā) (Tamhīdāt: 146). However, not every heart or the inmost center of the self can radiate the divine presence. Only a heart that is free of such dispersive characteristics and tendencies as negative thoughts and emotions can act as a locus for God’s self-contemplation. Or, as ʿAyn al-Quḍāt simply puts it, “God does not have any condition for you but that you empty your heart” (Nāma-hā: 2:92). With God’s eyes fixed upon a person’s pure heart, the heart can act as a source of moral conscience. ʿAyn al-Quḍāt thus asks us to consult the “mufti of our heart” when facing moral dilemmas, provided we have overcome the vagaries and impulses of our lower selves (Tamhīdāt: 197–198).

5. Good, Evil, Agency

Following a long-standing tradition in Islamic thought, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt identifies existence with light (nūr). God as the Necessary Existent is consequently the Necessary Light, or what our philosopher calls “the Illuminator of all other lights” (Tamhīdāt: 255). One major implication of this position is that, just as all other existent things are unreal (i.e., they exist through God’s being) in relation to the Necessary Being, when we speak of them as lights, they are likewise unreal or metaphorical in relation to the Illuminator of lights (Tamhīdāt: 256). At the top of the cosmic hierarchy, God’s light emanates in descending degrees of intensity. The further away a thing is from the Source of cosmic luminosity, the more darkness it exhibits, ontologically speaking. Since for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt God is pure goodness, it is to the degree that things participate in God’s light that they exhibit this goodness. Thus, the further a thing is away from God and the darker it is, the less goodness will it display. Yet since all things participate in the order of existence/light, there cannot be non-existence/darkness per se. This is why ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, who inveighs against the Zoroastrian view in support of the ontological reality of evil (see Rustom 2020: 74–75), argues for the ultimate unreality of evil. He states his position by arguing for the relational (nisbatī) nature of evil:

In general, one must say that, in itself, evil is nonexistent. That is the truth, however far-fetched it is for human understanding. The Messenger’s statement and the scholarly consensus must be interpreted—namely why they affirmed the existence of evil. This is just like when the father and mother of a child call cupping “evil” with reference to what is apparent and in relation to the child’s perception, since he can only perceive pain. But the parents know the reality: cupping is not evil; rather, it is good!

Likewise, it is certainly known to the Prophets and Friends of God that nothing but the good comes into existence from God and that all of His actions are good. However, it might be that not everyone will know that whatever exists is good and is not evil. The bad is relational, but in itself it is nonexistent. Thus, the name “evil” exists and is affirmed. Although from the perspective of reality evil is nonexistent, it is merely affirmed as such in accordance with the understanding of people. Yet the existence of the reality of evil, in relation to God’s mercy, generosity, and bounty is known to be impossible. (Nāma-hā: 2:294)

If, as ʿAyn al-Quḍāt maintains, evil is ultimately not real, then there is nothing in the cosmos but goodness in varied modes of perfection and presence. At the same time, evil does have some kind of “reality” in our world, and this by virtue of its relational nature. Relations, after all, are both real and unreal—for example, the relationship between father and son bespeaks a real fact that obtains between them on account of their essential definitions; but, at the same time, this relationship has no actual ontological status (i.e., it has no existence apart from those existents that make up the relata of the said relationship).

Like so many other post-classical Islamic philosophers, theologians, and mystics, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s theodicy is clearly influenced by Avicenna (see Shihadeh 2019), particularly the metaphysics (ilāhiyyāt) section of his famous Book of Healing (Kitāb al-Shifāʾ) (Kitāb al-Shifāʾ: IX.6), which itself was informed by the substantial discussion in Plotinus’ (d. 270) Enneads I.8. While Avicenna speaks of “accidental evils” (al-sharr al-ʿaraḍī), ʿAyn al-Quḍāt refers to relational evils. As for “essential evil” (al-sharr al-dhātī), namely a thing’s non-realization in a substrate for which it was intended (such as blindness vis-à-vis the ocular faculty), ʿAyn al-Quḍāt in all but name acknowledges its presence since evil/darkness in his worldview is tantamount to the non-realization of existence/light; this is to say that the privation of existence/light results in the emergence of evil/darkness in the cosmos (Rustom 2020: 76–77).

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt also confronts the objective nature of evil as a necessary and real feature of the sublunar realm, despite the fact that, as Avicenna did before him (Avicenna, Kitāb al-Shifāʾ: IX.6), he argues that all things in existence display complete perfection and beauty. Beyond our subjective likes and dislikes, accidental evils are a result of the existence of this perfection itself, which is inscribed upon the nature of things. Thus, water nourishes a fish but can drown a person, rain is beneficial for someone but can destroy a home, and fire is a source of warmth but can also burn somebody (Tamhīdāt: 186; Nāma-hā: 1:401). As for absolute evil, it cannot be present in the world as that would entail fissures and imperfection in the cosmic order (Nāma-hā: 1:343). But the presence of relational evils in the world does not for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt compromise God’s goodness, nor does it point to any kind of imperfection in the world (Tamhīdāt: 122).

If relational evils are a part of the order of nature, so too is the presence of secondary causes. ʿAyn al-Quḍāt ultimately relates them back to God’s agency or habit (sunna), which itself is identified with the very workings of the nature and structure of the world. As such, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s theory of causation is firmly rooted in a worldview that sees it as resultant from a form of divine compulsion (Maghsoudlou 2016: 277; Rustom 2020: 79–84). As for human beings, they are simultaneously implicated into this grand scheme of causal constraint, but also have restricted freedom of action—albeit not a libertarian form of freedom (Rustom 2020: 80).

As with his treatment of the relational nature of evil, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s theory of human action is formed in part as a response to another group of “dualists”, that is, the Muʿtazila. Apart from being moral dualists (see Rustom 2023a: 81), he sees them as adhering to a position to the effect that there is no type of compulsion that informs human choice (ikhtiyār). Rather, people can and do always act freely. ʿAyn al-Quḍāt maintains that human beings have free choice in their actions, but the freedom in question is a kind of compelled (muḍṭarr) constrained freedom: “Through his choice, man is compelled, overpowered, and subjugated” (Nāma-hā: 3:338). What this means is that human beings are compelled to act by virtue of the quality of choice that is a part of their nature (Nāma-hā: 3:338). Although the idea that human beings are compelled to act freely goes back to Avicenna (Avicenna, al-Taʿlīqāt: 124–125), one of ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s main aims in drawing on this idea is to demonstrate a perfect parallel between his cosmology of secondary causal constraint and his theory of human constrained action (Maghsoudlou 2016: 276–277). When it comes to constrained action, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt approaches this problem from many angles, the most concrete example of which is inextricably tied to his treatment of love.

6. Imagination, Beauty, Love

Many thinkers in post-Avicennan Islamic thought attempted to translate their abstract philosophical ideas into concrete forms through a process called “imaginalization” (tamaththul), which derives from Quran 19:17 (Rustom 2023a: 102–104). They did so largely through storytelling, poetry, music, and other artistic forms, thereby highlighting a unique dimension of later Islamic thought in which arcane and theoretical ideas accessible to a small group of highly trained philosophers were now graspable by a much larger group of intellectuals, artists, and laypeople (for storytelling in Islamic thought, see Zargar 2017; see also Harb 2020 for the wider and related usage of tamthīl in Arabic literature). Imagination in general and the imaginal world (ʿālam al-khayāl) in particular were seen as unique spaces that allow for the coming together of the seemingly opposed “worlds” of meaning (maʿnā) and form (ṣūra) (for different conceptions of imagination, see Chittick 1989 and van Lit 2017). Imagination came to refer to a process whereby meaning, which comes from a realm that is changeless, immaterial, and non-dual, interpenetrates form, which is characterized by change, corporeality, and duality. The function of imagination is often likened to dreams and mirrors since they both re-present to the observer images that are simultaneously there and not there, thereby pointing up their in-between-ness or unique ontological middle ground between existence and nonexistence. ʿAyn al-Quḍāt explains it in this way with respect to mirrors:

From the perspective of reality, everything in existence is transitory, and the only thing that remains is the face of the Living, the Self-Abiding. It is just like a transitory form in a mirror—only the form outside the mirror remains insofar as general observation is concerned, satisfied as it is with sensory imagery. In the eyes of the recognizer, the form outside the mirror is also transitory, just like the form inside the mirror, with no distinction between them. (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §95)

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt develops his theory of imaginalization in a variety of ways, relating it to the various posthumous states after death, understanding of scripture, and experience of beauty (see, respectively, Rustom 2023a: 106–109, 173–185, and 248–260). Imaginalization also comes part and parcel with ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s wide-ranging exposition of love (ʿishq, maḥabba; Persian, dūstī) in which he attempts to communicate through various angles of vision the interplay between lover and Beloved and how the lover can participate in the Beloved’s Self-love and Self-revelation by beholding the Beloved in multiple forms, images, sounds, and modes of beauty:

If love did not have the ruse of imaginalization, all the travelers on the path to God would become unbelievers because, in most moments, they would see everything in one form and in one state only. In seeing the moment like that, it would be one of blame. But when one sees increase in beauty and an added form at every instant or every day, love becomes greater and the desire to see the object of one’s yearning greater. At every instant, He loves them [Quran 5:54] is imaginalized for they love Him, and they love Him is, likewise, imaginalized. Thus, in this station, the lover sees the Beloved at every instant in another form of beauty, and herself in a more perfect and more complete form of love. (Tamhīdāt: 124–125)

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s doctrine of imaginalization is best exemplified in his retelling of the story of Iblīs or Satan. He notes that careful attention to this tale will unlock many doors for its listeners: “If anyone in existence knew how to listen to the tale of Iblīs, especially its mysteries, his tale would become extremely dear to him” (Nāma-hā: 2:416). In discussing what in Islamic thought is known as tawḥīd Iblīs or the devil’s monotheism (see Awn 1983), ʿAyn al-Quḍāt is following a well-trodden path first paved by the famous tenth century Sufi martyr Ḥallāj (d. 922), who was then proceeded by a number of major figures such as Aḥmad Ghazālī, Sanāʾī (d. 1131), and ʿAṭṭār (d. 1221). The tawḥīd Iblīs doctrine derives from the Quran (particularly 7:11–25), where God asks Iblīs to bow down to His newest creation, Adam. But Iblīs refuses, citing his superiority over Adam. God consequently expels Iblīs from His presence and Iblīs becomes the misguider of humanity (note that in the Quran and the Islamic tradition, Iblīs is never identified with evil per se). For the likes of Ḥallāj and Aḥmad Ghazālī, Iblīs’ refusal to bow to Adam was not on account of obstinacy but simply because he could only bow to his Source and first love. Iblīs is thus at core a monotheist who will always remain patient in the face of all forms of adversity, even if it be “blame” from God Himself (see Rustom 2020).

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s dramatized and imaginalized presentation of the story of Iblīs turns out to be a masterful way of expounding his action theory in concrete form. It also ties into his understanding of love. Just like human beings, who are “compelled” into action, Iblīs is also compelled into action. The difference here is that human action is informed by the inherent quality of choice, whereas Iblīs’ actions are informed by the inherent quality of love, which leaves him choiceless:

The lover is choice-less. Whatever the lover does comes into existence without his desire, and issues forth without his choice. (Tamhīdāt: 238)

Alas! What can be said about love? What indication of it is worthy and what explanation can be given? When entering love, a person should surrender and not be with himself. He should abandon himself and prefer love over himself. (Tamhīdāt: 96–97)

Iblīs “chose” separation from the Beloved over prostration to someone else. How excellent was his perfection of love! The gaze swerved not, nor did it transgress [Quran 53:17]. (Nāma-hā: 1:96)

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt insists that in his perfect, selfless love, Iblīs has many things to teach human beings. One of these is the cultivation of aspiration for divine proximity and the lack of “self” interest, regardless of what obstacles might stand in the way:

One must be an aspirant of the quality of Iblīs so that something comes from him. How fine was his aspiration! He said, “I am ready for endless pain, so give me the eternal mercilessness that is my due!” (Nāma-hā: 2:187)

The madness of love is of better worth than the cleverness of the entire world!… Whoever is not a lover is a self-seer. To be a lover is to be selfless and pathless. (Tamhīdāt: 98)

The imaginalized depiction of the story of Iblīs ultimately allows ʿAyn al-Quḍāt to turn to love itself as fundamentally grounded in the nature of things, which is where his theory of the “stage beyond reason” comes full circle. According to ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, divine love is one of the special attributes of the stage beyond reason (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §65); when a person experiences it, speech reveals itself to be rather hopeless in articulating its reality:

Love is one of the things specific to the stage beyond reason. For those who have witnessed the states of love, there is no doubt that reason is far from perceiving these states. To the understanding of the person restricted by his reason and who has not had an intimate taste of love, there is no way for the lover to convey the meaning of that love with which he is so intimate. That can only happen when such a person stands in the same position as the lover who tastes love. (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §71)

As ʿAyn al-Quḍāt sees it, love and God are one, and all human beings are objects of divine love. But he also maintains that human beings are likewise lovers of God. This leads him to explain the subtle dynamics of what can be called the “circle of love”, where the subject of love is simultaneously its object. To make sense of this all-encompassing vision of love, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt urges us to enter the school of love as students: “Be a student! For love suffices as your teacher” (Nāma-hā: 2:128). When entering the school of love, the seeker should surrender and abandon himself, preferring love over everything else (Tamhīdāt: 96–97). Time and again, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt emphasizes how a person should have sincerity and purity of intention when embarking on the path of love, seeking the Beloved from the bottom of their heart. The reality of the search for the Beloved comes to fruition when the gaze of the seeker is entirely turned towards the Sought. ʿAyn al-Quḍāt provides us with an analogy of iron’s attraction to a magnet to explain this state of sincere seeking:

The reality of seeking obtains when the gaze of the seeker is entirely turned toward the sought. It is then that seeking and finding are twins. The reality of this search can be expressed by the attraction of iron to a magnet: if the iron is unalloyed, the magnet will attract it, with nothing to impede the iron’s attraction to the magnet. But if the iron is mixed with some gold, silver, or the like, this will compromise its attraction. Likewise, when the iron is uncontaminated, its fully actualized attraction to the magnet will ensue. It is then that finding—namely the iron reaching the magnet—will necessarily occur. (Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq: §72, with slight modifications).

For ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, love is a fire that burns and turns everything into its own color, thereby reducing the lover to nothingness (see Rustom 2022). In order to experience true love, a person must be selfless and traceless, like Iblīs, making their concern solely with love itself (Tamhīdāt: 98). ʿAyn al-Quḍāt also relates the divine-human love relationship to the standard Persian Sufi imagery of the moth (Persian, parwāna) and candle (shamʿ). The moth, which symbolizes the lover, naturally lunges itself into the candle, which symbolizes the divine Beloved. All that the moth wants and sees is the fire of the candle. When it throws itself into the candle’s fire, neither moth nor moth-hood remain. All that remains is the fire of love:

Without the fire, the moth is restless, but in the fire it does not have existence. So long as the moth flutters around the fire of love, it sees the entire world as fire. And when it reaches the fire, it throws itself in its midst. The moth does not know how to differentiate between the fire and other than the fire. Why? Because love itself is all fire. (Tamhīdāt: 99)

It would not be an understatement to claim that “love” is the lens through which ʿAyn al-Quḍāt looks at the reality of religion itself. He often approaches the topic in the context of his treatment of a famous Prophetic saying that speaks of Islam as being divided into seventy-two or seventy-three sub-communities. The word for “sub-community” is madhhab (pl. madhāhib), and can also mean “school of thought”, “position”, and even “religion”. This explains why ʿAyn al-Quḍāt understands the reference to Islam’s being divided into seventy-two madhāhib as not sub-communities within the particular religion of Islam, but as so many different religious traditions within the more universal category of “Islam” or submission to God (for ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s approach to religious diversity, see Boylston 2021). The underlying meaning of these various madhāhib “is displayed to a person who has gone beyond the seventy some-odd differing religions” and who sees all things as rooted in God, the “Source of existents” (Tamhīdāt: 304–305).

For ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, a person who sees these different religions as distinct is better described as a “separator” than a “seeker” (Tamhīdāt: 21). Indeed, each of these ways are simply “waystations on the path to God” (Tamhīdāt: 285), and the path to God is nothing other than religion. The “religion” in question is what is known in the Persian Sufi tradition as madhhab-i ʿishq or the “Religion of Love”. For ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, the religion of love emphasizes unity and oneness instead of divisions and factions, which cause people to veer into the direction of multiplicity, disunity, and dispersion. That is why he says that “The partisans of the seventy-two religions dispute with one another, are opposed to everyone else because of their creed, and kill one another”. But if only they had listened to his words, he advises, they would have realized “that everyone follows one religion and one creed”, which is the creed of the lovers (Tamhīdāt: 339). When it comes to these lovers of God, love is the only true religion, and nothing else will suffice:

Let me start a fire, setting aflame this religion and creed!
I put love for You in place of religion.

How long shall I contain this hidden love in my wounded heart?
The goal of the path is neither religion nor creed, but You. (Tamhīdāt: 23)

7. Reception, Influence, Legacy

Along with Ghazālī and a handful of other authors, ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s Arabic and Persian writings were historically influential upon intellectual and spiritual authors working in both these languages well into the early modern period. By the thirteenth century, Persian Sufi authors such as ʿAzīz al-Dīn Nasafī (d. before 1300) were drawing on his work. This influence can also be found in such famous figures as ʿAbd al-Raḥmān Jāmī (d. 1492), a follower of Ibn ʿArabī who read both ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s Arabic and Persian writings, and the Safavid philosopher Mullā Ṣadrā (d. 1640), who drew on ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s unique theory of the Quran in developing his own scriptural hermeneutics (see Rustom 2012: 31–32). ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s Persian writings were also well-received in Ottoman Sufi circles, particularly among followers of the great Sufi poet Rūmī (d. 1273). His metaphysics and Sufi theology as expounded in Paving the Path and the Letters was specifically influential upon a variety of Indian Sufi authors for over five centuries, having been commented upon in Persian, naturalized into popular Indian Sufi sermons, and translated into languages such as Dakhini.

As far as ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s Arabic writings go, shortly after his death Essence of Reality became one of the most important curricular texts in the famous Madrasa Mujāhidiyya in Maragha (about 280 miles northwest of Hamadan). The core syllabus at this school was a major anthology of philosophical Sufism which included works by the likes of al-Fārābī (d. 950), Avicenna, Ghazālī, and ʿUmar b. Sahlān al-Sāwī (d. after 1143). At the Mujāhidiyya, a number of highly influential Muslim philosophers read Essence of Reality, including such giants as Suhrawardī and Fakhr al-Dīn al-Rāzī (d. 1210). It is also said that Naṣīr al-Dīn Ṭūsī (d. 1274) had translated it into Persian while establishing his observatory in Maragha. A number of Ibn ʿArabī’s later Arab followers, such as al-Nābulusī (d. 1731), made good use of the metaphysics and epistemology enshrined in the Essence of Reality, which also seems to have influenced later authors in British India, as is evidenced in the work of Faḍl-i Ḥaqq Khayrābādī (d. 1861) (see Rustom 2023a: 18–21).

ʿAyn al-Quḍāt is to this day a celebrated figure in Iran and beyond. In his native Hamadan there is a large cultural complex dedicated to his life, image, execution, and legacy. His writings are commonly taught in institutions of higher learning in Canada, France, Germany, Iran, Turkey, the United Kingdom, and the United States, are the subjects of scholarship and major commentaries, and continue to be anthologized (most recently in Adamson & Benevich 2023: 343–344, 507–509; Rustom 2023a; Rustom forthcoming) and translated into various languages (see bibliography in Rustom 2023a).

Bibliography

For a full bibliography, see:

Rustom, Mohammed, 2023, Inrushes of the Heart: The Sufi Philosophy of ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.

A. Primary Literature

  • Avicenna, Kitāb al-Shifāʾ, translated as The Metaphysics of the Healing, Michael Marmura (trans.), Provo: Brigham Young University Press, 2005.
  • –––, al-Taʿlīqāt. Modern edition, ʿAbd al-Raḥmān Badawī (ed.), Cairo: al-Hayʾa al-Miṣriyya al-ʿĀmma li’l-Kitāb, 1973.
  • ʿAyn al-Quḍāt, Nāma-hā (The Letters), c. 1131 CE. Modern edition, ʿAlī Naqī Munzawī and ʿAfīf ʿUsayrān (eds), 3 vols., Tehran: Asāṭīr, 1998. Substantial selected translations in Rustom 2023a.
  • –––, Shakwā’l-gharīb (The Exile’s Complaint), 1129 CE, translated in A Sufi Martyr: The ‘Apologia’ of ‘Ain al-Quḍāt al-Hamadhānī, A. J. Arberry (trans.), London: Keagan and Paul, 1969.
  • –––, Tamhīdāt (Paving the Path), 1127 CE. Modern edition, ʿAfīf ʿUsayrān (ed.), Tehran: Manūchihrī, 1994. Substantial selected translations in Rustom 2023a.
  • –––, Zubdat al-ḥaqāʾiq (The Essence of Reality), 1120 CE, translated as The Essence of Reality: A Defense of Philosophical Sufism, Mohammed Rustom (ed./trans.), New York: New York University Press, 2022.

B. Secondary Literature

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  • Ariankhoo, Masoud and Mohammed Rustom, 2023, “ʿAyn al-Quḍāt’s Tamhīdāt: An Ocean of Sufi Metaphysics in Persian”, in Rustom 2023b: 3–17 (ch. 1).
  • Awn, Peter J., 1983, Satan’s Tragedy and Redemption: Iblīs in Sufi Pyschology (Studies in the History of Religions : Supplements to Numen 44), Leiden: E.J. Brill.
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  • –––, 2013, Divine Love: Islamic Literature and the Path to God, New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
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  • –––, forthcoming, A Sourcebook in Global Philosophy, Sheffield: Equinox.
  • Safi, Omid, 2006, The Politics of Knowledge in Premodern Islam: Negotiating Ideology and Religious Inquiry, Chapel Hill, NC: University of North Carolina Press.
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  • van Lit, L. W. C., 2017, The World of Image in Islamic Philosophy: Ibn Sīnā, Suhrawardī, Shahrazūrī and Beyond, Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press.
  • Yūsuf-i Thānī, Maḥmūd and Ḥasan Mahdīpūr, 2012, “Tabyīn-i kathrat wa-waḥdat-i wujūd dar andīsha-yi ʿAyn al-Quḍāt Hamadānī bar asās-i ṭawr-i ʿaql wa-ṭawr-i warā-yi ʿaql”, Jāwīdān-khirad, 21(4): 135–164.
  • Zekavati Gharagozlou, Alireza, 2001, ʿIrfāniyyāt: majmūʿa-yi maqālāt-i ʿirfānī, Tehran: Ḥaqīqat.
  • Zargar, Cyrus Ali, 2017, The Polished Mirror: Storytelling and the Pursuit of Virtue in Islamic Philosophy and Sufism, London: Oneworld.

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the authors with suggestions.]

Copyright © 2024 by
Muhammad U. Faruque <farukia001@gmail.com>
Mohammed Rustom <mohammed.rustom@carleton.ca>

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