Ambiguity

First published Mon May 16, 2011; substantive revision Sat May 22, 2021

Fun fact: the word ‘ambiguous’, at least according to the Oxford English Dictionary, is ambiguous: it can mean uncertainty or dubiousness on the one hand and a sign bearing multiple meanings on the other. I mention this merely to disambiguate what this entry is about, which concerns a word or phrase enjoying multiple meanings. In this sense, ambiguity has been the source of much frustration, bemusement, and amusement for philosophers, lexicographers, linguists, cognitive scientists, literary theorists and critics, authors, poets, orators and pretty much every other being who uses language regularly to communicate.

Philosophers’ interest in ambiguity stems from several sources, ranging from an intense interest in logical representation to pragmatic, political and ethical concerns about how we use language to communicate. An example of the first concerns regarding the regimentation of natural language in formal logic: arguments that may look good in virtue of their linguistic form in fact can go very wrong if the words or phrases involved are equivocal. It would be logical folly, for example, to conclude from the true (on one reading) sentences ‘All bachelors are necessarily unmarried’ and ‘Adam was a bachelor’ that Adam was necessarily unmarried. In other words, philosophers have often found ambiguity the sort of thing one needs to avoid and eradicate when they do their serious philosophical business. Frege worried about the phenomenon enough to counsel against allowing any multiplicities of sense in a perfect language. An example of the second may be found in the infamous case of Smith vs. United States in which the law stipulated that a weapon used in the main question was whether the law proscribing penalties for using a firearm in committing a crime applied to weapons used as items of exchange for drugs.

Authors, poets, lyricists and the like, on the other hand, have often found ambiguity to be an extremely powerful tool. Thomas Pynchon’s sentence “we have forests full of game and hundreds of beaters who drive the animals toward the hunters such as myself who are waiting to shoot them,” (Against the Day, p. 46) utilizes the referential ambiguity of ‘them’ to great effect when said by his fictionalized Archduke Ferdinand. Shakespeare’s “Ask for me tomorrow and you shall find me a grave man” (Romeo and Juliet, Act III, Scene 1 line 97–98) plays cleverly on the double meaning of ‘grave’. Comedians have often found ambiguity useful in the misdirection essential to some forms of comedy. Groucho Marx’s “I shot an elephant in my pajamas” is a classic example.

Ambiguity is important and it is worth examining what the phenomenon is and how it differs and relates to similar phenomena such as indexicality, polysemy, vagueness, and especially sense generality. While ‘is an uncle’ can be satisfied by both brothers of mothers and brothers of fathers, the phrase is not ambiguous but unspecified with respect to parent. The boundaries of the predicate ‘is a heap’ is famously difficult to detect but the problem doesn’t seem to be that ‘heap’ enjoys too many meanings. The article will focus on what the phenomenon is and isn’t and discuss some of the interesting factors that confound the easy detection and categorization of apparent ambiguities.

1. Introduction

Ambiguity is generally taken to be a property enjoyed by signs that bear multiple (legitimate) interpretations in a language or, more generally, some system of signs. ’legitimate’ is a cover term I’m using to nod to the fact that many signs can, in principle, bear just about any interpretation. The relativization is to prevent ambiguity in terms like like ‘leaped’ which means leaped in English but loved in German. In common parlance, the word ‘ambiguity’ is used loosely: often simple underspecificity will suffice for a charge of ambiguity. The U.S.’s policy towards the unification of China and Taiwan has been described as a policy of ‘strategic ambiguity’, one that allows the U.S. to be non-specific with respect to the status of Taiwan. ‘Jane’s sister will come to visit’ is sometimes thought to be ambiguous when Jane has multiple sisters. A movie with a character that heads to surgery at the end, leaving it open whether he lives or dies, is said to have an ambiguous ending. There is a medical condition known as ‘ambiguous genitalia’ in which the genitals don’t categorize clearly, or exclusively, into male or female genitalia.

In many domains, however, theorists have found it useful to divide the phenomenon of ambiguity from other phenomena (e.g., underspecification, vagueness, context sensitivity). Ambiguity is of interest to philosophers for a variety of reasons, some of which we will look at below. First, ambiguity makes vivid some of the differences between formal languages and natural languages and presents demands on the usage of the former to provide representations of the latter. Second, ambiguity can have a deleterious effect on our ability to determine the validity of arguments in natural language on account of possible equivocation. Third, ambiguity in art can intentionally (or unintentionally) increase the interest in a work of art by refusing to allow easy categorization and interpretation. Fourth, ambiguity in the statement of the law can undermine their applicability and our ability to obey them. Finally, ambiguity resolution is an important feature of our cognitive understanding and interpretative abilities. Studying ambiguity and how we resolve it in practice can give us insight into both thought and interpretation.

Ambiguity has excited philosophers for a very, very long time. It was studied in the context of the study of fallacies in Aristotle’s Sophistical Refutations. Aristotle identifies various fallacies associated with ambiguity and amphiboly[1] writing:

There are three varieties of these ambiguities and amphibolies: (1) When either the expression or the name has strictly more than one meaning… (2) when by custom we use them so; (3) when words that have a simple sense taken alone have more than one meaning in combination; e.g. ‘knowing letters’. For each word, both ‘knowing’ and ‘letters’, possibly has a single meaning: but both together have more than one-either that the letters themselves have knowledge or that someone else has it of them. (Sophistical Refutations bk. 4)

The stoics were also intrigued by ambiguity (see Atherton 1993). Chrysippus claimed at one point that every word is ambiguous – though by this he meant that the same person may understand a word spoken to him in many distinct ways. Philosophers concerned with the relation between language and thought, particularly those who argue for a language of thought, concerned themselves with whether the language in which we think could contain ambiguous phrases. Ockham, for example, was willing to countenance ambiguities in mental sentences of a language of thought but not mental terms in that language (see Spade p. 101). Frege contemplated non-overlap of sense in natural language in a famous footnote, writing:

…So long as the reference remains the same, such variations of sense may be tolerated, although they are to be avoided in the theoretical structure of a demonstrative science and ought not to occur in a perfect language. (Frege 1948 [1892], p. 210 fn. 2)

Frege’s hostility to ambiguity remains with us today. Frequently we use formal languages precisely so that we can disambiguate otherwise ambiguous sentences (brackets being a paradigm example of a disambiguating device).

Giving an account of ambiguity (and disambiguation) requires one to discern the bearer(s) of ambiguity. Propositions, for example, are presumably unambiguous (since they are meanings they can’t be subject to further considerations of meaning). This leaves a range of potential objects: utterances, utterances relative to a context, sentences, sentences relative to a context, discourses, inscriptions…. The differences aren’t trivial: a written down sentence corresponds to many possible ways of being uttered in which features such as prosody can prevent certain meanings that the written down sentence seems capable of enjoying. Two written utterances may sound the same (if they contain words that sound alike) without being spelt alike (if the words aren’t co-spelled) thus resulting in phonological ambiguity without corresponding orthographic ambiguity. I’m going to (somewhat perversely) simply use ‘sentence’ and ‘phrase’ ambiguously, and I will attempt to disambiguate when necessary. We will also look briefly at the application of ambiguity to discourse transitions.

One important question regarding ambiguity is how we ought to represent ambiguities. With structural ambiguities there is no independent issue but with lexical ambiguities there is a real issue. It’s tempting to see this as a question we could answer in any number of equally good ways. For example, we may choose to represent the meaning of ‘bank’ disjunctively or we may choose to individuate ‘bank’ as multiple lexical items that simply sound and look alike, perhaps using subscripts. Both are potentially problematic if taken as analyses: disjunctive meanings are not unique to ambiguity (I can introduce any term I like with a single disjunctive meaning), and representation using subscripts simply masks the question of what the subscripts represent. This suggests that the issue is more like a problem than a nuisance or a trivial choice and actually has serious ramifications for how to pursue truth conditional semantics. (See Davidson 1967, Gillon 1990, and Saka 2007 (Ch. 6) for an interesting account of the problem regarding representing ambiguity.) I’ll proceed as though lexical ambiguities are properly represented as two separate words/lexical items that overlap with respect to some significant feature (phonologically, graphemically, pictorially…).

A brief terminological point: ‘polysemy’ refers to a phenomenon that is closely related to ambiguity, but often is characterized as a term with multiple meanings that are, in some hard to specify sense, interestingly related. For example, ‘in’ is often thought to be a paradigm of polysemy: to be in a car, in my thoughts and in trouble seem to play on notions of containment but there is clearly a difference in how we interpret ‘in’ in each case. It is sometimes characterized as a phenomenon subsumable under ambiguity (basically, an ambiguity with the meanings that are tightly related meanings) but sometimes it is taken to be a different phenomenon altogether. One traditional carving is that ambiguity in words is a matter of two or more lexical entries that correspond to the same word and polysemy a single lexeme that has multiple meanings.[2] For the rest of this article, I will assume that polysemy is simply ambiguity with tightly corresponding meanings and I will not try to distinguish polysemy from ambiguity very carefully. Many cognitive linguists contend that there there is no principled way to divide these in any case. It’s worth noticing that terms could be both ambiguous and polysemous if it had three meanings, two of which were suitably related and one which was quite far apart from the other two. See Vicente and Falkum (2017) for a detailed look at polysemy.

2. What (Linguistic) Ambiguity Isn’t

‘Ambiguity’, as used by philosophers of language and linguists, refers to a more specific phenomenon than that of multiple permissible interpretations. Distinguishing ambiguity from these related phenomenon can be a difficult and tendentious (and sometimes tedious!) affair. We will discuss testing for ambiguity below: for now, we will try to isolate ambiguity by separating it from other typical cases with which ambiguity is easily conflated.

2.1 Vagueness

Characterizing vagueness is notoriously (and ironically) difficult, but it seems to stem from lack of precision in the meaning or reference of a term or phrase. There are clearly words that are ambiguous but not (obviously) vague: ‘bat’ is not vague but it is ambiguous. ‘Is bald’ looks to be vague but not ambiguous.

A general hallmark of vagueness is that it involves borderline cases: possible cases that are neither clearly in the extension of the vague term nor clearly not in its extension. An alternative characterization involves fuzzy boundaries rather than borderline cases (see Fara 2000, 47–48). Cases of ambiguity can be like this: one can imagine a sorites series involving something that is clearly a baseball bat at t1 that is changed particle by particle into a chiropteran with borderline cases of each mid-series, thus being a vague case of ‘bat’ in both senses. However, ambiguity need not be characterized by borderline cases nor by sorites-series susceptibility.

Interestingly, there are views regarding vague language that treat vagueness as at least akin to ambiguity. Braun and Sider (2007) treat sentences with vague terms as expressing multiple distinct propositions and supervaluationism treats vague terms as expressing multiple distinct semantic values. But the relevant notion of multiple expression seem different from paradigmatic ambiguity, where two meanings are definitely meanings of a term or phrase, not where a bunch of meanings are acceptable ways of making a term more precise. If anything, one might think that these views treat vagueness as a sort of polysemy.

2.2 Context Sensitivity

Context sensitivity is (potential) variability in content due purely to changes in the context of utterance without a change in the convention of word usage. Thus, ‘I am hungry’ varies in content speaker to speaker because ‘I’ is context sensitive and shifts reference depending on who utters it. ‘I’, however, is not massively ambiguous – if anything, the mystery of context sensitive terms has been how they could have a single meaning with multiple reference. ‘Bank’ is ambiguous, not (at least, not obviously) context sensitive. Of course, knowledge of context may well help disambiguate an ambiguous utterance. Nonetheless, ambiguity is not characterized by interaction with (extra- linguistic) context but is a property of the meanings of the terms.

2.3 Under-specification and Generality

I have a sister in New York, a sister in Kingston and one in Toronto. If I tell you that I am going to visit one of my sisters, what I say underspecifies which sister I am going to see. This can be frustrating if you are trying to figure out where I am going. But this isn’t due to ‘one of my sisters’ being ambiguous ambiguous. Its meaning is clear. The sentence is ‘sense-general’; it doesn’t specify some detail without thereby being ambiguous with respect to that detail. In general, under- determination and generality may leave open many possibilities without being ambiguous between those possibilities. One more terminological note: in the cognitive linguistics literature (e.g. Dunbar 2001) it is common to treat what we call ‘sense generality’ as vagueness: a single lexeme with a unified meaning that is unspecified with respect to certain features.

Similarly, if I tell you that I am going to visit my aunt, I underspecify whether it is my mother’s sister or my father’s sister whom I am going to go visit. Nothing follows about the univocality or ambiguity of ‘aunt’. It simply means ‘aunt’ is true of things that are female siblings of your parent. By the same token, ‘human’ doesn’t make any demand on an person’s mass in order to be part of its extension.

It is easy to mistake sense generality for ambiguity, as often the extension of a univocal term can break up into two or more distinct salient categories. The sentence ‘I ordered filet mignon’ doesn’t specify whether or not the filet was to be given to me cooked or raw. You will surely be annoyed and say ‘that’s not what I meant’ at a restaurant if the waiter brings the filet raw, but not so at the butcher shop. Often it is difficult to tell when the distinction in extension corresponds to an ambiguity in the meaning of the term. But difficulty in telling these apart in some cases should not lead us to abjure the distinction.

2.4 Sense and Reference Transfer

One difficult phenomenon to classify is transference of sense or reference (see Nunberg, Ward). When you say ‘I am parked on G St.’, you presumably manage to refer to the car rather than yourself. Similarly, ‘I am traditionally allowed a final supper’ said by a prisoner is not about himself (there are no traditions regarding him). The mechanics of reference transfer are mysterious, and the interaction of transferred terms with the syntax is a matter of some dispute.

Of course, sentences can have many of these properties at once. ‘My uncle wonders if I am parked where the bank begins’ is sense-general, ambiguous, context-sensitive, vague and it involves reference-transfer. Nonetheless, it is important to keep these properties apart as the semantic treatment we give each may vary wildly, the ways of testing for them may require highly specialized considerations and their source may well differ radically from phenomenon to phenomenon.

3. Types of Ambiguity

There are different sources and types of ambiguities. To explore these, however, we will need to adopt some terminology to make clear what sorts of phenomena we are looking at. Those familiar with some of the issues in current syntactic theory can skip until the next section.

Modern linguistic theory involves, in part, the study of syntax. The dominant strain of current syntactic theory takes the lexicon as primitive and studies the rule-governed derivation of syntactic forms, which are structures known as LFs (or, more misleadingly, Logical Forms). The relationship of sentences in natural language to LFs can be one to many: the phonological/orthographic forms of a sentence can be associated with more than one LF. Thus, ‘every man loves a woman’ has been argued (e.g., May 1977) to involve two distinct logical forms. It has also been argued (see May 1985) to involve one that is multiply interpretable with constrained but not determined quantifier scopes.

A standard, but controversial, assumption is that LFs are the input to semantic theory, not the phonological/orthographic objects we hear and see. (see May 1985). Thus, while LFs may not be ambiguous, the sentences we actually use and assert often are. If this assumption turns out to be false, then it will be a great deal more difficult to locate the source of some ambiguities.

LFs can be represented as trees, and the terminal nodes of the branches are taken from the lexicon. A lexicon is a repository of lexical items, which need not look like words and they certainly need not correspond to our intuitions about words. Thus, intuitions about a word’s modal profile suggest that it can undergo massive shifts in its orthographic and phonetic properties. It is far less clear that the lexemes retain their identity over shifts of phonological properties. We should be a bit careful, then, about the relationship between words and lexemes: a word may retain its identity while the lexeme it is derived from may not constitute it over time. Fortunately, issues of concerning the diachronic identity of words won’t concern us much here.

The LF driven picture of semantic interpretation is controversial for many reasons: some people don’t think that LFs are properly thought of as inputs to anything, never mind semantic interpretation. Culicover and Jackendoff (2005) argue for much less extensive syntactic structures coupled with very messy mappings to semantic (or ‘conceptual’) structures. Others think that most of the work done by LFs could be done by taking a notion of surface syntax seriously, trading in syntactic structure for very complicated semantic theories to account for the data. (Bittner 2007, Jacobson 1999). Thus, the description of some of the ambiguities as syntactic or structural rather than semantic can be somewhat controversial. However, everyone in the game needs something to serve as the input to semantic interpretation and everyone needs some way to describe those structures (if you don’t, call me and let’s talk about it…) so hopefully similar points will hold in your preferred syntactic framework. We will highlight some of these controversies where necessary.

One more clarification: ambiguity is a property of either sentences or perhaps the speech acts in which the sentences are used. But ambiguity of a sentence or sentences uttered does not necessarily result in any unclarity regarding what was expressed or meant by the speaker. There is no guarantee that unambiguous utterances will result in full univocal clear understanding either. In some syntactic contexts, the ambiguity won’t show up at all: ‘I want to see you duck’ is a case in which the NP interpretation of ‘duck’ is simply unavailable (especially with no comma after ‘you’). In many cases our best theory predicts an ambiguity in the sentence used, without predicting confusion over how the utterance ought to be interpreted.

3.1 Lexical Ambiguity

The lexicon contains entries that are homophonous, or even co-spelled, but differ in meanings and even syntactic categories. ‘Duck’ is both a verb and a noun as is ‘cover’. ‘Bat’ is a noun with two different meanings and a verb with at least one meaning. ‘Kick the bucket’ is arguably ambiguous between one meaning involving dying and one meaning involving application of foot to bucket.

This sort of ambiguity is often very easy to detect by simple linguistic reflection, especially when the meanings are wildly distinct such as in the case of ‘bat’. It can be more difficult, however, when the meanings are closely related. A classic case is the short word ‘in’. The meaning(s) of ‘in’, if it is ambiguous, seem to crucially involve a general notion of containment, but at a more fine-grained level, the types of containment can seem wildly distinct. One can be in therapy, in Florida, in the Mafia, in the yearbook…but it seems like a joke to say that one is in therapy and the Mafia.

The considerations suggest that ‘in’ is ambiguous, but perhaps it is univocal with a very sense general meaning that involves containment of an appropriate sort and different objects require different sorts of appropriate containment. Telling between these two possibilities is difficult. An even harder case of lexical ambiguity involves the putative ambiguity in ‘any’ between the reading as a universal quantifier and a ‘free choice’ item. (see Dayal 2004)

A few points about lexical ambiguity should be kept in mind, so I’ll repeat them. First, a bookkeeping issue: should we relegate lexical ambiguity to the lexicon (two non-identical entries for ambiguous terms) or to semantic interpretation (one lexical entry, two or more meanings)? We’ll go with the first option (so the two meanings of ‘bank’ correspond to two separate lexical items) but nothing I know of forces this choice. Second, the word/lexical item distinction may cause us some trouble. While ‘holey’ and ‘holy’ are homophonous, they are not co-spelled. Thus an utterance of ‘the temple is holey’ is ambiguous between two sentences, while an inscription in English is not. Sometimes co-spelled words are distinct sounding, such as ‘refuse’ which is distinct sounding (in my dialect at least) between ‘ree-fuze’ and ‘reh-fuse’. Fortunately, we have the relevant categories to describe these differences and we can talk about ambiguity in sound or in notation (or in sign).

3.2 Syntactic Ambiguity

Syntactic ambiguity occurs when there are many LFs that correspond to the same sentence – assuming we don’t think of sentences as distinct if their LFs are distinct. This may be the result of scope, movement or binding, and the level at which the ambiguity is localized can involve full sentences or phrases. Here are some examples of purportedly syntactic ambiguities.

3.2.1 Phrasal

A phrase can be ambiguous by corresponding to distinct syntactic structures. The classic example:

superfluous hair remover

can mean the same as ‘hair remover that is superfluous’ or ‘remover of hair that is superfluous’. The ambiguity results from the lack of representation of constituent structure in the English sentence, since it is unclear if the noun ‘hair remover’ is modified by ‘superfluous’ in its specifier or if the ‘superfluous hair’ is the specifier of the noun ‘remover’. In current syntax, the phrase would be associated with two different NPs.

Similarly, a phrase can be ambiguous between an adjunct and an argument:

  1. John floated the boat between the rocks.

‘between the rocks’ can modify the event of floating, saying where it happened and thus acts as an adjunct. It can also act as an argument of ‘float’, specifying where the resulting location of the boat on account of the floating. It can also act as an adjunct modifying ‘the boat’, helping to specify which boat it is. All of these are readings of (1) and in each case we find ‘between the rocks’ playing very different roles. Assuming these roles are dictated by their relations in the relevant LF, we get three very different LFs that correspond to (1).

Thematic assignments can be similarly ambiguous at the level of LF with deleted phrases:

  1. The chicken is ready to eat.

(2) can mean that the chicken is ready to be fed or to be fed to someone depending on the thematic assignment. In a popular semantic framework, this is because ‘the chicken’ is assigned agent on one reading and patient on another. Arguably, these assignments is corresponds syntactic phenomenon assuming principles that align thematic role and syntactic position (see Baker 1988, 1997; Williams 1994; and Grimshaw 1990) but the semantic point stands either way. They result in a clear ambiguity that we may term ‘thematic ambiguity’ for present purposes.

Multiple connectives present similar ambiguities. The following ambiguity, for example, is borne directly out of failure to tell which connective has widest scope:

  1. He got drunk and fired or divorced.

We teach our students in propositional logic to disambiguate these with brackets but we are not so lucky when it comes to the orthographic and phonetic groupings in natural language.

An interesting case is the semantics of modals. At least some modal auxiliaries and adverbs seem to allow for distinct senses such as metaphysical, deontic, doxastic and perhaps practical. Consider

  1. John ought to be at home by now.

(4) can mean that John’s presence at home is, given everything we know, guaranteed. It might mean that, though we have no idea where he is, he is under the obligation to be at home. Similarly:

  1. The coin might come up heads.

(5) means that there is an open metaphysical possibility in which the coin comes up heads. It also means that everything we know doesn’t tell us that the coin won’t come up heads. On the latter reading, for example, we can utter (5) truly even if we know that the coin is weighted, but we aren’t sure in which way.

Similarly:

  1. You must eat a piece of cake.

(6) can express a moral imperative: you are obliged morally to eat a piece of cake. It can express a practical obligation: given your tastes you’d be remiss if you didn’t eat a piece. Though this would rarely make sense, (6) can suggest a doxastic certainty: everything we know entails that you won’t fail to eat the cake.

The multiplicity of interpretation in these modals is pretty clear. One particularly controversial case involves imperative vs epistemic interpretations of ‘must’ as in ‘He must be here’. However, whether or not it is a lexical or structural ambiguity (or best treated as a case of univocality with indexicality) is a source of some controversy (see Drubig 2001). In the semantics literature, views on which modalities are treated indexically rather than as cases of ambiguity pretty much dominate all contemporary thinking, as we shall see in section 6.3.

3.2.1 Quantifier and Operator Scope

Finally, and of much interest to philosophers and logicians, there are scopal ambiguities involving operators and quantifiers. For example:

  1. Every woman squeezed a man.

(7) can express

  1. [∀x:Wx][∃y:My](x squeezed y)

(In regimented English: For every womani there is at least one man that shei squeezed.)

Or

  1. [∃y:My][∀x:Wx](x squeezed y)

(In regimented English: There is at least one mani who is such that every womanj squeezed himi.)

These ambiguities can be very difficult to hear in some cases. For example:

  1. Someone is in a car accident every 10 seconds.

No one is tempted to hear the reading of (10) that involves an unlucky driver who is constantly in car accidents. Thus, our best theory may determine an ambiguity that is never the intended meaning of an utterance of the ambiguous sentence. If we were able to revive people frequently and very quickly and immediately get them into cars , we would presumably start to consider the currently pragmatically unavailable reading of (10) more seriously.

Operators have scopal interactions with quantifiers as well. The semantics of modal auxiliaries, adverbs, temporal modifiers and tense are the subject of much concern but one thing is clear: they have interactive effects.

Modal and temporal fallacies abound if we aren’t careful about scope:

(P1)
John is a bachelor.
(P2)
All bachelors are necessarily unmarried.
(C)
Therefore John is necessarily unmarried.

If we allow ‘necessarily’ to have ‘bachelors’ etc. within its scope, P2 is true but the conclusion is not entailed. If the modal is interpreted narrowly, the conclusion follows but P2 is false and so is the conclusion.

There is a great deal of controversy over how scope is to be handled. Orthodoxy suggests movement of quantifiers at LF where quantifier scope is made explicit and unambiguous. May (1985) is often cited as the canonical source for this – but it is worth noting that in that work May treats some LFs as underdetermining some semantic scopal relations. The situation is less clear with temporal and modal (and other) operators: many semantic theories treat tense and temporal adverbs as quantifiers, while some treat modal expression in this manner. Other treat them as the operators or adverbs they appear to be. One respectable semantic tradition sees (P2) as ambiguous, for example, between:

  1. [∀w][∀x:Bachelor(w,x)](Unmarried(x,w))

(In regimented English: Every world is such that every bachelor at that world is unmarried at that world.)

And

  1. [∀x:Bachelor(w,x)][∀w′](Unmarried (x,w′))

(In regimented English: Every bachelor at a world is such that at every world he is a bachelor.)

On the first reading, the world-quantifier takes wide scope. On the second, the bachelor-quantifier takes wide scope and the world variable is unbound. On the operator treatment, we dispose of quantification over worlds and let the predicates be interpreted relative to the operators, perhaps as a matter of movement, perhaps by other semantic means.

Negation has similarly been argued to present interesting scope ambiguities (see Russell (1905) for an early example of a philosophical use of this type of ambiguity). The following, according to Russell, is ambiguous:

  1. The present king of France is not bald.

As is:

  1. All that glitters is not gold.

Russell claims that (13) and (14) are ambiguous between a reading on which negation that scopes over the sentence as a whole and one reading on which it scopes under the determiner phrase and over the predicate (though see Strawson (1950) See also Neale (1990)).

Long story short, of great interest to philosophers are these sorts of scope worries as many an argument has been accused of looking convincing because of a scope ambiguity (the causal argument for God’s existence, the ontological argument). The development of logics capable of handling multiple quantification was an achievement in part because they could sort out just this sort of linguistic phenomenon.

One final note: even in the domain of scopal ambiguities, there are controversies about whether to treat (some of) these apparent ambiguities as ambiguities. Pietroski and Hornstein (2002) argue that many of these cases aren’t ambiguities at all and prefer a pragmatic explanation of the multiple readings.

3.2.2 Pronouns

Bound and unbound readings of pronouns give rise to similar problems, though whether this is a semantic, syntactic or pragmatic ambiguity has been the source of heated debate. If I tell you ‘everyone loves his mother’, the sentence may be interpreted with ‘his’ being co-indexed with ‘everyone’ and yielding different mothers (potentially) for different values of ‘everyone’ or it could be interpreted deictically saying that everyone loves that [appropriate demonstration] guy’s mother. Static semantics usually treats the distinction between bound and free pronouns as a fundamental ambiguity; dynamic semantics relegates the distinction to an ambiguity in variable choice (see Heim 1982, 1983, and Kamp 1981).

The phenomenon is subject to syntactic constraints. We have a good idea of the conditions under which we can fail to get bound readings, as characterized by binding theory. Thus, we know that binding is impossible in cross-over cases and cases where pronouns are ‘too close’ to their binder ((15) is a case of ‘weak crossover’, (16) is a case of ‘strong crossover’ and (17) is a violation of principle B of binding theory):

  1. ?His1 mother loves John1.
  2. *He1 loves John1.
  3. *John1 loves him1.

However, the impossibility of these readings demonstrates constraints on interpretation. It doesn’t resolve the ambiguity in sentences where violations of binding theory do not occur.

3.3 Pragmatic Ambiguity

Pragmatics has been claimed to be the study of many different things; but for our purposes we can focus on two: speech acts and truth conditional pragmatics.

3.3.1 Speech Acts

Speech act theory is complicated and it is not easy to offer a neutral account of the typology or interpretation of speech acts. But, intuitively, an utterance (locutionary act) of the sentence ‘The cops are coming’ can be an assertion, a warning, or an expression of relief. ‘I’m sorry you were raised so badly’ can be an assertion or an apology. ‘You want to cook dinner’ can function as a request or as an assertion. ‘Can you pick me up later?’ can function as a request or a question or both. And these are just examples of speech acts that are conventionally tied to these sentence forms. Many, if not all, sentences can be used in multiple ways.

Interestingly, these ambiguities are not always signaled by the content of the sentence. For example the following differ in their potential for use in speech acts though they seem to express similar content:

  1. Can you pass the salt?
  2. Are you able to pass the salt?

Some creativity may allow (19) to function as a request but it is very difficult compared to (18). As such, some theorists have been interested in trying to determine whether sentence types constrain the speech act potential of utterances of them (see Murray and Starr (2018) for an overview).

3.3.2 Pragmatic Ambiguity

An interesting case of ubiquitous potential ambiguity is the notion, suggested by Donnellan (1966), that the apparent referential use of some sentences with definite descriptions. Donnellan writes:

It does not seem possible to say categorically of a definite description in a particular sentence that it is a referring expression (of course, one could say this if he meant that it might be used to refer). In general, whether or not a definite description is used referentially or attributively is a function of the speaker’s intentions in a particular case. … Nor does it seem at all attractive to suppose an ambiguity in the meaning of the words; it does not appear to be semantically ambiguous. (Perhaps we could say that the sentence is pragmatically ambiguous ….) (Donnellan, p. 297)

Philosophers puzzled a great deal over the import of a ‘pragmatic’ ambiguity that wasn’t a speech act ambiguity or perhaps an ambiguity in what a speaker implies by uttering a sentence. Kripke (1977) and Searle (1979: p. 150 fn. 3) claim that pragmatic ambiguity is conceptually confused – either the sentence bears two interpretations and there is a vanilla ambiguity or the sentence used in univocal but the speaker is using it to get across a different or additional piece of information. But the intuition that perhaps pragmatics has a great role to play in interpretation than merely an account of inferences licensed by the needs of conversational coherence has led philosophers to consider what ambiguity that resides in the interface of semantics and pragmatics might look like (see Recanati (2010).

3.3.3 Presuppositional Ambiguity

Ambiguity can be found at the level of presupposition, terms of identifying the presupposition triggered by a sentence/utterance, as well. The case of ‘too’ is instructive. It has long been observed that the word ‘too’ triggers presuppositions, as in:

  1. Maria solved the problem too.

It’s natural on first read to think that (20) carries the presupposition that someone else solved the problem. But that need not be the case: it may presuppose that Maria solved the problem as well as having done something else, as in:

  1. Maria came up with the problem. Maria solved the problem too.

Kent Bach (1982) explores the intriguing case of:

  1. I love you too.

This can mean (at least) one of four distinct things:

  1. I love you (just like you love me)
  2. I love you (just like someone else does)
  3. I love you (and I love someone else)
  4. I love you (as well as bearing some other relationship (i.e. admiring) to you)

If none of these are true, ‘I love you too’ is clearly infelicitous.

3.4 Other Interesting Cases

3.4.1 Pros Hen Ambiguity

Aristotle noticed in Metaphysics Γ2 that some words are related in meaning but subtly distinct in what they imply. He thought that ‘being’ was like this and he illustrates his point with examples such as ‘health’:

There are many senses in which a thing may be said to ‘be’, but all that ‘is’ is related to one central point, one definite kind of thing, and is not said to ‘be’ by a mere ambiguity. Everything which is healthy is related to health, one thing in the sense that it preserves health, another in the sense that it produces it, another in the sense that it is a symptom of health, another because it is capable of it. (Metaphysics Γ2)

The idea here is that there are words like ‘health’ (and, if Aristotle is right, ‘being’) that are ambiguous between a ‘primary’ sense of ‘healthy’ is that which applies to things that can enjoy health, such as people, dogs, plants, and perhaps corporations but also a ‘secondary’ sense that involves promoting or signaling the presence of health in the primary sense. For example, your diet may be healthy not because it is failing to suffer from a disease but because it promotes your health. Your doctor may tell you that you have healthy urine on account of it being a positive indication of your health. This ambiguity is special in that the derivative senses of ‘health’ are all defined in terms of the more primary sense of ‘health’. The linguistic context doesn’t always settle which sense of is at play: ‘dogs are healthy pets’ can both mean that dogs tend to be themselves healthy and that dogs tend to promote health in their owners.

3.4.2 Collective-Distributive Ambiguity

Another interesting ambiguity is the collective-distributive ambiguity that occurs in the case of some predicates with certain quantificational or conjunctive antecedents. Consider:

  1. The politicians lifted the piano.
  2. Sam and Jess brokered deals.

(27) enjoys a collective reading on which the piano lifting is true of the politicians collectively but not true of any particular politician and a similar ambiguity is present in (28). They also have distributive readings involving as many liftings of the piano as there were politicians and at least two different deal brokerings respectively. See section (4.1) for relevant considerations.

3.4.3 Ellipsis and Complement Ambiguity

An interesting case of ambiguity comes from ellipsis. The following is clearly ambiguous:

  1. John loves his mother and Bill does too.

We’ve already discussed the bound/unbound ambiguity inherent in ‘John loves his mother’. Consider the bound reading of the first sentence. Now, on that reading, there are still two interpretations of the second sentence to deal with: one on which Bill loves John’s mother and one on which Bill loves his own. This ambiguity has been given the regrettable name ‘strict-sloppy identity’ and seems to be the result of what ‘does too’ is short form for. There is a long-standing debate over whether the mechanism is primarily one of copying over at LF (Fiengo and May 1994), the result of expressing a lambda-abstracted predicate (Sag, 1976; Williams, 1977) or the result of centering on a discourse referent (see Hardt and Stone 1997). Ambiguities can arise from words that aren’t written or said as well as from ones that are.

Similar ambiguities come up in cases such as:

  1. Sam loves Jess more than Jason.

(30) can mean either that Sam loves Jess more than he loves Jason or that Sam loves Jess more than Jason loves Jess. This ambiguity arises from phrasal and clausal comparatives: the phrasal comparative of ‘more than’ takes a noun phrase and relates Jess and Jason (effectively saying that the degree to which Sam loves Jess exceeds the degree to which he loves Jason). On the other hand, one can read (30) as involving ellipsis in which ‘loves Jess’ is stripped from the complement of Jason and left sotto voce.

3.4.4 Flexible Types

Montague (Montague 1973) held to a policy of holding fixed the semantic type of lexical items by their category, so that names, falling in the same category as quantifier phrases, were assigned the same type as quantifier phrases. Otherwise, he reasoned, there would be a type mismatch when we conjoined names and quantifier phrases. Others, however, have been content to posit ambiguities in type for one and the same expression. Thus, we may posit that ‘John’, when the word occurs alone, is of type ⟨e⟩ (entity referring) but when conjoined with ‘every man’, it is of type ⟨⟨e,t⟩,t⟩ (a function from functions to truth values) just like quantifier phrases. The semantics is carefully rigged so as not to make a truth-conditional difference; but there is ambiguity nonetheless in what names literally express.

There are alternatives. We could retain the univocality of names and treat ‘and’ as flexible in type depending on its arguments. We could also treat ‘and’ as a type-shifter. Similar considerations hold for verb phrases. Whether or not there is an ambiguity present in such cases is likely to be determined by very high level considerations, not by competent speakers ability to detect a difference in intuitive meaning.

3.4.5 Generic vs. Non-Generic Readings

Some terms are ambiguous between a generic and non-generic reading, and the sentences they play into are similarly ambiguous between the two readings. For example:

  1. Dinosaurs ate kelp. (Carlson 1982: p. 163)

(31) is clearly ambiguous between a generic reading (equivalent roughly to ‘dinosaurs were kelp-eaters’) and a non-generic, episodic reading (equivalent to ‘there were some dinosaurs that ate some kelp’). The ambiguity can be located with certain predicates as well:

  1. John ate breakfast with a gold fork.

The habitual reading (describing how John favored utensil for eating breakfast) vs. the episodic reading (describing a particular breakfast John ate) is evident in (32).

3.4.6 Inchoative Alternations

The following sentences are obviously related:

  1. I broke the vase.
  2. The vase broke.

‘Broke’ and other words like it (e.g., ‘boiled’) have double lives as transitive and intransitive verbs. This could encourage one to posit an ambiguity (or a polysemy) since the putative lexical entries are closely related. However, that would be awfully quick: another approach is to take words like ‘broke’ as playing two distinct syntactic roles univocally, where the root ‘broke’ is a monadic predicate of events. Another is to take ‘broke’ to be univocal and allow the object to move into subject position. Whether or not the term is ambiguous lexically depends a great deal on which theory of the inchoative turns out to be right.

3.4.7 Granularity

Yet another systematic (seeming) ambiguity corresponds roughly to the type-token distinction that philosophers cherish, though it is more general. Philosophers have noticed that (35) is ambiguous between a type and a token reading:

  1. I paid for the same car.

(35) can express a complaint that a car was paid for twice or the claim that I now own a car that is like yours. How closely they have to correspond in similarity is an open question. But interestingly, the two senses cannot always be accessed felicitously:

  1. ?I skidded on ice and hit the same car.

One cannot read (36) as saying, say, that my Honda hit another Honda. It’s tempting to think that ‘same’ is the culprit, allowing for sameness across different levels of grain from the very fine to the very coarse. The phenomenon is quite wide-spread, however (See Hobbs 1985).

3.4.8 Count/Mass Nouns

Another ambiguity, though perhaps best thought of as polysemy due to the similarity of the meanings, concerns count nouns like ‘(one) chicken’ and mass nouns like, say, ‘(a lot of) chicken’. David Lewis used the idea of a universal grinder (reported by Pelletier in his (1975)) to suggest that we can make sense of mass uses of substantive count nouns – apply the imaginary grinder to, say, three guitars and you can then make sense of:

  1. There was guitar all over the floor.

The possibility of grinding out mass nouns with the universal grinder is limited to predicates that refer to things we can imagine being grindable in their extensions – it’s hard to see how one gets a mass interpretation of ‘melody’ by grinding. The applicability of the universal grinder, moreover, is not linguistically universal in its ability to imbue one and the same noun with a mass interpretation. The count/mass distinction concerns, in part, whether nouns supply a criterion for counting (explaining why count nouns play well with numerical determiners). Thus, continuing our example of ground guitars, notice that (38) doesn’t entail and isn’t entailed by (39):

  1. John picked up more guitars than Sarah.
  2. John picked up more guitar than Sarah.

This doesn’t hold for, say ‘footwear’ and ‘shoes’ where owing more shoes entails owning more footwear and vice versa. See Doetjes (2011) for discussion.

3.4.9 Discourse Relations

Much recent work has gone into trying to give informative explanations of the oddity of discourses such as:

  1. ?Raskolnikov killed Alyona. The tacos at Lalos are delicious.
A standard Gricean response to this oddity is that (40) is odd because the second sentence fails to be relevant to the first, and thus uncooperative (unless the speaker wants to signal a hidden connection between the tacos and the murder). This seems like a promising start but the injunction to be relevant fails to provide enough theoretical options to explain other transitions between sentences. For example (due to Hobbs 1979):
  1. Peter picked the lock. He learned how from Jason.
  2. Peter picked the lock and he learned how from Jason.
An utterance (41) strongly conveys the information that Jason’s teaching Peter is what explains the lock picking. No such inference seems available in (42), in which the learning to lock pick seems (strangely) to temporally follow the lock picking. It’s difficult to see how the period vs. ‘and’ distinction could be responsible for this. Moreover, much empirical work has been done to show that the manner in which we interpret sentences as connected in a discourse effects how we resolve the reference of anaphora. For example (Smyth (1994)):
  1. Phil tickled Stanley, and Liz poked him.

Clearly, the ‘him’ in (43) can be interpreted as Phil or Stanley. But, crucially, how you interpret ‘him’ will depend on how you connect the two sentences. On the one hand, the interpretation of ‘him’ as referring to Phil goes hand in hand with a causal relation – its was the tickling that caused the poking (known as a result relation. Interpreting ‘him’ as referring to Stanley suggests goes hand in hand with a parallel relation. Of course the inference is defeasible – one can always break the connection between discourse relation and pronoun resolution in a manner that looks much like cancellation for Griceans (‘…Liz poked him, I mean, Phil, for unrelated reasons’). But the point is that the search for discourse relations that help settle pronominal reference is good evidence that the discourse relations are part of your linguistic knowledge, not just a reflect of cooperative conversation and maxim following or flaunting. The study of discourse relations has flourished into a large literature in the last 20 years but the relevant point for us is that it looks like (43) is ambiguous as a discourse. This type of ambiguity is fairly novel and much work is still needed to get clear on the number and nature of possible relations that provide the possible resolutions of ambiguities like (41).

4. Detecting Ambiguity

Now that we have separated types of ambiguity, we may reasonably ask how we tell when a term or phrase contains an ambiguity. The answer may be disappointing – there are tests and considerations but no firm answers and probably a lot depends on what the ‘best theories’ in linguistics etc. end up looking like. Nevertheless, we can make some progress. The canonical source for these tests is Zwicky and Sadock’s ‘Ambiguity Tests and How to Fail Them’ (1975).

These tests generally depend on the presence or lack of interpretations and on judgments regarding the ridiculousness of interpretation (the absurdity of the meaning is known as zeugma – though it should probably be known as syllepsis). These judgments can be difficult to make, especially in tricky philosophical cases, so we must treat the results of the tests with care.

4.1 Conjunction Reduction

A standard test for ambiguity is to take two sentences that contain the purportedly ambiguous term and conjoin them by using the term only once in contexts where both meanings are encouraged. For example, ‘light’ is a predicate that can enjoy the same meaning as either ‘not dark’ or ‘not heavy’.

  1. The colours are light.
  2. The feathers are light.

The following, however, seems to be zeugmatic:

  1. ?The colours and the feathers are light.

The reduced sentence is zeugmatic for obvious reasons. This is evidence for ambiguity (or polysemy) in ‘light’. On the other hand, ‘exist’, which has been claimed to be ambiguous, seems not to display such zeugmatic effects:

  1. Toronto exists.
  2. Numbers exist.
  3. Triadic relations exist.
  4. Toronto and numbers and triadic relations exist.

The test is limited in one way. If a term can be ambiguous but in a way so subtle that competent speakers may miss it, then the zeugma might not be noticeable. Given that these tests try to draw on linguistic judgments to detect ambiguity, it’s not clear how to proceed when there is a case of disagreement over the presence of zeugma.

We can use the test in cases in which one wouldn’t necessarily expect zeugma, but merely lack of multiple interpretations. For example:

  1. Han and Chewbacca used superfluous hair removers.

(51) doesn’t allow a reading on which Han used a hair remover that was superfluous and Chewbacca used a remover of superfluous hair. If multiple interpretations are impossible, there is evidence of ambiguity. This is to be expected since the point of conjunction reduction is to ‘freeze’ the syntactic structure and in ambiguous cases, the effect is achieved.

As mentioned above, conjunction reduction has been used to argue that collective-distributive ambiguities are due to an ambiguity in the subject phrase. Consider:

  1. John and Jane moved a piano.

One might think that the readings are generated by an ambiguity in ‘and’: sometimes it acts as a sentential operator and sometimes as a term-forming operator that makes two names into a single term for predication. However, notice that there are some predicates that can only be (sensibly) interpreted collectively, such as ‘met’:

  1. John and Jane met for lunch.

In this case, there is no sense to be made of ‘John met for lunch and Jane met for lunch’ and so the sentential conjunction reading is not available. Using conjunction reduction on (52) and (53) we get:

  1. John and Jane moved a piano and met for lunch.

(54) has a reading on which ‘moved the piano’ is interpreted distributively (two liftings) and ‘met’ is read collectively. The felicity of the conjunction reduced (54) suggests that the ambiguity isn’t the result of an ambiguity in conjunction. (see Schein (2006), McKay (2006)). We can try to use the test in an extended manner on full sentences if we embed them under ‘says that’ or perhaps ‘believes that’: ‘John and Adam believe that Sarah bought a superfluous hair remover’ is infelicitous if the unconjoined sentences involve different interpretations of ‘superfluous hair remover’.

The test has certain weaknesses. In actual utterances, intonation can be used to indicate an assertion or an each question (‘Ben wanted to eat that?) conjoined with ‘Ben wanted to eat that’ yields an infelicity even if the demonstrative has the same value on both occasions – though we may try to fix things up by demanding that the test be run using common intonation (at least in spoken uses of the test!). On that note, the test will judge demonstrative and indexicals to be ambiguous since they are famously not generally conjunction reducible. Similar worries concern polysemy and ambiguity, which conjunction reduction may be overly sensitive to (See Viebahn (2016) for relevant considerations).

4.2 Ellipsis

Ellipsis tests work in a manner similar to conjunction reduction tests. For example:

  1. I saw his duck and swallow under the table and I saw hers too. (Zwicky and Sadock 1975)

(55) can mean that I saw their birds under the table or that I saw their activities of ducking and swallowing but it can’t mean that I saw one’s birds and the other’s activities. Similar features hold for structural ambiguities:

  1. I’m happy that every man met two women and Jim is too.

It isn’t possible to interpret (56) as having ‘every man’ with wide scope in one but narrow in the other. This suggests a real ambiguity in the scope of the two quantifiers. This test has led people some philosophers to surprising results. For example, Atlas (1989) argues that the acceptability of the following suggest that negation does not interact scopally with descriptions in the ways we have come to expect:

  1. John thinks that the King of France is not bald and Bob thinks so too.

The purported availability of both readings suggests that sentences with negation(s) and descriptions are sense-general rather than ambiguous, contradicting many standard assumptions about the available truth conditions these structures should make available. Alternatively, it may lead us to think that there weren’t as many readings as we initially thought there were (or that we have the wrong theory of descriptions).

4.3 Contradiction Tests

Another way to test for ambiguity is to test for lack of contradiction in sentences that look to be contradictory. For example, say someone argued that ‘aunt’ was ambiguous on account of not specifying maternal from paternal aunt. If that was the case, we would expect that we can access the two distinct senses of ‘aunt’ just as we can for ‘bank’. However, compare:

  1. That bank isn’t a bank.
  2. *She is an aunt but she isn’t an aunt.

Both sentences are rather awkward but only one is doomed to life as a contradiction. This is good evidence that ‘aunt’ is unspecified with respect to which side of the family she comes from, but not ambiguous. The tests can be used for most of the other types of ambiguity:

  1. My superfluous hair remover is not a superfluous hair remover; (I need it!)
  2. The goose is ready to eat but it’s not ready to eat; (we need to cook it first.)

(It helps to provide a paraphrase afterwards to bring out the distinct senses). The tests can be used to detect lexical, structural and thematic ambiguity.

4.4 Definitional Tests

Aristotle offers a test for ambiguity: try to construct a definition that encompasses both meanings and posit an ambiguity only if you fail. The notion of definition here has to be taken as a heavy-weight notion: ‘bank’ is ambiguous even though you can ‘define’ it as ‘financial institution or river side’. However, we can get a reasonable grip on what Aristotle had in mind. ‘Uncle’ is not ambiguous because it has a single definition that covers both: x is an uncle iff x is the brother of y and y has a child.

The test depends partly on how strict we are about what counts as a definition. And on the assumption that there are interesting definitions to be had (see Fodor 1998).

4.5 Checking the Lexicon of Other Languages

Kripke, in his famous attack on Donnellan, suggests a few tests for ambiguity that are more conceptual in nature. In particular, he makes the following intriguing suggestion:

“Bank” is ambiguous; we would expect the ambiguity to be disambiguated by separate and unrelated words in some other languages. Why should the two separate senses be reproduced in languages unrelated to English? First, then, we can consult our linguistic intuitions, independently of any empirical investigation. Would we be surprised to find languages that used two separate words for the two alleged senses of a given word? If so, then, to that extent our linguistic intuitions are really intuitions of a unitary concept, rather than of a word that expresses two distinct and unrelated senses. Second, we can ask empirically whether languages are in fact found that contain distinct words expressing the allegedly distinct senses. If no such language is found, once again this is evidence that a unitary account of the word or phrase in question should be sought. (Kripke 1977: p. 268)

In other words, since lexical ambiguity should involve something like accidental homophony, one would expect that other languages would lexicalize these meanings differently. Thus, it would not surprise one to find out that the two meanings of ‘bat’ were expressed by two different words in other languages. It may well surprise one to find out that every action verb was lexicalized as two different verbs, one for a reading on which the action was done intentionally, one on which it wasn’t in some other language.

One may worry about this test, especially with respect to its ability to differentiating sense generality from ambiguity. It would not be surprising to find out that other languages lexicalize ‘uncle’ in two different words (in Croatian, there is no one word translation of ‘uncle’: ‘stric’ means brother of one’s father and ‘ujak’ means an uncle from the mother’s side). Nonetheless, there is no reason to think that ‘uncle’ is ambiguous in English. Why wouldn’t language users create words to designate the specific meanings that are left sense-general in a different language?

4.6 Problems for the Tests

4.6.1 Privative Opposites

Zwicky and Sadock (1975) argue that sometimes the two (or more) putative meanings of a word are related by overlapping except with respect to one or more features. The Random House Dictionary, for example, gives (amongst many others) the following two definitions for ‘dog’:

  1. any carnivore of the dog family Canidae, having prominent canine teeth and, in the wild state, a long and slender muzzle, a deep-chested muscular body, a bushy tail, and large, erect ears. Compare canid.
  2. the male of such an animal.

Ignoring for now whether or not dictionaries manage to report analyticities (is having a bushy tail really an analytic necessary condition for being a dog?), it looks like sense (ii) and (iii) differ merely by specification of gender, and so if this makes for ambiguity, it may well be hard to test for. Similarly for verbs that allow a factive and non-factive reading such as ‘report’ where the factive reading entails the non-factive. If I say ‘the police reported that the criminal was apprehended but the police didn’t report that the criminal was apprehended’ there is at least one reading that is anomalous, but largely out of contradiction engendered by entailment rather than univocality: it takes subtle intuitions to train one’s ear to hear ambiguities when the meanings are largely overlapping. As mentioned above, Pietroski and Hornstein (2002) make a similar point regarding syntactic ambiguities. Noting that the two putative readings of ‘every man loves a woman’ are such that the wide scope ‘a woman’ reading entails the narrow, they ask whether or not we should be countenancing a structural ambiguity or chalking up the two ‘readings’ to confusion over the specific and general case. If these sorts of factors can interfere, we will indeed have to apply our tests gingerly.

4.6.2 The Inconsistency of Zeugma

A problem for the conjunction reduction test involves the context-sensitivity of zeugma. As noted by Lewandowska-Tomaszczyk (following Cruse 1986), the following two are different in terms of zeugma:

  1. ?Judy’s dissertation is thought provoking and yellowed with age.
  2. Judy’s dissertation is still thought provoking although yellowed with age.

Similarly, from the literature on generics:

  1. Bees thrive in warm environments and hence are swarming my porch.

These cases looks like a problem for the conjunction reduction test, depending on how one thinks we should treat the ambiguity in generics. One might think that this provides evidence against ambiguity in bare plurals.

4.7 Contextual Resolution and Degree of Zeugma

As we suggested above, context-sensitivity, vagueness and indexicality are frequently thought to be different phenomena than ambiguity, requiring a different treatment than lexical proliferation or differences in structure. However, in context, it can be pretty easy to make them pass some of the tests for ambiguity. For example, consider James, who wants to meet a man who is is tall for a philosopher, and Jane who wants to meet a man who is tall for a horse jockey (who tend to be a fair bit shorter on average). Let’s conjunction reduce and see what happens:

  1. ?James and Jane want to meet a tall man.

Admittedly, (65) strikes me as meriting a ‘?’ rather than a ‘#’, but I am unwilling to let it escape unmarked. Let’s try another case. Consider, James speaking to Jill and disagreeing over the relevant height required to be tall:

  1. ?That mani is tall but hei’s not tall.

It’s possible, I think, to get a non-contradictory reading of (66). But it requires, to my ear, adding a good helping of focal stress on the second ‘tall’. Of course, putting focal stress on a word has semantic effects of its own. So we don’t have clear counter-examples to the tests here. But we do have some evidence that running the tests requires controlling for variables.

Similarly, speaker’s reference and semantic reference distinctions mentioned above can interfere with the proper operation of the tests. Let’s consider a variant on Kripke’s famous case. We see someone who looks like Smith (but is Jones) raking the leaves and someone else sees Smith (the actual Smith) raking leaves. Can we hear the following as non-zeugmatic?

  1. We saw Smith raking the leaves and he did too.

In context, this sounds awfully bad to me. It doesn’t seem, however, that the word ‘Smith’ is ambiguous in sometimes referring to Jones, sometimes Smith. The utterance of the word ‘Smith’ however, may well be used with referential intentions that lead to utterance ambiguity.

The bottom line is that in clear cases, the tests work great. In controversial cases, one must be very careful and run many of them and hope for the best; it will sometimes involve sifting through degrees of zeugma rather than triumphantly producing an indisputable result.

4.8 Metaphor and Non-Literal Usage

Metaphor and non-literal usage can also confound the tests. For example:

  1. #We saw Zoe down in the dumps and her therapist did too.
  2. #Life and the 401 are highways.

The metaphors aren’t very good and (68) and (69) are clearly zeugmatic. Given how many parts of speech can be used metaphorically, slavish obedience to the test would postulate massive and unconstrained ambiguity in natural language. (See Camp 2006) The natural answer is to restrict the use of the test to cases in which the words are used literally; but of course the tests are supposed to help us decide when we have literal, semantic difference and when we don’t. To add to the complication, metaphors that are used in similar manners over time tend to become ‘dead’ metaphors – literally ambiguities that took a causal path through metaphor. ‘Deadline’ is a pretty clear case of a metaphor that has died. Since the passing of the non-literal into the standardized literal is not exactly a transition whose time of occurrence is obvious, it will be difficult in some cases to tell what has been lexicalized as a different meaning and what has not (think, again, of ‘deadline’ as a case, which once meant a line the crossing of which would result in your death. Think of that next time you are late with a paper…)

5. Philosophical Issues

There are a few main philosophical issues involved in ambiguity.

5.1 Validity

Many arguments look persuasive but fail on closer inspection on account of structural and/or lexical ambiguity. For example, consider:

  1. Babe Ruth owned a bat.
  2. Bats have wings.
  3. Babe Ruth owned something with wings.

The argument looks valid and the premises seem true, on at least one reading, but the conclusion doesn’t follow.

If logic is to be free of issues that would complicate telling valid from non-valid arguments by form, detecting ambiguity is essential to logical representation of natural language arguments. Frege noted this to be the main defect of natural language and a real obstacle to trying to formalize it (as opposed to just using the formal language without translation from natural language). We typically are more optimistic on this point than Frege; but the long history of dispute over such issues as the pragmatic-semantics distinction and skepticism over the viability of semantic theory in general stand as challenges.

5.2 Basic Semantic Methodology

Ambiguity has been used methodologically as a way to shield a theory from counter-example. Kripke laments this tendency explicitly:

It is very much the lazy man’s approach in philosophy to posit ambiguities when in trouble. If we face a putative counterexample to our favorite philosophical thesis, it is always open to us to protest that some key term is being used in a special sense, different from its use in the thesis. We may be right, but the ease of the move should counsel a policy of caution: Do not posit an ambiguity unless you are really forced to, unless there are really compelling theoretical or intuitive grounds to suppose that an ambiguity really is present.(Kripke 1977, p.268)

Grice (1975) counsels a methodological principle: ‘Senses are not to be multiplied beyond necessity’.

This general moral seems right. It is worryingly easy to deflect a counter-example or to explain an intuition by claiming differences in meaning. On the other hand, in philosophical discourse, distinctions that are quite fine can be made that may well be missed by normal users of the language who are inclined to miss differences in meaning that are slight. One thus often will be tempted to posit ambiguity as a way to reconcile differences between two plausible hypotheses about the meanings of words and phrases (‘evidence’ has both an internal sense and an external sense, ‘right action’ has both a utilitarian sense and a deontic sense…) A neat case of this is Gilbert Ryle’s contention that ‘exists’ is ambiguous mentioned above:

…two different senses of ‘exist’, somewhat as ‘rising’ has different senses in ‘the tide is rising’, ‘hopes are rising’, and ‘the average age of death is rising’. A man would be thought to be making a poor joke who said that three things are now rising, namely the tide, hopes and the average age of death. It would be just as good or bad a joke to say that there exist prime numbers and Wednesdays and public opinions and navies; or that there exist both minds and bodies. (Ryle 1949, p. 23)

Ryle here makes use of the conjunction reduction test mentioned above and has been the target of much scorn for his intuitions on this matter. This may just go to show how hard it is to (dis)prove a claim to ambiguity using the tests.

5.3 The Analytic-Synthetic Distinction

One long-standing issue about ambiguity is that it assumes a difference between something like sense and reference. While some words can clearly be used to refer to things that are wildly different in ontic category, that has not been taken to be sufficient for a claim to ambiguity. In theory, a phrase could be ambiguous and yet differ not at all in reference: imagine a term t that was ambiguous between two meanings, but it turned out as highly surprising essential condition that things that were t in the first sense were also t in the second sense – while this seems unlikely to happen, it is by no means conceptually impossible.

However, the 20th century saw a vicious and sometimes relentless attack on the distinction between facts about meaning and facts about reference (see the entry on the analytic/synthetic distinction). If the line between these two is blurry, there will very likely be cases in which the line between ambiguity and sense-generality is blurry as well (and not just epistemologically). Let’s indulge in some possible-world anthropology on a group that uses a term, ‘gavagai’ (Quine 1960). Furthermore, I stipulate (perhaps counter-possibly) that the world is a four-dimensional world with respect to the referent of ‘gavagai’ so if they refer at all with ‘gavagai’, they refer to something made up of stages. Now we sit down to write the lexicon of the world’s inhabitants and we come to ‘gavagai’. We write:

‘Gavagai’ (ga-vuh-guy): (N, sing.):

It’s not easy to know what to write down for this entry as it’s not obvious what counts as semantic content for the word and what counts as information about the referent of the word. For example, say they clearly think that the referent of ‘gavagai’ is something that does not have temporal parts. Does this mean that they fail to refer to rabbits with ‘gavagai’ or that they are mistaken about their nature? If this question is hard to answer, we can generalize to harder cases: say that some of the ‘rabbits’ in this world are three-dimensional and some four- dimensional. Should we countenance an ambiguity in ‘gavagai’ given that the people use it indiscriminately to refer to both? Should we posit a lexical ambiguity with two different definitions for ‘gavagai’?

This case may be far-fetched; but we have a real live cases of it. Field (1973) discusses the case of the term ‘mass’, which seems to have been thought to pick out one property of objects but in fact picks out two that are really very different in character. Deciding whether this is a surprising case of disjunctive reference, or an indeterminacy in reference is no easy task, but the decision has ramifications for whether or not we categorize ‘mass’ as ambiguous or highly sense-general (and if sense-general, what is the general sense?)

5.4 The Flexibility of the Lexicon

The lexicon is highly productive and easily extended. Most people, including myself, upon hearing:

  1. She bought a rabbit.

will think that it’s safe to infer that she bought a fuzzy little pet that hops around and likes carrots. However, upon learning that there is a car by the same name made by Volkswagen, it will be much less clear to me that I know what she bought.

Similar phenomena include dead metaphors and idioms. The former include such items as ‘branch’ which now applies to distinct sections of the government, the latter to phrases ‘kick the bucket.’ (As an aside, I puzzled over several candidates for both and realized it was hard to tell in most cases which were which!) These clearly pass the ambiguity tests above by exhibiting zeugma, i.e.,

  1. ?The government and the trees have branches.
  2. ?He kicked the bucket last week and she did too, twice.

It’s controversial whether metaphors ever actually die and whether or not, assuming they do die, they are metaphors. So it is controversial whether or not ‘branch’ is lexically ambiguous. It clearly has two readings but whether or not these are to be reflected as lexical meanings is a difficult and vague matter – not that it clearly matters all that much in most cases.

5.5 Legal Interpretations

On the other hand, the facts about ambiguity can matter a great deal when it comes to determining policy, extension of law etc. The law is sensitive to this and makes certain division between ambiguities. For example, the law divides between patent and latent ambiguity, where the former roughly corresponds to a case where the meaning of a law is unclear, the latter to cases where the meaning is clear but applies equally well to highly disparate things. In effect, this is the difference between ambiguity in sense and ambiguity in reference.

U.S. Constitution scholars sometimes claim that the Constitution is ‘ambiguous’ at key points. A famous example of such an ambiguity is the succession of the vice president, where the framers stipulate that:

In Case of the Removal of the President from Office, or of his Death, Resignation, or Inability to discharge the Powers and Duties of the said Office, the same shall devolve on the Vice President, (Article 2, section 1)

The clause is not clear as to what ‘devolve’ means.

Of course, given what has been discussed, this looks to be more like a case of under-specificity, or simply ignorance of a word’s meaning (in 1787), not ambiguity. As the distinction has no real legal relevance in this case, it is ignored as it generally is in common parlance.

6. Ambiguity and Indexicality: Are They Easily Told Apart?

In section 2 we looked at phenomena that were not the same as ambiguity; in this section, we look at a few cases in which we might have been wrong to tear them apart.

6.1 Deictic vs. Bound Anaphora

It is often claimed that:

  1. John loves his mother.

is ambiguous between a deictic reading and a bound reading. Syntactic orthodoxy holds that either ‘his’ is co-indexed with John or it bears a different referential index. Various theories of anaphora, however, have claimed that we can dispense with the fundamental ambiguity between free and bound anaphora and unify the treatment of the two. Dynamic Semantics aspires to offer just such a unified account, taking all anaphora to always refer to discourse referents, or functions from information states to information states. This provides a unified treatment of the function of anaphora in natural language and dispenses with the need to think of anaphoric interpretation as ambiguous as opposed to merely context-sensitive. (See Heim 1982, 1983, and Kamp 1981).

6.2 The Scope of Indefinites

Consider:

  1. Every man who read a book by Chomsky is happy.

(77) is ambiguous between one where ‘a book by Chomsky’ takes wide scope over ‘every man who reads’ and one where it takes narrow scope. Maybe so; but most quantifiers in fact cannot escape from relative clauses. Relative clauses are known as ‘scope islands’, or contexts in which quantifiers can’t be interpreted as raised. In fact, it has been noted that indefinites seem to escape from nearly any normal scope island whatsoever. This suggests that treating the various readings as an ambiguity akin to other scopal ambiguities is mistaken. Another treatment of (77)’s multiplicity of readings involves domain restriction: if we restrict the domain of ‘a book’ to only one particular book, we can emulate the reading one would get from treating ‘a book’ as having wide-scope. Domain restriction traditionally is treated as a matter of context sensitivity rather than ambiguity. We thus have some reason to doubt that the right treatment of (77) has much to do with the phenomenon of scope. (see Schwarzchild (2002) for further discussion).

6.3 Modals

As noted above, modals seem to come in various flavours (doxastic, metaphysical, logical, deontic, practical…). It is tempting to treat these as ambiguities involving the modal term. However, it is worth noting that other treatments abound. Kratzer (1983) treats modals as univocal but indexical: they get their differing interpretations by taking in different input sets of worlds and orderings induced on the relevant sets. If this is right, it may well be that what looks like an ambiguity should actually be treated as a matter of straightforward indexicality (much like ‘I’ is not ambiguous but indexical).

6.4 Focal Stress

A really interesting case that may be loosely described as ambiguity at the level of a sentence concerns focal stress and its myriad of interesting effects. Generally focal stress is well known to co-ordinate assertions with questions under discuss and to introduce sets of alternatives into a discourse. In particular, these alternative sets can have truth conditional effects, for example:

  1. Putin only poisons his opponents.
  2. Putin only poisons his opponents
(78) is falsified by Putin shooting an opponent, (79) is not. (78) introduces a presupposition that Putin does something to his opponents while (79) introduces a presupposition that Putin poisons someone. The sentence, thought of in terms of orthography, ‘Putin only poisons his opponents’ is thus ambiguous. Assuming that focal stress is syntactically marked, the LF disambiguates. See (Rooth (1993) and Herburger (2000) for semantic theories of focal stress).

6.5 Cancellation vs. Disambiguation

Griceans have long used cancellation as a method to detect conversational implicatures, or information communicated by an utterer of a sentence that isn’t part of what’s said by S. Cancellation is a procedure by which an explicit denial of putatively conveyed information is conjoined to the original utterance to see if the result is a contradiction. For example, consider an utterance of:

  1. I got drunk and I drove home (but not in that order).

The non-bracketed sentence, absent an utterance of the bracketed content, will typically convey the order events as being mirrored in the order of the conjuncts. But, as Grice famously argued, this isn’t due to an embedded ordering in the meaning of ‘and’ as shown by the addition of the bracketed content not producing a contradiction. The Gricean stories about how we come about this extra information in non-cancellation cases is fairly well known. But given the preceding, it’s not hard to see that an option has been overlooked: why shouldn’t we think of ‘but’ as playing the role of a disambiguator? If ‘and’ were ambiguous, for example, wouldn’t one way of avoiding an contradictory utterance involve adding a phrase that ruled out one possible meaning? We saw Grice’s claims about Modified Occam’s razor and so perhaps attributing an ambiguity to ‘and’ is not so attractive. But perhaps an ambiguity in the assignment of times to the present tense markers is, and the putative cancellation serves to indicate the intended resolution of the those variables? Or perhaps ‘and’ signals two or more possible discourse relations and the putative cancellation services to disambiguate between those? Lepore and Stone (2016) put disambiguation to work in an attempt to show that ambiguities in interpretation are more rife and wide spread than we might have previously assumed. If they are right, ambiguity plays a more central role than perhaps might have been thought in sentence, utterance and discourse interpretation. It remains to see if they are. The point of these examples is that it is often difficult to tell which theoretical treatment best explains a case of multiple interpretability. One must be cautious in one’s approach to these issues. It is all too easy to notice an apparent ambiguity, but often all too difficult to explain its nature.

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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

The author thanks Ben Caplan, Michael Glanzberg, Robbie Hirsch, Greg D’amico, Judith Tonheuser, Robert May and the reading group Synners at OSU for extremely helpful comments and observations. Thanks to the OSU reading group Synners for suggestions that were invaluable additions to Section 4.1. Thanks to Paul Saka for detailed comments and helpful discussion that helped me produce the first revision of the entry. Thanks to Jeff Pelletier for very helpful suggestions that helped a great deal with the second revision.

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Adam Sennet <amsennet@ucdavis.edu>

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