Notes to Samuel Alexander

1. The first phrase reads, “He erred with Spinoza”. Muirhead’s alternative reads, “Even if Spinoza philosophised otherwise”. My translation.

2. In a letter to Broad dated 4 August 1920, Alexander discusses his claim that space and time are the same thing considered from two sides. Afterwards, Alexander adds, “The fact is I have an obstinate belief that the proposition is true, but I also think it more than possible I have slipped in the proof”. Held at John Rylands Library, reference ALEX/A/1/1/37/2.

3. Stiernotte (1954: 285) and Emmet (1950) understand the nisus as a creative tendency or force, Brettschneider (1964: 154) interprets it as a principle of coherence, and Thomas (2013: 563) characterises it as an evolutionary principle.

Copyright © 2022 by
Emily A. E. Thomas <emily.thomas@cantab.net>

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