Albert the Great

First published Sun Nov 30, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Bruno Tremblay replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

The importance of Albert the Great in the development and achievements of medieval and more generally Western philosophy remains somewhat undervalued and understated. For a long time, a shadow was cast onto his contributions by the excellence of his most famous student, Thomas Aquinas, whose greater clarity and more systematic thought in comparison with his master are impossible to deny. But as Aristotle would never have been the philosopher he was had it not been for Plato, so too would Aquinas never have reached the heights he did had it not been for pioneers like Albert. For Albert comes at a time in the Middle Ages that is intellectually both extraordinarily stimulating and challenging. Over just a few decades, a trove of new Greek and Arabic writings in philosophy, mathematics, astronomy, medicine, etc., makes its way into Western Europe and needs to be interpreted within a coherent understanding of the world. Not only are most of those works of the highest caliber, their sophistication and advancement are often far superior to what medievals had managed on their own in the many centuries during which the West was cut off from a significant portion of the intellectual accomplishments of the Ancient Greeks and later their Arabic successors. Albert is at the vanguard of that very intense movement of interpretation and assimilation, which depends on translations (or successive translations) that not unfrequently contain barely intelligible passages and which must contribute to one consistent vision of reality that also minimally does not contradict the Christian faith. The task is absolutely colossal, and it is thanks to intellectually courageous giants like Albert that the West manages to accomplish it over a surprisingly short period of time.

It would be quite wrong, however, to reduce Albert to the role he historically played in philosophy or even to being a mere precursor of Aquinas. For he himself is also an extremely serious and intelligent thinker, whose writings offer valuable insights into both the thought of the authors they are commenting on and reality. In other words, he is a philosopher from whom much can be learned. His seemingly unquenchable and universal sense of wonder, his tendency to always look for the deepest and most explanatory reasons, his far above average capacity to get hold of, read and assimilate new materials, his ease when dealing with very abstract questions and his general trust in the power of reason are among his exceptional strengths. As anyone acquainted with his works knows, however, their study also comes with difficulties. Albert’s verbosity, his seeming desire to show how well read he is, his at times idiosyncratic Latin and his contradictions (whether real or only apparent) can easily make him hard to understand or get in the way of the points he is making. Some of these weaknesses are assuredly amplified by his role as a pioneer in the exploration and assimilation of so many new and challenging sources of different origins, which also manifests itself in the extraordinary magnitude of his own literary production. (When completed, the critical edition of his works, begun in the 1950s, should have more than 40 large volumes, many of which are in fact groups of volumes.) Even an admirer of his sometimes gets the impression that it would have been better had he written fewer books and for that reason perhaps written them a little more slowly and with greater care.

1. Life

Albert was born in Lauingen (Swabia), around 1200, to a noble family at the service of the Count of Bollstädt. He likely studied at the Faculty of Arts of the University of Padua, where he became a Dominican in 1223. He continued his studies in Cologne and subsequently lectured in convents in Hildesheim, Freiburg im Breisgau, Regensburg and Strasbourg. In the early 1240s, he was sent to the University of Paris, where he received his degree of Master of Theology in 1245 and taught until 1248. He was then sent to Cologne to found a new Dominican school (studium generale), accompanied by the young Italian student he had met in 1245 and taught in Paris, Thomas Aquinas. He led and lectured in the Cologne studium until 1254, when he was elected by his fellow Dominicans Prior Provincial of Teutonia. He occupied the position for three years, during and after which he spent time at Papal courts. Following a new period of teaching and writing in Cologne, and against the strong wishes of the head of his order, Albert accepted the troubled bishopric of Regensburg in 1260. He was granted his request to be relieved of his position in 1262, and thereafter preached the crusade in German-speaking regions of Europe. After teaching in Würzburg and Strasbourg (1264–1269), he was back in Cologne for good, where he died in 1280. In 1931, Pope Pius XI declared Albert a Saint and a Doctor of the Church, and ten years later he was made the patron saint of natural scientists by Pius XII. His remains can be found today in the crypt of the Dominican church of St. Andreas, in Cologne.

Albert’s exceptionally prolific writing spanned over many decades. His first published work, On the Nature of the Good (De natura boni), dates from the first half of the 1230s and in his old age he was still working on his Summa of Theology (Summa theologiae siue de mirabilia scientia Dei), which was left unfinished despite the fact that some anonymous hands might have contributed to the composition of its Book II. Many of Albert’s purely philosophical works are from the 1250s, but the late 1240s and the 1260s were also particularly fertile, both theologically and philosophically.

2. Meaning of Albert’s Philosophical Work

As befits the encyclopedia for which this entry is written, we focus all our attention on Albert’s philosophical thought and leave aside his contribution to the study of Scripture and the development of Christian revealed theology. (It is interesting to note, in that respect, that this Dominican friar, Master of Theology at the University of Paris and bishop was already in the Middle Ages much more renowned as a philosopher than as a theologian [Grabmann 1917].) Now, perfect agreement among scholars is lacking when it comes to determining the exact and complete reason why Albert not only incorporated many philosophical developments into his theological work but also devoted so much time and energy on preparing and writing philosophical books. His own and most oft-quoted statement about the nature of that work can be found at the very beginning of his Physica, the first of his numerous paraphrastic commentaries on Aristotle, written in 1251–1252:

Our intention, in natural science, is to satisfy as much as we can the brothers of our order who have been asking us, for now many years, to compose for them a book on physics like this one, in which they might acquire a complete knowledge of natural science and on the basis of which they might be able to understand properly the books of Aristotle. We do not see ourselves as sufficient to the task, but being unable to fail the brothers’ requests and after refusing many times, we have at last consented to it and undertaken it, overcome by the requests of some of them. Our goal is primarily to praise God almighty, who is the source of wisdom and the creator, master and ruler of nature, and to be useful to the brothers and consequently to all who read that book and want to acquire natural science.

Our method in this work will be to follow Aristotle’s order and meaning and to say whatever seems necessary to explain and support it, in such a way, however, that no mention is made of his text. Besides that, we will make digressions, shedding light on difficulties that arise and providing all the things that, being less explicit in the meaning of Aristotle, are obscure to some. (…) [W]herever (…) a digression is made, we add it there in order to complete and support what has been introduced. Proceeding this way, we will complete as many books and use the same titles as Aristotle did. We will also add book parts where they have not been completed and books where they have been skipped or omitted, which books either Aristotle did not make or, if he perhaps made them, they have not come down to us. (…)

Now, since there are three essential parts to the philosophy of reality (…), which are the natural (or physical), mathematical and metaphysical parts, our intention is to render said parts intelligible to the Latins. (…) [W]hile treating the parts of philosophy, we will first complete, with God’s help, natural science, and then we’ll speak of all the mathematical ones and it is in divine science [i.e., metaphysics] that what we intend to do will come to its end. (Physica, I, 1, 1, p.1, l.9–49 and p.3, l.37–41)

Albert’s goal of writing paraphrastic commentaries on all of Aristotle’s natural works and to make them intelligible to his Dominican brothers and contemporaries quickly turns out to be much more ambitious, first because it also extends to mathematics and metaphysics. Not only will all available works by Aristotle be explained and added to, but works written by other philosophers will be incorporated into the project along the way, whether it be to fill in a few noticeable gaps in Aristotle’s writings, as in natural science, to dramatically expand on what he has left us, as in metaphysics, or to actually deal with a branch of learning about which he seems not to have written anything, as in mathematics. Moreover, the actual unfolding of Albert’s project over the years reveals very early on that he has the same plan in mind for the other two main parts of philosophy, logic and ethics. In fact, at the time of establishing and describing the above plan he was finishing or had recently finished a question-commentary on Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics and he was months or a few years away from composing the first of a long list of commentaries on logic.

But why is Albert embarking on such a demanding and ambitious enterprise, for which there is no precedent in the Middle Ages? It is almost natural for modern historians of philosophy to think that he is simply interested in what Aristotle (or in some cases, another like-minded philosopher) thought and wants to help less advanced students who share the same interest. Albert’s numerous explicit denials in his commentaries that he is putting forth what he himself thinks and his claims that he is merely exposing others’ ideas and that readers unhappy with the latter should not lay the blame at his door seem to confirm that interpretation. On this depends the principle held by some (and explicitly encouraged in De somni et vigilia, III, 1, 12, p.195b) that Albert’s personal views are to be found only in his theological works, especially the theological syntheses, and never in his purely philosophical commentaries. However tempting such an approach may be, it is perhaps too easy or simplistic to be true and it is telling that very few today consistently adopt it. First, Albert sees Aristotle as the greatest authority in philosophical matters, comparable to Augustine in revealed theology, which in the context means that Aristotle is more right about more things and that he is not studied merely out of curiosity or because his works have relatively recently resurfaced and become fashionable in the West. Much of what Albert says when expounding Aristotle, in particular when raising and answering objections against him, would make little sense if he were not constantly reading and most often agreeing with Aristotle in light of what reason and experience tell him about reality. Moreover, and consequently, all those thinkers that Albert lumps with Aristotle under the wide (and sometimes elastic) label of “Peripatetic school” — Avicenna, Averroes, Porphyry, the author of the Book of Causes, etc. — are used to explain, complete and add to Aristotle because a great number of their claims are considered by Albert to be not only consistent with what the Stagirite says, but also true. Also, there are, as previously mentioned, discrepancies within Albert’s works, but it is far from being clear that those that come to light when comparing his theological with his philosophical works are proportionally more numerous or important than those that come out when we compare his philosophical writings with one another or his earlier writings with later ones. The rich philosophical developments that can be found in his theological works are also, much more often than not, in agreement with either the totality or a part of what he says in his exclusively philosophical writings. Finally, a good proportion of Albert’s disclaimers, however general their terms, arise in the context of discussions of philosophical matters about which stakes and risks of contradicting, directly or indirectly, church doctrine are particularly high (e.g. God’s causality), or he seems to struggle mightily to make up his mind for good (e.g. the animation of celestial bodies and the identification of those spirits with angels) (Twetten and Baldner 2013: 171).

Everything considered, then, is Albert a systematic thinker? Does the sum of his writings present a new, unified, structured and entirely or almost entirely consistent understanding of reality? No, especially if we take people like Aquinas or Scotus as the measures of such systematicity. Perhaps we should say that Albert is indeed a systematic philosopher, but in a diluted sense and only in as much as one can be when one is attempting to absorb a wave of new knowledge that vastly surpasses what Europe had been able to achieve without it; when one is most often one of the first or not rarely even the first in the West to work and comment on the books or groups of books that convey that resurging ancient wisdom; when one often comments on a work before one has had a chance to access or study seriously other relevant parts of that new corpus or more legible translations thereof; and when one’s somewhat bulimic mind and very universal interests lead one to write a little too much and too fast. In fact, that Albert managed to be as consistent or systematic as he was under such circumstances is perhaps what should amaze us, rather than the lack of unity we notice between the different parts of his works.

If something approaching a loose philosophical system can be seen in Albert’s project, even one that would have formed only along the way, what would be some of its main features or how should it be characterized? On the one hand, Albert’s understanding of philosophy proper as a rational pursuit of understanding of reality, his genuine and keen interest in the workings of the physical world, his constant respect for and desire to be in agreement with empirical evidence and the rules of logic, as well as his explicit and repeated claims that Aristotle is the main thinker he is following in philosophy, clearly point toward Aristotelianism. Albert explains and writes commentaries on Aristotle more than on any other philosopher, and it shows in the fact that Aristotle is the immediate source of the greatest proportion of Albert’s ideas in philosophy. And yet many feel ill at ease labelling him an Aristotelian, one reason being that most moderns do not share Albert’s syncretic conviction, rooted in late Antiquity and fairly common in the Middle Ages, that much of what he finds in and retrieves from his other sources — whether Ancient Greek, Arabic or Jewish — can be shown to complement and be compatible with an Aristotelian comprehension of the universe. More importantly, the materials that he finds in his Neoplatonic readings and attaches to his Aristotelian project tend to play a quantitatively disproportionate role in his loose synthesis because they concern extremely fundamental questions about which Aristotle says very little, particularly God and the created world’s relationship to Him as its cause. In that respect the influence on Albert of Pseudo-Dionysius (on whose whole corpus he wrote commentaries before embarking on his series of Aristotelian paraphrases) and the anonymous Book of Causes (which Albert thought had its origin in Aristotle but was in reality an Arabic reworking of Proclus’ Elements of Theology) can hardly be overemphasized. It is in light of that influence that it has been argued (Anzulewicz 2000a and 2000b) that there is a general but profound underlying unity to Albert’s whole project and that it is provided by his adhesion to the triad exitus-perfectio-reductio: 1) the procession of the world from God, its one and simple creator and exemplar (exitus), 2) the world’s concrete unfolding and realization in multiplicity, contingency, potentiality, time and materiality (perfectio); 3) the return and reduction of all created things to God, their ultimate end (reductio). Much of the work done by Aristotle and his followers, in which among other things the concept of creation ex nihilo is seemingly absent and the permanence of prime matter often treated as given, is then seen as only one part of a bigger whole and as focusing mostly on the description and analysis of perfectio, i.e. our world as it concretely realizes itself and is experienced by us. Said work also ceases to be seen as incompatible or in unacceptable tension with the Neoplatonic intuitions and Christian faith of Pseudo-Dionysius and the highly abstract metaphysical reasoning of the Book of Causes, which concentrate on God as the prime origin and ultimate end of absolutely all things that constitute our world. Not everyone is convinced by such attempts, however, and the remark has been made (Sturlese 2017: 875–876) that given the lack of unity between Albert’s works and the changes in his thought over time, it is best to study and treat each book in relation to its own unique context and in chronological order.

3. Logic

Logic is for Albert a full-fledged science in the Aristotelian sense, with self-evident principles which are specific to it (e.g. ‘when something is predicated of a subject, that which is said of the predicate is also said of the subject’) and from which necessary conclusions can be drawn. It is also an art in a broad sense in as much as the elements of that scientific, theoretical knowledge can be used as rules in the concrete reasoning done in all sciences (including in logic), thus justifying the traditional view of logic as the instrument or mode of the sciences (Tremblay 2007).

Albert was the first in the Middle Ages to comment on the whole of Aristotle’s organon, as well as a few complementary works that tradition had attached to the latter over time. The texts he commented on are ordered by him in function of, by and large, the main cognitive ends that the application of logical knowledge can contribute to: 1) knowing the incomplex, i.e. knowing the quiddity of things, ultimately and ideally through definition (Porphyry’s Isagoge, Aristotle’s Categories, the anonymous 12th-century Book on the Six Principles [which Albert attributes to Gilbertus Porretanus] and Boethius’ Book on Division); 2) knowing the complex, i.e. knowing the true through simple predication or argumentation (Aristotle’s On Interpretation, Prior Analytics, Posterior Analytics, Topics and Sophistical Refutations, as well as two short treatises by Boethius on the categorical and the hypothetical syllogisms). The latter two commentaries by Albert, to which he refers in Posteriora Analytica, I, 1, 1, p.4a, appear to be lost.

Albert’s work in logic has received relatively little attention so far. This is true of other writings of his, but it is also that some hold Albert’s logical corpus in very low esteem (most famously Prantl 1867; Ebbesen 1981), for which the latest reason is his undeniably extensive and silent use therein of his predecessor Robert Kilwardby’s commentaries. The reproach should not be overstated, however, not only because of how common it was for medievals to anonymously use contemporaries’ material in teaching and not to refer to them by name in their writings — something which Kilwardby himself does, as shown by the material common to his logical commentaries and those of his own Parisian predecessors — but also because the influence of the English master is very uneven throughout Albert’s logical corpus. Moreover, it seems to be most present in the more formal or technical treatises, notably the commentary on the Prior Analytics and those on On Interpretation and the Sophistical Refutations, which were likely of lesser interest to Albert. In his commentary on the Categories and the Second Analytics, arguably the most crucial of the Aristotelian logical treatises, Kilwardby is most often used as a rich and reliable source of common classroom objections and problems and many of his solutions are either contradicted or greatly developed by Albert (Steel 2009; Brumberg-Chaumont 2020).

Logic as understood by Albert and most ancient and medieval philosophers pays attention to much more than argumentative formal validity and deals with questions that many today would say belong to epistemology and even metaphysics. This is certainly not to say that he confuses logic and metaphysics as he understands them. Albert is an early promoter in the West of the Avicennian view that logic deals with something that has only intellectual existence, unlike what metaphysics and philosophy of nature study (Metaphysica, I, 1, 1, p.3, l.8–12). More precisely, it examines the features that the natures of things or real objects of our thoughts take on when they exist in and are understood by our intellect and enter into relationships with one another in rational discourse, which is the process of acquiring new knowledge on the basis of what we already know. Thus, universals (if understood logically, for Albert can mean many different things when using that term), supreme genera, subjects, predicates, contradictories, premises, syllogisms, etc., are examples of the many topics that logic must study, although the argument or the syllogism is also frequently singled out as the subject of the science of logic because of how it roughly contains or implies the others. Being a genus, a predicate or part of a premise are traits of things as conceived, strictly speaking, although like Avicenna, Albert believes that our need to use linguistic manifestations of our concepts in order to conduct rational discourse explains why we also, albeit less properly or essentially, characterize logic as a language science (Tremblay 2011; 2014).

Albert’s frequent metaphysical, natural and other non-logical digressions in his logical works do not contradict his debt toward Avicenna and his clear understanding of the purely rational or intellectual nature of the type of reality logic studies. They reflect his general tendency, noticed in most of his works and unnerving to some of his readers, to be as complete as possible. In the case of logic, two more reasons are at play. First, Albert thinks that even though logic is about beings that exist only in reason, what is true about them depends ultimately on the objective nature of things. Thus, it is only after it has been abstracted as a universal concept that animal, when understood in relation to horse in rational discourse, acquires the logical property of generality and becomes a genus, but the truth that animal is the logical genus of horse (or the falsehood that animal is the logical species or proper accident of horse or that carrot is the genus of horse) is at the end of the day based on what those things are in themselves, independently of reason (Liber divisionum, 2, 4, p.91, l.3–22; De anima, III, 3, 2, p.210, l.18–20; Super Porphyrium De V universalibus, 1, 2, p.4, l.61–68; Tremblay 2014). In that sense, at least some of Albert’s non-logical forays have to do with his desire to bring to light a deeper explanatory reason. Second, Albert is sometimes commenting on works that contain or are seen by him as containing non-logical points or developments. Thus, Albert believes that even if the Categories is overall a work in logic, some of the properties of the ten categories treated by Aristotle are non-logical and belong to the supreme genera whether we know and reason about them or not (De praedicamentis, 2, 6, p.30, l.64–31, l.2; 2, 8, p.36, l.46–51; 2, 9, p.38, l.53–55; 2, 12, p.45, l.7–10; Tremblay 2019).

4. Natural Philosophy and the Sciences

For Albert, as well as for most thinkers up to the early modern era, natural philosophy or science encompasses any study of the physical world conducted by reason and using sense experience as a decisive criterion of truth. Its fundamental unity comes from the fact that it has one general subject, which he defines formally as corpus mobile or body subject to change (a position Aquinas will later criticize), whose different kinds are addressed in the more particular branches of the discipline (Physica, I, 1, 3). The first part of that study is considered in Aristotle’s Physics and, following our narrower modern parlance, we might call it more philosophical. In physics, we define the subject of the discipline in all its generality, demonstrate its properties and generally shed light on an array of very common aspects of the physical world that relate in one way or another to naturally changeable material substances as such. Those things — change, final causality or telos, body, time, place, etc. — are so common that no person normally constituted can fail to experience them and therefore everyone has some form of knowledge of them. That knowledge comes first in the study of the physical world, because, being very general, it is always presupposed by any more specific and particular knowledge of the world that surrounds us (e.g. my understanding of any kind of change, such as eclipses or even yesterday’s lunar eclipse, depends on and cannot exist without my understanding of change in general) and it is also more certain (e.g. that change exists in the physical world is much more certain than that a meteorite is currently entering the earth’s southern atmosphere at 12.6745327 km/s). Those very basic and certain notions, manifested by common everyday experience and in need of no confirmation from more specialized experience or sciences, initially provide only a confused understanding. Their exact content and everything it entails have to be clarified by a purely philosophical analysis. It is by virtue of that analysis that Albert fully adopts the Aristotelian view that all physical substances are necessarily made of a potential principle and an actualizing principle, matter and form, and that these, along with privation, fully explain change as such and therefore apply to all the changes bodily substances undergo, including their coming- and ceasing-to-be. Because of their generality and certainty, hylomorphism and the other such fundamental notions developed by Aristotle in the Physics (teleology, for instance) are always taken for granted and are constantly appealed to in the rest of Albert’s study of the physical world, including in those natural works in which he is in fact not directly paraphrasing or commenting on Aristotle.

The unity of the works associated with the more specific or particular disciplines that constitute the rest of the study of nature manifests itself for Albert in the fact that they all deal with mobile body considered in more specific respects. For example, the topic of Aristotle’s On the Heavens is elementary mobile bodies (ether, fire, water, air and earth) insofar as they undergo change of place; in his On Generation and Corruption the four sublunar elements are further studied as being subject to other kinds of change, whereas in his Meteors, they are considered through the process of mixing into composite bodies; Albert’s On Minerals, On Plants and On Animals deal with the genera and species of fully-constituted mixed mobile bodies; and so on (Physica, I, 1, 4).

As some of those examples show, the more particular branches of the study of nature depend much more on specialized observations (e.g. comets or the behaviour of elephants) that most of us do not make and must therefore accept by an act of confidence in what the observer says and on hypotheses and theories (e.g. the five elements or the indestructibility of ethereal celestial bodies), which makes them more akin to what we today call the natural sciences than philosophy. Albert is sometimes described as a medieval forerunner of modern science, and his great interest in knowing the physical world down to its smallest and most particular aspects, his belief in the usefulness of mathematical tools in at least some parts of that study (in particular in astronomy and optics), his general respect for experience and his frequent mentions of personal observations and in some cases even experimental tests (especially about minerals, plants and animals) certainly lend some support to that claim. But it would be wrong to think of Albert as someone who, in his more scientific work, had grasped the extent of the benefits of a generalized mathematical approach of the natural world and the wall-to-wall application of the hypothetico-deductive experimental method, which are two essential features of modern science.

Following the Aristotelian tradition, Albert first attaches the study of the soul to natural philosophy, for the reason that the soul is that which animates certain mobile bodies, i.e. the principle by which they are alive, and therefore the soul must be understood for living bodies to be known properly. Now, the soul is a much less general or encompassing topic than the things that are dealt with in the Physics, and such particular subjects typically cannot be treated with the same evidence and certainty because everyday, common experience offers no or less insight into them. Moreover, the soul itself and what it does are not, as such, objects of the senses, which seems to be a problem given that our knowledge begins in sense perception and the most natural object of our human intellect is the nature of sensible things. Albert addresses the problem by first reminding his readers that if our knowledge begins in sense perception, it does not end there and therefore knowing things that the senses do not perceive is possible: not only is the nature of particular sensible things not a direct object of sensation itself (e.g. strictly speaking we cannot see or smell what a dog essentially is), but we are even able to conclude, on the basis of our understanding of the nature and properties of sensible things, a certain number of things concerning the existence and nature of their metaphysical causes, which are not sensible at all. More to the point, finally, there is the fact that our soul, already when dealing with the sensible and physical things that surround it, necessarily also experiences itself doing so (De anima, I, 1, 1, p.2, l.36–p.3, l.5; III, 2, 15, p.199, l.42–52; Super Dionysium De caelesti hierarchia, 2, p.18, l.51–55). When we see or hear particular dogs, when we are afraid of them, when we understand their universal nature, etc., we also experience seeing, hearing, fearing and understanding, which gives us a formidable access to our soul and intellect that we do not have when studying the highest causes of reality. That first, universally available insight into the nature and operations of the soul is of course as vague as it is certain, and defining accurately and reaching a distinct understanding of the soul remains an extremely difficult task for the philosopher (De anima, I, 1, 3, p.6, l.29–p.7, l.30). Well conducted, however, the rational inquiry into its nature and properties will reveal among other things the universality of the intellect and our free will (i.e. the intellect can in theory grasps anything that is and the will can turn itself toward anything that is grasped as good; see De anima, I, 1, 1, p.2, l.5–13, and Liber de principiis motus processivi, 2, 12, p.73, l.47–50), from which their immateriality and incorruptibility, and therefore the immateriality and incorruptibility of the soul of which the intellect and the will are powers, will be shown, as well as the soul’s subsistence or capacity to exist without a body. Thus, the soul or the intellect, through which man serves as a kind of nexus between the material and the immaterial world (Metaphysica, I, 1, 1, p.2, l.4–11), can also be considered in itself rather than as the perfection or principle of the living body. This quickly branches out of natural philosophy and into metaphysics (De homine, 3.1.1, p.10, l.59–67), where the soul or the intellect can be considered in its intelligible and ontological anteriority over the material world, as a procession from God and knowing recipient of the forms emanating from Him — all things for which Neoplatonic and non-Aristotelian sources, for instance the Book of Causes, play a crucial role in shaping Albert’s thought. Just as our soul’s experience and knowledge of its acts provide its point of departure in the science of the soul, the intellect’s understanding of itself is also crucial to the metaphysical investigation of the highest causes of reality, up to the very First Cause. These first causes are themselves pure intellects and the root of the nature, immortality and beauty of our own intellects. The human intellect’s self-knowledge allows it to catch a glimpse of such higher intellects by analogy (De unitate intellectus, 3a, §1, p.23, l.28–44; De IV coaequaevis, 4, 28, 2, p.496).

5. Mathematics

As previously mentioned, part of Albert’s initial philosophical program in the very early 1250s was the writing of books on the mathematical sciences, among which he seems to have meant to include at least geometry, astronomy and perhaps even optics (Physica, I, 2, 1, p.17, l.55–56; De anima, II, 3, 16, p.122, l.58–62 and 16, p.123, l.52–55; Geyer 1938: 165–166). However, we possess today only one actual mathematical work, a seemingly truncated commentary on Euclid’s Elements that is found in a single manuscript and that after decades of hesitation most scholars now consider to be Albert’s. Toward the middle of the 1260s, Albert mentions that he can devote himself to metaphysics, “now that the natural sciences and mathematical (doctrinalibus) sciences have been explained” (Metaphysica, I, 1, 1, p.1, l.9–10), and the direct evidence we have that the natural sciences half of that claim is true certainly adds credibility to its mathematical one. The loss of some work(s) in astronomy (possibly a commentary on Ptolemy’s Almagest) or another discipline deemed mathematical is thus likely, albeit unproven. Much of what we can know of Albert’s mathematical thought, in particular his philosophy of mathematics, is to be found in passages from his extant, non-mathematical writings.

Like most in the Middle Ages, Albert identifies quantity as the subject of mathematics in general, more precisely discrete quantity in the case of arithmetic (i.e. number theory) and continuous quantity in that of geometry (Analytica posteriora, I, 2, 13, p.53b). Quantity being a feature of changeable bodies, the consideration of it seems to belong to natural philosophy or science, which it assuredly does (Physica, V, 1, 8, p.418, l.10–34), and yet that does not make arithmetic or geometry branches of natural science. The reason for this is that mathematics considers quantity not as it exists in the natural world, i.e. as the feature of a material and changeable subject, but abstractly, i.e. in itself and without the subject in which it is found in the extra-mental world and without the traits of this subject. When studying the line, for instance, the geometer completely ignores the fact that lines in the outside world exist in faces, wood or chalk, and that such things are also cold, soft, blue or good and undergo multiple changes. This abstraction is possible because we can imagine quantity without that in and with which it always exists outside of our mind, and in that process quantity acquires or is seen in a perfected form with properties it does not have when considered in nature. Straight lines in the physical world are never as perfectly straight and spheres are never as perfectly spherical as the mathematical definitions say such things are. Indeed, the abstraction that is typical of mathematics is not simply the abstraction of the universal from the particular, as when the natural philosopher abstracts some common nature from the traits proper to the real individuals in which it exists extra-mentally (Super Dionysium De divinis nominibus, 1, 10, p.5, l.23–37). If we define what an animal is by claiming, say, that it is a living being endowed with sense perception, this definition applies perfectly to this or that particular animal, even though it abstracts from the precise colours, location, size, etc., of each. By contrast, the geometrical definition of a straight line or a sphere is only approximately and never perfectly verified in physical “straight” lines or “spherical” figures. Properties of mathematical beings and their physical counterparts often differ or are contradictory. For instance, a number as understood in mathematics can be added to infinitely, whereas the number of, say, atoms of hydrogen in a molecule of water can never be more than two precisely because of the material it is made of or found in, and a mathematical body can be divided infinitely or a straight line as conceived in geometry touch a sphere at only one point, which bodies and lines existing in physical matter cannot actually do (Physica, III, 2, 17; De generatione et corruptione, I, 1, 14, p.123, l.36–46; De anima, I, 1, 1, p.12, l.92–p.13, l.10; Metaphysica, III, 2, 3, p.118, l.35–40).

Natural philosophy, being about natural things as they are found in the material and changing physical world, must therefore constantly rely on the testimony of the senses to support one way or another its claims (either in general or more specifically about the quantitative aspects of natural things), whereas the mathematician must turn toward the imagination, in which the individual cases that best embody mathematical definitions lie (Super Euclidem, prooemium, p.1, l.3–18; Physica, III, 2, 17, p.197, l.29–51). Extra-mental triangles or numbers are the remote foundation of the mathematical beings we necessarily form when we conceive of the latter without matter and motion, and this seems to be enough to make mathematics a science of the real in some sense and its objects something classifiable within Aristotle’s categories (De praedicamentis, 3, 3, p.56, l.19–36). (Albert would probably heavily qualify such a view if he could see some of the developments of mathematics in the centuries that separate him from us.)

Even though purely metaphysical things — being as being, for instance, or the first causes of all things — do not as such contain sensible matter or undergo physical change and therefore are inherently most knowable with certainty, it is much easier and natural for us as animals or embodied souls to think and feel certain about things that can be sensorially perceived or imagined. First among such things are quantitative beings that can be imagined and understood without matter and motion, which greatly diminish intelligibility (Ethica, VI, 2, 25, p.443b). This is why disagreements are much less frequent in mathematics than in metaphysics or even natural philosophy and why mathematics has always been held in such high esteem among the disciplines (Super Ethica, VII, 2, 607, p.521, l.88–95). The traditional applied branches of mathematics, mainly astronomy (the geometrical study of the movements of celestial bodies) and musical theory (the study of the numerical ratios involved in musical sounds) but also a whole series of disciplines like optics, engineering and many others, use some of the conclusions drawn in pure mathematics as tools to know and better control some parts of the natural world. In as much as they depend on and apply mathematical knowledge to their subject matter, they are mathematical, but in as much as the subjects they apply them to are natural things, they belong to natural science (Physica, II, 1, 8, p.90, l.63–p.91, l.28). The fact that such mixed disciplines consider something as existing in matter and subject to change makes them less clear and certain than pure mathematics, but it also makes them more honorable as far as their subject matter is concerned, most obviously in the case of astronomy (De anima, I, 1, 2, p.3, l.23–42), which for the ancients and medievals deals with things that are very high in the universe’s causal ladder and assuredly much higher than abstracted quantities existing only in our imagination. All in all, Albert appears to be a strong proponent of the view that mathematical entities are based in natural beings rather than the other way around (Metaphysica, I, 1, 1, p.2, l.31–35; Molland 1980).

6. Metaphysics

The exact nature of Albert’s views on the subject of metaphysics and in particular the way in which it encompasses or relates to God, as well as many other metaphysical questions such as the composition of being or the existence and role of created separate substances, has been a matter of debate for some time. Such problems are very difficult in any context, but even more so for an era that was trying to quickly assimilate recently arrived and fully mature metaphysical writings of Greek and Arabic origin. Albert led that effort, being the first known medieval to write a commentary on the totality of Aristotle’s Metaphysics and on the anonymous Book of Causes, and among the first to comment on the highly metaphysical Pseudo-Dionysian corpus. He did so with the help of Averroes and Avicenna, whose sometimes divergent readings of the Metaphysics were both very influential in the West and had to be grappled with. That Albert’s metaphysical thought contains some confusion or at the very least is unclear or confusing to us is a serious problem but hardly a scandal.

Albert sides with the Aristotelian and Avicennian characterisation of the subject matter of the science of metaphysics as being qua being, in which God is considered because He is the principle and cause of being as being (Metaphysica, I, 1, 2; IV, 2, 1). This consideration is the most important reason one may have to pursue this kind of study of being, which is why if God were also called the subject of metaphysics, it would only be in the different sense of its goal or principal object of consideration (Summa theologiae siue de mirabilia scientia Dei, I, 1, 3, 1, p.10, l.65–89). Whether he always specifies it or not, Albert understands the subject matter of metaphysics to be created being. This is the being that, starting with our experience or knowledge of ourselves, the things in the material and changing universe that surrounds us and even separate higher causes whose existence he believes we are able to deduce, we discover through a rational process of abstraction. We isolate and bring to light the primitive and naturally formed concept of being that we all have and separate it from any other understood form or determination. That form of being is by nature and intelligibility prior to all other things (e.g. as expressions like “living being” or “human being” show), although it is never found as such as an extra-mental reality. For nothing in our created world is ever simply being: it is always a being (i.e. this or that concrete being) and it is also always a being of this or that kind (e.g. an animal, an intellect, green, etc.) (Tremblay 2019).

This explicit philosophical process of the analysis and resolution of all beings into being as being or the form of being will bring distinction to the vague and confused understanding of being that all our thinking presupposes. It could for instance be by dividing it into its most general kinds (actual and potential, necessary and possible, substantial and accidental, etc.) or by showing that being is a component of all created beings, in which multiple kinds of composition are to be found and minimally the composite of that-which-is (quod est) and being (esse) — a composition that for Albert applies to created beings in more than one sense, which makes the exact meaning of many passages where this vocabulary is used exceedingly difficult to interpret for his readers. By and large, this vertical process of resolution into the simplest form or predicate seems to describe for Albert much of Aristotle’s way of proceeding in his Metaphysics (Super IV libros Sententiarum, I, 46, 14, p.450a), all the more so given the Stagirite’s preference for naming that form concretely (ens, in Latin translations), instead of abstractly (esse).

Complementary to and compatible with the above approach, in Albert’s eyes, is the Pseudo-Dionysian corpus and the Book of Causes, more evidently so to him since he wrongly believes the latter to be of Aristotelian origin. In such Neoplatonic works, the emphasis is less on slowly and a posteriori retracing our way back from concrete beings to the general form of being they share (univocally or analogously), than on considering being directly in its purity and priority over all other things in the created world and as the very first and most primary procession or emanation from God. Created things are of themselves nothing actual, mere possibilities to be in this or that finite way that God knows by knowing Himself and some of which He freely understands and wills into existence (De causis et processu universitatis a prima causa, I, 3, 1; 4, 2, p.44, l.37–43). Thus, and whatever intermediary role Albert ascribes to created separate substances and celestial bodies in the production of concrete beings of diverse kinds, God is the efficient and formal (i.e. exemplary) cause of the being that is the subject matter of metaphysics, as well as its final cause, for in one way or another created being has an inclination to return to its ultimate source (Metaphysica, XI, 1, 3, p.462, l.58–71; Summa theologiae sive de mirabilia scientia Dei, I, 13, 55, 3).

What God is in Himself can never be grasped by us. We must instead resort to 1) relating His effects to Him, as we have just seen; 2) denying of Him things like the multiple forms of composition or finiteness that we find everywhere in our world; or 3) realizing that even if He has to be in some sense a being, a substance, etc. — since causes cannot give what they do not have and He is the source and exemplar of all things that we call and understand to be thus — He is those things in such a perfect and unfathomable way that it is better to simply state that He is beyond being, beyond substance, etc. (Metaphysica, XI, 2, 7, p.491, l.74–p.492, l.5; De causis et processu universitatis a prima causa, I, 3, 6, p.41, l.28–52). It goes without saying that for Albert the above concerns the limits of rationality and metaphysics as a branch of philosophy. He is also a Christian, a theologian and a scriptural commentator, and as such he believes that God has freely revealed a certain number of things about Himself through history and above all in the Incarnation, but this falls outside of the purview of this article.

7. Ethics and Politics

For a long time, Albert’s writings in ethics received little attention from modern scholars, especially in comparison to his metaphysics and to a lesser extent his writing on natural science. Yet, Albert himself seems always to have had a strong interest in this part of philosophy. This shows in his very early and unfortunately incomplete On the Nature of the Good (De natura boni) and On the Good (De bono), whose topics pertain mostly to moral philosophy. Against then-existing curriculum regulations, Albert also lectured on Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics to his students at the Dominican studium he was tasked to establish in 1248, in Cologne, and he is seen as an important reason why, when the Dominican program of study was revised by the General Chapter of Valenciennes a few years later, such lectures became authorized and subsequently common in the Dominican Order’s schools. Finally, he wrote two substantial commentaries on the Nicomachean Ethics, something he did not do for any other work, including metaphysics and theology. This is even more remarkable given that by the time he wrote his second commentary, in 1262, he was still the only philosopher in the Latin West to have ever written a full commentary on that book. And yet, as critical a scholar as R. A. Gauthier (1970: 123) claims that Albert’s first commentary is better by far than all the many other ones that would be written during the rest of the Middle Ages.

A certain number of consensuses can be seen emerging among scholars who have delved into Albert’s ethics (see in particular Müller 2001 and Cuningham 2008). First, at a time when traditional theologians still dominated the field of ethics at institutions of higher learning (theologians who, it should be noted, considered the input of philosophers to be of secondary importance at best), Albert tries to present as valuable in itself a purely rational or philosophical inquiry into moral matters. Albert’s original effort in the prologues of his commentaries on the Nicomachean Ethics (Super Ethica, prologus, 2; Ethica, I, 1, 2) to show that ethics can be a science the way it is defined by Aristotle in the Posterior Analytics, his general reliance on Aristotle’s analysis of the virtues and his strong case that the latter’s understanding of a this-wordly happiness brought about by a life of virtuous activity is not in tension with the Christian belief that true happiness will only come from God in the afterlife (Super IV libros Sententiarum, IV, 49, 7, p.678b) are some of the elements that characterize Albert’s attempt to legitimize philosophical ethics. Albert also makes it clear that he considers Aristotle, regardless of his limitations and the fact that he is a pagan, to be a model of how a philosopher or rational thinker must approach the main problems of ethics. Perhaps because he takes him much more seriously, Albert’s understanding of Aristotle seems deeper than that of most of his predecessors (Celano 2006), and serious moral philosophers who will come after him — such as Aquinas or Boethius of Dacia — are all influenced by the work done by Albert in one way or another.

Another fundamental contribution or trait of Albert’s moral thought is receiving greater emphasis nowadays, especially as his second commentary on the Nicomachean Ethics becomes the object of more studies. Albert, and more precisely mature Albert, is now often associated with a more intellectualist and so to speak metaphysical conception of happiness (Müller 2009). This is usually seen as an effect of the influence that Arabic philosophers such as Alfarabi, Avicenna and Averroes exercised on him and as something that to a small extent leads Albert away from his earlier, purer ethical Aristotelianism and toward the Neoplatonism that is in the background of much of Arabic philosophy. Albert seems to have maintained very early on that the highest form of (earthly) happiness lies in the metaphysician’s contemplation of the highest realities that is produced by a morally virtuous and well-ordered existence and the life-long practice of the rational study of the world rooted in sense experience. However, he appears to push this one step further in his middle and later works by repeatedly claiming, using a vocabulary typical of his Arabic sources, that this contemplation is an act of the “acquired intellect”, intellectus adeptus (Ethica, X, 2, 4, p. 632a). This corresponds to a state of the soul in which the human agent intellect, which separates universal forms from matter and thus reveals the intelligibility they inherently possess as emanations of the Divine Intellect, not only activates our capacity to understand and is conjoined with it when doing so, but activates it so continuously and perfectly as to become the very form of the human being in as much as it perfects him in the activity that defines him precisely as human (De anima, III, 3, 11). That state of perfection in the understanding of all intelligible forms culminates in the contemplation of separate substances and consists in acts of intellectual intuition which, once reached, are performed independently of sense perception and imagination (Ethica, VI, 2, 17, p.430a; De anima, III, 2, 19, p.206, l.49–54) — something Albert had earlier maintained is impossible for natural reason to do in this life (Super Ethica, I, 13, 80, p.71, l.91–p.72, l.6; X, 13, 906, p.759, l.29–38). Moral virtues at times appear to be reduced to a precondition of the contemplative life, in as much as they not simply moderate but more radically free the subject from his bestial side and passions, lest they perturb his intellect (Ethica, X, 2, 3, p.627b; Super Ethica, X, 12, 903, p.757, l.21–25, and 904, p.757, l.50–64), “through which he becomes somewhat similar to a god” (De anima, III, 3, 11, p.222, l.80–84). This contemplation is itself a preparation for and foretaste of the return to and union with God in the afterlife, the true and ultimate end of the immortal human being, about which, however, philosophy has little to say (Super Ethica, I, 3, 19, p.17, 52–55).

Albert’s moral thought greatly influences his political philosophy, a field in which he once again plays the role of a trailblazer, being the first in the Latin West to comment on Aristotle’s recently translated Politics. Assuredly, Albert appears to agree with the main tenets of the Stagirite’s political philosophy, be it the naturalness of political society and its necessity for the human good, the non-dissociation of ethics and politics or the acceptability of different types of rules (i.e. by one, the few or the many) depending on circumstances. Society’s political structure is naturally ordered toward the common good of citizens, which entails ensuring that there is order, peace, enough material wealth, virtuous habits and leisure. For Albert, however, chief among the things that a well-governed society makes possible is the above-described contemplation of the highest things, which appears to be the ultimate end of the polity as well. This contemplative felicity therefore plays the role of a first principle in political philosophy, provided by ethics (Super Ethica, I, 7, 35, p.32, l.74–p.33, l.15; X, 19, 947, p.789, l.50–p.790, l.15; Ethica, I, 9, 1, p.140a).

8. Albert’s Heirs

Albert had a noticeable impact on philosophers in the thirteenth, fourteenth and fifteenth centuries. The main manner in which he influenced his contemporaries and successors is impossible to quantify, but it should not go unmentioned, as it often does. Albert’s openness to the wisdom of Ancient Greek and Arabic pagans, rationality and the careful study of nature made him one of the leaders of a group of thinkers that quickly allowed the European Christian world to reach philosophical heights that had been inaccessible to Western civilization since the end of Antiquity. In that sense, an important part of the even greater influence that his pupil and fellow theologian Thomas Aquinas exercised is also his master’s. However, Albert’s activity as a teacher encouraged and shaped many other intellectual vocations, who receive today more attention than they used to. Among those who were the direct or indirect products of Albert’s teaching, one should first mention a certain number of German Dominicans: Hugh Ripelin of Strasbourg († 1268), whose Compendium of Theological Truth was long used as a school manual and was for a time attributed to Albert himself; Ulrich of Strasbourg (1220–1277), who authored the six-book On the Supreme Good (De summo bono); Dietrich of Freiberg (1240/1250–1318/1320), whose writings touch upon philosophy, theology and natural science; and Berthold of Moosburg (†1361 or later), who wrote an important commentary on Proclus’ Elements of Theology. (One could arguably add to that Albertine German Dominican school Meister Eckhart [c. 1260–1328].) Moreover, Albert is sometimes suspected to have had an impact on some of the so-called “Latin Averroists” (for example John of Jandun [c. 1285–1328], but also others), in particular through his views on the nature of the intellect and contemplative felicity, but the influence in this case is harder to delineate and more debatable. Finally, the fifteenth century also witnessed the development in some French, German and Italian universities of what is now customarily called “Albertism”. Led by the scholars John de Nova Domo († 1418) and Heymeric de Campo (1395–1460), it strongly and systematically promoted Albert’s ideas and reading of Aristotle, often in opposition to nominalism or even contemporary Thomism.

The great number of books that falsely circulated under Albert’s name soon after his death attests to a renown and authority that already in the Middle Ages went beyond academic circles, even though the mediocrity or idiocy of some of those apocrypha ended up unfairly damaging Albert’s reputation in the modern world.

Bibliography

Albert the Great’s Works

There exist three comprehensive editions of Albert’s works:

• Opera omnia, ed. P. Jammy, Lyon: Claude Prost, 1651

• Opera omnia, ed. A. and É. Borgnet, Paris: Vivès, 1890–1899

• Opera omnia, ed. B. Geyer (and his successors over time), Münster: Aschendorff, 1951–ongoing

The second edition is largely based on the first one, and only the third one, led by the Albertus-Magnus-Institut in Bonn and nicknamed Editio Coloniensis because the Institut was initially located in Cologne, is a critical edition and contains no spurious works. It will include all extant works when completed. While we await said completion, some volumes from the Paris edition (Editio Parisiensis) and a few works edited individually in the last two centuries remain essential.

Given the exceptionally high number of Albert’s extant works, the following is a list of only some of his most philosophically significant writings, which includes a few whose general intention is theological but which are filled with philosophical distinctions and developments. (For a truly exhaustive list of Albert’s works and editions and translations thereof, see Other Internet Resources, below.) Works are here named as and listed in the order in which the Institut has edited or plans to edit them, even when only another edition is available for now. Full English translations of the listed works are also mentioned.

  • De praedicamentis (Editio Coloniensis, tomus I, pars IB): paraphrastic commentary on Aristotle’s Categories
  • De sex principiis (Editio Coloniensis, tomus I, pars II): paraphrastic commentary on the 12th-century Liber sex principiorum
  • Analytica posteriora (Editio Parisiensis, volumen 2, pp.1–232): paraphrastic commentary on Aristotle’s Posterior Analytics
  • Physica (Editio Coloniensis, tomus IV, partes I and II): paraphrastic commentary on Aristotle’s Physics
  • Mineralia (Editio Parisiensis, volumen 5, pp.1–103): book on minerals. Translation: Albertus Magnus, Book of Minerals, trans. D. Wyckoff, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1967, 309p.
  • De anima (Editio Coloniensis, tomus VII, pars I): paraphrastic commentary on Aristotle’s On the Soul
  • De intellectu et intelligibili (Editio Coloniensis, tomus VII, pars IIB): a short original work on the intellect
  • De vegetabilibus (Albertus Magnus, De vegetabilibus libri VII, ed. E. Meyer and K. Jessen, Berlin: Georg Reimer, 1867, 752p.): treatise on botany
  • De animalibus (Albertus Magnus, De animalibus libri XXVI, ed. H. Stadler, 2 volumes, Münster: Aschendorff, 1916 and 1920, 1664p. [Beiträge zur Geschichte der Philosophie des Mittelalters, 15–16]): massive zoological work comprising paraphrases of Aristotle’s History of Animals, Parts of Animals and Generation of Animals, borrowings from some less Ancient and even contemporary sources and personal observations. Translation: Albertus Magnus, On Animals. A Medieval Summa Zoologica, trans. K. F. Kitchell and I. M. Resnick, volumes I and II, revised edition, Columbus: The Ohio State University Press, 2018, 1833p.
  • Liber de natura et origine animae (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XII, pp.1–46): short treatise on the nature and origin of the soul
  • Quaestiones super de animalibus (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XII, pp.77–309): questions disputed on Aristotle’s History of Animals, Parts of Animals and Generation of Animals. Translation: Albert the Great, Questions concerning Aristotle’s On Animals, trans. I. M. Resnick and K. F. Kitchell, Washington, D.C.: The Catholic University of America Press, 2008, 574p. (The Fathers of the Church, Medieval Continuation, 9)
  • Ethica (Editio Parisiensis, volumen 7, but tractatus 1 and 2 of Liber I have been critically edited in J. Müller 2001 and idem, “Der begriff des Guten im zweiten Ethikkommentar des Albertus Magnus. Untersuchung und Edition von Ethica, Buch I, Traktat 2”, Recherches de théologie et philosophie médiévales, 69 (2002), 318–370): paraphrastic commentary on Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics
  • Super Ethica (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XIV, partes I–II): question commentary on Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics
  • Politica (Editio Parisiensis, volumen 8): literal commentary on Aristotle’s Politics
  • Metaphysica (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XVI, partes I–II): paraphrastic commentary on Aristotle’s Metaphysics
  • Libellus de unitate intellectus contra averroistas (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XVII, pars I, pp.1–30): opusculum on the unity of the intellect
  • De causis et processu universitatis a prima causa (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XVII, pars II): paraphrastic commentary on Algazel’s Metaphysica (Lib. I) and the Liber de causis (Lib. II)
  • De IV coaequaevis (Editio Parisiensis, volumen 34, pp.307–761): general study of the four coevals that some identify in Genesis, i.e. prime matter, time, the heavens and angelic nature
  • De homine (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XXVII, pars II): general study of the human being
  • Super IV libros Sententiarum (Editio Parisiensis, volumina 25–30; critical edition of the first part found in Editio Coloniensis, tomus XXIX, pars I): commentary on Pierre Lombard’s Sentences
  • Summa theologiae sive de mirabili scientia dei (Editio Parisiensis, volumina 31–33; critical edition of Lib. I, q. 1–50A in Editio Coloniensis, tomus XXXIV, pars I): unfinished summa of theology, the second book of which might not be from only Albert’s hand
  • Super Dionysium De caelesti hierarchia (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XXXVI, pars I): question commentary on Pseudo-Dionysius’ On the Celestial Hierarchy
  • Super Dionysium De ecclesiastica hierarchia (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XXXVI, pars II): question commentary on Pseudo-Dionysius’ On the Ecclesiastical Hierarchy
  • Super Dionysium De divinis nominibus (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XXXVII, pars I): question commentary on Pseudo-Dionysius’ On the Divine Names
  • Super Dionysii mysticam theologiam (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XXXVII, pars II, pp.453–475): question commentary on Pseudo-Dionysius’ Mystical Theology. Translation: S. Tugwell, Albert & Thomas: Selected Writings, New York-Mahwah: Paulist Press, 1988, 650p.
  • Super Euclidem (Editio Coloniensis, tomus XXXIX): extant part (Lib. I–IV) of a commentary on Euclid’s Elements.

Secondary Sources

Works cited in the entry or of particular importance in the field

Anthologies

  • Bertolacci, A. and Galluzzo, G. (eds.), 2019, dedicated issue of Documenti e studi sulla tradizione filosofica medievale, 30.
  • Cheneval, F., Imbach, R. and Ricklin, T. (eds.), 1998, Albert le Grand et sa réception au Moyen Âge, Fribourg: Éditions Saint-Paul.
  • Hoenen, M. and de Libera, A. (eds.), 1995, Albertus Magnus und der Albertismus. Deutsche philosophische Kultur des Mittelalters, Leiden-New York-Köln: Brill.
  • Honnefelder, L., Möhle, H., and Bullido del Barrio, S. (eds.), 2009, Via Alberti. Texte — Quellen — Interpretationen, Münster: Aschendorff.
  • Kovach, F. and Shahan, R. (eds.), 1980, Albert the Great: Commemorative Essays, Norman: University of Oklahoma Press.
  • Krause, K. and Taylor, R. (eds.), 2024, Albert the Great and His Arabic Sources. Medieval Science between Inheritance and Emergence, Turnhout: Brepols.
  • Loconsole, M., Miteva, E. and Panarelli, M. (eds.), 2023, Natural Philosophy in Albert the Great. A Dialogue of Disciplines, dedicated issue of Quaestio, 23.
  • Meyer, G. and Zimmerman, A. (eds.), 1980, Albertus Magnus. Doctor Universalis. 1280/1980, Mainz: Matthias-Grünewald-Verlag.
  • Ostlender, H. (ed.), 1952, Studia Albertina. Festschrift für Bernhard Geyer zum 70. Geburtstage, Münster: Aschendorff.
  • Régnier, M. (ed.), 1980, VIIe centenaire d’Albert le Grand, dedicated issue of Archives de philosophie, 43.
  • Resnick, I. (ed.), 2013, A Companion to Albert the Great. Theology, Philosophy and the Sciences, Leiden-Boston: Brill.
  • Senner, W., Anzulewicz, H., Burger, M., Meyer, R., Nauert, M., Sicouly, P., Söder, J. and Springer, K.-B. (eds.), 2001, Albertus Magnus. Zum Gedenken nach 800 Jahren: Neue Zugänge, Aspekte und Perspektiven, Berlin: Akademie Verlag.
  • Weisheipl, J. (ed.), 1980, Albertus Magnus and the Sciences: Commemorative Essays 1980, Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Medieval Studies.
  • Zimmermann, A., and Vuillemin-Diem, G. (eds.), 1981, Albert der Grosse. Seine Zeit, sein Werk, seine Wirkung, Berlin-New York: Walter de Gruyter.

Bibliographies

  • Resnick, I. and K. Kitchell (eds.), 2004, Albert the Great: A Selectively Annotated Bibliography (1900–2000), Tempe: Arizona Center for Medieval and Renaissance Studies.
  • Tremblay, B., 2006, “Modern Scholarship (1900–2000) on Albertus Magnus: A Complement,” Bochumer Philosophisches Jahrbuch für Antike und Mittelalter, 11: 159–194.

Other Works

  • Anzulewicz, H., 2000a, “Die Denkstruktur des Albertus Magnus. Ihre Dekodierung und ihre Relevanz für die Begrifflichkeit und Terminologie,” in J. Hamesse and C. Steel (eds.), L’élaboration du vocabulaire philosophique au Moyen Âge, Turnhout: Brepols, 369–396.
  • –––, 2000b, “Pseudo-Dionysius Areopagita und das Strukturprinzip des Denkens von Albert dem Grossen,” in T. Boiadjiev, G. Kapriev and A. Speer (eds.), Die Dionysius-Rezeption im Mittelalter, Turnhout: Brepols, 251–295.
  • Bonin, T., 2001, Creation as Emanation. The Origin of Diversity in Albert the Great’s On the Causes and the Procession of the Universe, Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press.
  • Brumberg-Chaumont, J., 2020, “Albert the Great,” in H. Lagerlund (ed.), Encyclopedia of Medieval Philosophy. Philosophy Between 500 and 1500, Dordrecht: Springer, 86–91.
  • Celano, A., 2006, “The Understanding of Beatitude, the Perfection of the Soul, in the Early Latin Commentaries on Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics,” Documenti e studi sulla tradizione filosofica medievale, 17: 1–22.
  • Craemer-Ruegenberg, I., 2005, Albertus Magnus, revised and updated by H. Anzulewicz, Leipzig: Benno.
  • Cunningham, S., 2008, Reclaiming Moral Agency: The Moral Philosophy of Albert the Great, Washington, D.C.: The Catholic University of America Press.
  • de Libera, A., 1990, Albert le Grand et la philosophie, Paris: Vrin.
  • –––, 1994, La mystique rhénane. D’Albert le Grand à Maître Eckhart, Paris: Seuil.
  • –––, 2005, Métaphysique et noétique. Albert le Grand, Paris: Vrin.
  • Ebbesen, S., 1981, “ Albert (the Great?)’s Companion to the Organon,” in A. Zimmermann and G. Vuillemin-Diem (eds.) 1981: 89–103.
  • Führer, M., 1991, “The Contemplative Function of the Agent Intellect in the Psychology of Albert the Great,” in B. Mojsisch and O. Pluta (eds.), Historia Philosophiae Medii Aevi: Studien zur Geschichte der Philosophie des Mittelalters, Amsterdam-Philadelphia: Grüner, 305–319.
  • Gauthier, R. A., 1970, “Introduction,” in Aristote, L’Éthique à Nicomaque, I, 1, Louvain-Paris: Publications Universitaires-Béatrice-Nauwelaerts.
  • Geiger, L. B., 1962, “La vie, acte essentiel de l’âme — l’esse, acte essentiel de l’essence d’après Albert le Grand,” Études d’histoire littéraire et doctrinale, 17: 49–116.
  • Geyer, B., 1958, “Die mathematischen Schriften des Albertus Magnus,” Angelicum, 35: 159–175.
  • Grabmann, M., 1917, “Ist das ‘philosophische Universalgenie’ bei Magister Heinrich dem Poeten Thomas von Aquin?” Historisches Jahrbuch, 88: 315–320.
  • Hossfeld, P., 1983, Albertus Magnus als Naturphilosoph und Naturwissenschaftler, Bonn: Albertus-Magnus-Institut.
  • Michaud-Quentin, P., 1966, La psychologie de l’activité chez Albert le Grand, Paris: Vrin.
  • Molland, A. G., 1980, “’Mathematics in the Thought of Albertus Magnus,” in J. Weisheipl (ed.) 1980: 463–478.
  • Müller, J., 2001, Natürliche Moral und philosophische Ethik bei Albertus Magnus, Münster: Aschendorff.
  • Müller, J., 2009, “La vie humaine comme tout hiérarchique. Félicité contemplative et vie active chez Albert le Grand,” in C. Trottmann (ed.), Vie active et contemplative au Moyen Âge et au seuil de la Renaissance, Rome: École française de Rome, 2009, 241–263.
  • Nardi, B., 1960, Studi di filosofia medievale, Rome: Edizioni di Storia e letteratura.
  • Prantl, C., 1867, Geschichte der Logik im Abendlande, Band III, Hirzel: Leipzig, 89–90.
  • Schneider, A., 1903 and 1906, Die Psychologie Alberts des Großen nach den Quellen dargestellt, I–II, Münster: Aschendorff.
  • Steel, C., 2009, “Albert’s Use of Kilwardby’s Notulae in his Paraphrase of the Categories,” in L. Honnefelder et al. (eds.), 2009: 481–507.
  • Stehkämper, H., and Zender, M., 1980, Albertus Magnus. Ausstellung zum 700. Todestag, Köln: Historisches Archiv der Stadt Köln.
  • Sturlese, L., 2017, “§ 28. Albert der Große,” in A. Brungs, V. Mudroch and P. Schulthess (eds.), Die Philosophie des Mittelalters. Band 4: 13. Jahrhundert, Basel: Schwabe, 2017, 861–886.
  • Tracey, M., 1999, The Character of Aristotle’s Nicomachean Teaching in Albert the Great’s Super Ethica Commentum et Quaestiones (1250–1252), doctoral dissertation, Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame.
  • Tremblay, B., 2007, “Nécessité, nature et rôle de l’art logique, d’après Albert le Grand,” Bochumer philosophisches Jahrbuch für Antike und Mittelalter, 12: 97–156.
  • –––, 2011, “Albert le Grand et le problème du sujet de la science logique,” Documenti e studi sulla tradizione filosofica medievale, 22: 301–345.
  • –––, 2014, “La logique comme science du langage chez Albert le Grand,” Revue des sciences philosophiques et théologiques, 98: 193–239.
  • –––, 2019, “Albert the Great on What Should Be Known About Substance Before Reading Categories, 5,” Documenti e studi sulla tradizione filosofica medievale, 30: 57–130.
  • Twetten, D., 1997, “Albert the Great on whether natural philosophy proves God’s existence,” Archives d’histoire doctrinale et littéraire du Moyen Âge, 64: 7–58.
  • –––, and Baldner, S., 2013, “Introduction to Albert’s Philosophical Works,” in Resnick (ed.) 2013, 165–172.
  • Wieland, G., 1972, Untersuchungen zum Seinsbegriff im Metaphysikkommentar Alberts des Großen, Münster: Aschendorff.
  • –––, 1981, Ethica — Scientia practica. Die Anfänge der philosophischen Ethik im 13. Jahrhundert, Münster: Aschendorff.

Other Internet Resources

  • Albertus-Magnus-Institut. Site of the German institute in charge of the excellent and ongoing new edition of Albert’s works. Contains among many other things a table of all the volumes that have been edited, are in preparation or are planned, as well as a bibliographic tool that covers mainly but not only scholarly material published from 1980 onward. Digital copies of a few volumes of the new critical edition can also be downloaded for free.
  • Aschendorff Verlag. Site of the publisher of the new critical edition. All the volumes so far published can be searched electronically, for a fee.
  • Alberti Magni E-corpus. Provides downloadable copies of the volumes of the Jammy and Borgnet editions of Albert’s opera omnia, as well as a few other older editions of individual works that are no longer under copyrights. The site also gives access to a free search engine, permitting searches through, among other things, all of Albert’s works that are not yet available in the new critical edition and that therefore cannot be searched with the Aschendorff tool, including very voluminous ones like the commentary on the Sentences and the Summa theologiae.
  • IAMS. Website of the International Albertus Magnus Society, with a certain number of resources, including downloadable copies of Resnick’s and Kitchell’s 1900–2000 bibliography and Tremblay’s small complement. A comprehensive 70–page list of existing editions and translations of Albert’s works is also available. The Society has a facebook group, with more news about Albert-related events.
  • Führer, Markus, “Albert the Great”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2025 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/fall2025/entries/albert-great/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]

Acknowledgments

The author is indebted to Sylvia Terzian for identifying the most egregious lapses in English in the entry’s initial draft and to SEP’s anonymous referee for their many language- and content-related corrections and suggestions.

Copyright © 2025 by
Bruno Tremblay <btrembla@uwaterloo.ca>

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