Essence and Existence in Arabic and Islamic Philosophy

First published Sat Aug 24, 2024

The core issue of Islamic metaphysics is whether the essences of things are distinct from their existence. The philosophical intuition underlying the distinction between essence and existence is that what something is (e.g., human, horse) is different from the fact that it exists. The debate on the distinction between essence and existence in Islamic philosophy revolves around the question whether there is such a distinction to be made at all and, if so, then whether this distinction is between two features that are either real (i.e., outside the mind) or only conceptual (i.e., within the mind). The responses to these questions bear on further philosophical issues such as divine omnipotence, that is, whether God can change the essences of things (for instance, turn human into stone) assuming that God does not create essences but only makes them existent; and whether God’s essence is distinct from God’s existence.

1. Historical Overview

The discussion of essence and existence in Islamic philosophy extends throughout its entire history. We can find relevant materials as early as the ninth century CE and up to the Qajar period of Iranian history (eighteenth-nineteenth centuries) (Pourjavady 2019). The question remains crucial in contemporary Islamic philosophy (e.g., Tabatabai 2010). For the purposes of this entry, we will mostly focus on the period between the ninth and the seventeenth centuries. That period can be divided into five episodes.

The first episode takes place within the Islamic tradition of falsafa, which is the philosophical tradition in the Islamic world rooted in the Greek-into-Arabic translation movement. Consequently, it is largely indebted to Greek Neoplatonism and Aristotelianism. The main protagonists of this episode are Abū Yaʿqūb al-Kindī (d. after 870 CE) and Abū Naṣr al-Fārābī (d. 950–1 CE).

The second episode is to be located in another tradition of Islamic philosophical thought called “kalām”. Kalām develops largely independently from Greek philosophy as a parallel philosophical tradition with its own highly original conceptual framework and a set of philosophical issues. The main schools of kalām relevant for this entry are the Muʿtazilites of Basra as well as the Ashʿarites. Classical kalām reaches its climactic point of development in the early eleventh century.

The discussion of essence and existence in early falsafa and classical kalām culminates in the third episode: the metaphysics of Abū ʿAlī ibn Sīnā (d. 1037 CE), known in the West under the name of Avicenna. Avicenna develops his own views on essence and existence in reaction to both falsafa and kalām. His innovative analysis of essence and existence sets the framework for how the question is subsequently addressed in Islamic metaphysics and beyond.

The fourth core episode constitutes a reaction to Avicenna’s analysis of essence and existence by the scholars of kalām, as well as a refinement of the Avicennan approach essence and existence in addressing the issues raised by that reaction. The two most influential contributors to the debate on the relationship between essence and existence in this period are Fakhr al-Dīn al-Rāzī (d. 1210) and Shihāb al-Dīn al-Suhrawardī (d. 1191).

The competition between what can be referred to as the “Razīan” and the “Suhrawardīan” methods in metaphysics largely shapes subsequent approaches taken to address the relationship between essence and existence in post-classical Islamic philosophy. Yet, from the thirteenth century onwards, another metaphysical trend starts gaining momentum and influence—ontological monism. The idea that everything in reality shares one and the same existence has detrimental consequences for how Islamic philosophers understand essence and existence. Originally developed by Ibn ʿArabī (d. 1240) and Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Qūnawī (d. 1274), ontological monism reaches its culmination in the works of Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Shīrāzī (d. 1640), also known as Mullā Ṣadrā.

2. Senses of Being in Falsafa Before Avicenna

Apparently, there was no one who explicitly accepted the distinction between essence and existence in the tradition of Islamic falsafa before Avicenna. For instance, Abū Yaʿqūb al-Kindī never makes this distinction clear. On the contrary, he states that “being” is identical to “what something is” (Adamson 2002: 306–307). In other words, for al-Kindī, “to be” means “to be something”. When we say that a cup is, we mean that a cup is a cup—nothing more and beyond that. Therefore, al-Kindī denies any distinction between essence and existence.

In Arabic, al-Kindī’s terminology for “existence” includes anniyya (on which see Frank 1956), al-ays (on which see Endress 1973: 104–105), and huwiyya (on which see Menn 2008: 75). Given the absence of any distinction between essence and existence in al-Kindī’s metaphysics, all three notions equally designate what something is and the fact that it is—something that can be captured with a more neutral English notion of “being”. Therefore, when al-Kindī says that God is pure being (anniyya faqaṭ), he does not mean anything like Avicenna’s later idea that God’s essence is confined to the fact that God exists, unlike the essences of other things which are distinct from their existence. Rather, al-Kindī engages in the contemporary kalām debate on divine attributes. His position that God is “pure being” amounts to the statement that God does not have any attributes that would be really distinct from His essence (Adamson 2003).

The later common notion for “existence” in Arabic philosophy is wujūd. It comes from the passive verb form wujida, and literally means “to be found”. One comes across the first extensive discussion of this notion of existence (wujūd) and the existent (mawjūd) in falsafa with Abū Naṣr al-Fārābī.

Al-Fārābī argues that existence can be understood in two senses. In the first sense, when we say “horses exist”, we mean that horses truly occur outside our minds. In this sense, existence is a “secondary intelligible” (maʿqūl thānī), as described by al-Fārābī. Secondary intelligibles are solely predicated of further notions in our minds and not of any real objects (on secondary intelligibles in Islamic philosophy, see Sabra 1980). For instance, “cup” is a primary notion in our minds. It corresponds to a cup outside the mind. But when we say that cups exist, we just mean that what we conceive under the notion of “cup” has instantiations in the extramental world. We attribute the predicate of existence understood in the sense of having an instantiation outside the mind to the notion of cup in the mind, not to the real cup outside the mind. We can apply the notion of existence in the same way to any notions we wish. When we say that aliens, for instance, do not exist, we mean that whatever we think of when we think of aliens has no instantiation outside the mind.

Therefore, although al-Fārābī never explicitly stresses it, the first sense of existence implies that existence must at least have a different meaning (that is, be conceptually distinct) from our notions corresponding to the essences of things. “Cups” and “humans” obviously mean different things, but whether we say that cups exist or that humans exist, we always have the same notion in mind: that something has at least one instantiation outside the mind (Menn 2008).

And yet, al-Fārābī refrains from postulating any clear-cut distinction between the essences of things and their existence. His resistance to a metaphysical distinction between what things are and their existence is evident in al-Farābī’s discussion of the second sense of existence. Here, al-Fārābī states that existence amounts to possessing a certain essence outside our minds. In this sense, he asserts that existence relates to real objects and is identical to them. For a cup, “to be” still means to be a cup, insofar as by “being” we refer to an ontological reality that pertains to cups outside our minds. (Menn 2008).

3. Things and Their Existence in Classical Kalām

In classical kalām, there are two theories that problematize the relationship between things and the fact of their ontological presence in the world. One of these theories proposes that objects (dhawāt) have some ontological status of their own, beyond their existence (wujūd).

Several representatives of the Basran tradition of the Muʿtazilite school of kalām argue that things, before their creation by God, already are what they are. God’s sole task in creation consists of attaching existence to some already semi-real objects. He looks at them and says to them “Be!” (cf. Qurʿān 36:82), but He cannot change what they are. This doctrine is commonly epitomized with the slogan “the non-existent is a thing” (al-maʿdūm shayʾ). Another way to put the same doctrine is to say that the reality (thubūt) of things is extensionally broader that their existence (wujūd) as it includes non-existent things as well (Frank 1980; Klein-Franke 1994).

A modern reader may find multiple striking parallels between the Basran Muʿtazilite theory of non-existent objects and the metaphysics of Meinongianism. For instance, the Basran Muʿtazilites equally use theories of intentionality to establish the reality of things beyond existence. They argue that divine and human wishes and thoughts must have some sort of connection or association (taʿalluq) with their objects. Yet, a connection or an association is possible only if there is something to which the wishes and thoughts may be connected. Therefore, we need to postulate a separate realm of reality that contains all our objects of thought and volitions even before they exist (Benevich 2018b).

Although the theory of non-existent objects did not explicitly include the notion of essences, it posited a real distinction between objects (dhawāt) and their thing-ness (shayʾiyya) on the one hand and their existence (wujūd) on the other. Things are already things even before they are made existent. Hence, what things are must be different from the fact that they exist (Wisnovsky 2000).

The second relevant theory addresses the relationship between things and their existence even more directly. The Basran Muʿtazilites argue that being existent (mawjūd) is a state (ḥāl) that belongs to objects in the world extrinsically.

The ontology of kalām traditionally includes two main types of entities, substantial elements (jawāhir, traditionally translated as “atoms”) and their accidents (aʿrāḍ). Substantial elements are responsible for the physical structure of the universe, the constitution of bodies and their spatial location. Accidents are entities (maʿānī) that inhere in the substantial elements and the bodies that they form and stand for all other perceptible and sometimes non-perceptible qualities (Dhanani 1994; Frank 1978).

The front figure of Basran Muʿtazilism, Abū Hāshim al-Jubbāʾī (d. 933), suggests that there is something beyond the substantial elements and the accidents—something he calls “states” (aḥwāl). The states are non-perceptible, non-entitative features that belong to the substantial elements or the bodies they form together. The Basran Muʿtazilites usually express the non-entitative character of the states by stating that they are neither existent nor non-existent (ghayr maʿdūm wa-ghayr mawjūd). Despite how it may appear, this statement does not violate the principle of the excluded middle; it merely implies that the application of existence and non-existence to the states constitutes a category mistake. Another way the Basran Muʿtazilites emphasize the non-entitative status of the states is by arguing that they cannot be known on their own. Whenever we think of a state, we conceive of it as belonging to something, not as a separate entity (Frank 1971 and 1978; Thiele 2016; Benevich 2016; Zamboni 2023).

Among these non-entitative states, the Basran Muʿtazilites distinguish many types, but we may simply focus on two. Firstly, some states are grounded in the accidents that inhere in the bodies. For instance, the accident of desire (shahwa) inheres somewhere around the heart and gives rise to a state of desiring (kawn mushtahiyan) attributed to the entire human (jumla). Note that accidents are usually perceptible by senses but those accidents that give rise to the states are non-perceptible; we cannot perceive desire (Ibn Mattawayh, Tadhkira, 415). The second group of accidents is usually described as ungrounded or uncaused. They belong to things intrinsically. For instance, the feature of occupying space (kawn mutaḥayyizan) belongs to substantial elements in virtue of themselves (Frank 1978; Thiele 2016).

Now, for the Basran Muʿtazilites, being existent (kawn mawjūdan) is considered as a state that belongs to things. Like any other state, being existent is distinct (zāʾid, literally “additional”) from the substantial elements and their accidents themselves, but is not an entity by itself. More specifically, the state of being existent is somewhere between the two aforementioned groups of states. On the one hand, being existent is a state that belongs to things extrinsically. As discussed earlier, God makes things exist. On the other hand, however, the Basran Muʿtazilites deny that being existent is grounded in any kind of accident, such as an entity (maʿnā) of existence inherent in existent things. Thus, through their theory of states, the Basran Muʿtazilites clearly acknowledge that being existent is something distinct from what things are, but they are reluctant to postulate any distinct entity of existence (wujūd) that belongs to things extrinsically (Zamboni 2023).

There are many different reactions to the Basran Muʿtazilite metaphysics of non-existent objects and states even within the Muʿtazilite school. However, both modern and medieval scholars typically oppose it to the metaphysics of the Ashʿarite tradition of kalām. According to the Ashʿarites, things have no metaphysical status before God creates them; they are fully dependent on God both in terms of what they are and that they exist. The Ashʿarites deny any extensional difference between the reality of things and their existence, asserting that only existent things are real. In response to the Basran discussion of intentionality, the Ashʿarites argue that we conceive of non-existent things “on the supposition of their existence (ʿalā taqdīr al-wujūd)”, although it is not entirely clear what they mean by that (Frank 2000).

Going beyond that, the Ashʿarites clearly deny that being existent is something distinct from what things are in themselves. Even those among the Ashʿarites who partially accept the theory of states (aḥwāl), such as Abū al-Maʿālī al-Juwaynī (d. 1085), categorically deny that being existent is such a state. In response to the common argument, typically used to support the reality of a state, which posits an obvious similarity between the notions of existence in the sentences “Human beings exist” and “Cups exist”, the Ashʿarites argue that the similarity is merely verbal (lafẓī) and has no correspondence in the real world (Benevich 2018c; for more on Ashʿarite ontology, see Frank 1999 and Frank 2004). Thus, for the Ashʿarites there is no distinction between the essence of things and their existence whatsoever.

4. Avicenna on Essence and Existence

Despite the presence of an extensive discussion of the relationship between things and their existence in classical kalām, the main historiographical reason for why contemporary scholarship regards the issue of essence and existence among the main contributions of Islamic philosophy to the history of philosophy, without any doubt, is Avicenna’s analysis of essence and existence and its impact on the later tradition.

Avicenna made the distinction between essence, quiddity, or the reality and nature of something (his Arabic notions for these are dhāt, māhiyya, ḥaqīqa, and ṭabīʿa; see Goichon 1937: 30–32), on the one hand, and its existence (wujūd), on the other hand, the central feature of his metaphysics. His main argument in favor of the distinction between essence and existence is that we can know what things are (human beings, horses, triangles) without knowing whether they exist. This argument relies on a conceptual test that is highly characteristic of Avicenna’s type of essentialism (Benevich 2018a and 2022). Simply stated, Avicenna’s conceptual test posits that if x is essential for y, then we cannot conceive of x without conceiving of y. Conversely, if we can conceive of x without y, y is not essential for x; y is distinct from x and extrinsic to it. Thus, insofar as we can conceive of things without knowing whether they exist or not, their existence is distinct from their essence (Avicenna, Remarks and Admonitions, 121).

Avicenna extensively argues against the position of early falsafa and the Ashʿarite scholars of kalām that “to be” means “to be something”. He labels this position as stating the equivocity of existence (al-ishtirāk al-lafẓī). Philosophers who accept the equivocity of existence believe that, in each case, “to exist” means something different. For a horse, to exist means to exist as a horse; for Socrates, to exist means to exist as Socrates. Avicenna denies the equivocity of existence. He employs an argument similar to the conceptual test we have just seen above: If “to be” or “to exist” had the same meaning as “to be something”, then saying that horses exist would be semantically tantamount to saying that horses are horses. This is not true. Therefore, “to exist” cannot be identical to being something, that is, to having a certain essence ([HA], 3: T3).

In both of these arguments, we can observe how Avicenna transitions from a conceptual level of analysis to conclusions about reality. The presence of a conceptual distinction between two meanings (essence and existence) leads Avicenna to the conclusion that there is a real distinction. However, interpreting Avicenna’s distinction between essence and existence as a real distinction should not lead us to think that he accepts that essences have or could have some kind of ontological status beyond being existent. Avicenna may derive a real distinction between essence and existence from the analysis of the corresponding meanings, but he never establishes an extensional distinction between the two.

Indeed, despite disagreeing with the Ashʿarites on the meaning of existence and “being something” (shayʾiyya), Avicenna agrees with them that things are what they are if and only if they exist (Wisnovsky 2000; Druart 2001). Thus, Avicenna is not ready to concur with the Basran Muʿtazilites that essences already exist in a certain manner even before God brings them into existence. He argues that nothing can have any kind of reality without being existent.

In the previous section, we observed that the Muʿtazilites argued that non-existent things are real because we can have an intentional relation to them. However, for Avicenna, intentionality is primarily directed towards mental beings rather than anything outside the mind. When I think of a phoenix, for instance, the intentional object of my thought is a phoenix in my mind, not a phoenix outside my mind (Zarepour forthcoming).

Avicenna’s philosophy of mind is in agreement with his logical analysis. According to Avicenna, every affirmative proposition of the form “S is P” has existential import. This is because P, as an affirmative predicate, carries existential significance (wujūdī). For Avicenna, affirmative predication literally means that a predicate exists in the subject. Therefore, Avicenna argues, the subject must also be something existent, as a predicate cannot exist in nothing. Consequently, every affirmative predication implies an existent subject. Now, non-existent things do not exist outside the mind; therefore, they must exist inside the mind. As Avicenna puts it, affirmative predication implies that the predicate exists at least inside the mind (Avicenna, Healing, Metaphysics 1.5).

Thus, whenever we think of an essence or predicate something of an essence, we are attributing something to an existent object. If that essence does not exist in the extramental reality, it exists within the mind. This represents another crucial innovation in Avicenna’s metaphysics, namely, a doctrine of mental existence (wujūd dhihnī). Just as the essences of things can be instantiated outside the mind, they can also exist within our minds whenever we conceive of them (Black 1997 and 1999). The doctrine of mental existence helps Avicenna maintain the extensional identity between essence and existence, in agreement with the Ashʿarite approach.

That said, there are a few elements in Avicenna’s conception of the relationship between essence and existence that strongly resemble Basran Muʿtazilite views. For instance, despite stating that the essence of things must exist either inside or outside the mind, Avicenna also accepts that there is a way of considering essences in themselves with no regard to their existence whatsoever. If we take horseness qua horseness, for example, it has no relation to whether it exists in our minds as a universal, outside our minds as something particular, or does not exist at all (Avicenna, Healing, Metaphysics 5.1). This theory is sometimes referred to as Avicenna’s doctrine of pure quiddity or the theory of neutrality of essence towards existence. In the later tradition, it has become known as the doctrine of common nature (natura communis in Latin and kullī ṭabīʿī in Arabic). The doctrine of pure quiddity pushes the Avicennan understanding of essences towards Muʿtazilite Meinongianism and some kind of third-realm ontology, at least according to some commentators. For these commentators, Avicenna accepts a doctrine of the priority of essence over mental and concrete existence (note, however, that not all commentators agree that the priority in question, which they accept, translates into a third-realm). In this context, Avicenna’s theory of pure quiddity is often compared with a later medieval doctrine of esse essentiae (see further De Libera 1996 and 1999; Porro 2002; Janos 2020).

Other commentators understand the status of pure quiddity in Avicenna differently. They emphasize that whenever Avicenna talks about pure quiddity or the ontological status of pure quiddity, which he calls “divine existence” (wujūd ilāhī), he means that pure quiddities are immanent in their instantiations (Benevich 2015; Avicenna inherits the notion from Yaḥyā ibn ʿAdī; see further Rashed 2004). Indeed, Avicenna does not shy away from simplistic mereological language when describing the relationship between an essence and its instantiation. The essence is a part of the whole individual, he says (Avicenna, Healing, Metaphysics 5.1). Parts clearly have some kind of priority over the whole, as you need the parts for the existence of the whole—another argument in favor of ascribing the doctrine of the priority of essence to Avicenna (cf. Menn 2013: 156). However, one could reply that if an essence, as a part of the whole individual, were ontologically prior to the individual, then it would be completely independent of it. For instance, one could imagine a possible world in which the pure essence of horseness that belongs to Bucephalus belonged to Marengo (Napoleon’s horse). This would violate the necessary identity between Bucephalus and its essence, which Avicenna definitely accepts as a consequence of his de re essentialism (Benevich 2022). Therefore, the pure essence of horseness that belongs to Bucephalus exists only insofar as it is instantiated in Bucephalus. Thus, Bucephalus’s pure horseness cannot be simply ontologically prior to Bucephalus itself. A more accurate way of expressing Avicenna’s doctrine of pure quiddity may be to say that pure quiddities, such as horseness qua horseness, have essential (amounting to definitional or logical) priority over their instantiations, but they are not ontologically prior to them. On this interpretation, Avicenna does not accept anything similar to the Muʿtazilite third-realm ontology or the later Latin esse essentiae (Druart 2001; McGinnis 2007; Bertolacci 2012; Lizzini, 2014; Benevich 2019).

Whether Avicenna’s pure quiddities push him in the Muʿtazilite-Meinongian direction or not, we can observe that he definitely agrees with the Muʿtazilites on another issue—that things are what they are independently of God. According to Avicenna, God has no effect on essences. Taking the example of the number four, Avicenna argues that if there were someone who made four, for instance, an even number, then we could imagine a possible world in which that someone would be absent, and the number four would not be even. This scenario, however, contradicts the truth of the proposition “Necessarily, four is an even number”, implying that four is an even number in all possible worlds. Therefore, God has no influence on whether four is even or not; four is essentially an even number, independently of God ([HA], 4: T6).

Avicenna very clearly distinguishes between the causes of an essence qua essence and the causes of its existence (Avicenna, Remarks and Admonitions, 121). Consequently, the only influence that God has is to bring essences into existence. This division of labor is, in fact, the most crucial metaphysical consequence of Avicenna’s distinction between essence and existence. Since essences are distinct from their existence, Avicenna easily problematizes the modalities of the relationship between the two. According to Avicenna, all things either necessarily exist by virtue of themselves (their essence) or contingently exist by virtue of themselves and necessarily exist through another. The latter category encompasses all things apart from God and possesses a curious modal status—it is simultaneously necessary and contingent, viewed from two different perspectives. For instance, if you isolate the essence of Bucephalus, nothing about it implies that it exists. However, if you consider the essence of Bucephalus as part of the global picture—that is, with all causes leading to the existence of Bucephalus, ultimately tracing back to God—then the existence of Bucephalus becomes necessary. Avicenna, a necessitarian, accepts that everything that exists does so necessarily. In his terms, existence is a necessary concomitant (lāzim) of essences (Avicenna, Healing, Metaphysics 1.5). This implies that existence, though distinct from and extrinsic to essence, is still a necessary attribute of essence. Avicenna acknowledges that once there is an essence, it exists necessarily, even if existence is not essential to it (Richardson 2014; Morvarid manuscript; Kaukua forthcoming).

The only case in Avicenna’s metaphysics where something exists through itself is God, the Necessary Existent in Itself (wājib al-wujūd bi-dhātihi). The Necessary Existent is also the only instance in which essence and existence are identical, as God’s essence confines itself to being existent (Bertolacci 2012; Mayer 2003; Adamson 2013a; Zarepour 2022). Avicenna argues that if God’s essence were distinct from His existence, it would imply that it causes its own existence (all other options would fail to account for God’s unique status as the Necessary Existent). However, Avicenna argues, nothing can be such that it causes its own existence. For something to be a cause, it needs to already exist. In God’s case, it would mean that God’s essence already exists before causing its own existence (Avicenna, Remarks and Admonitions, 125). Clearly, this is absurd, or, even worse, it introduces a danger of infinite regress as we can start asking what caused that second-order existence that God’s essence had before causing its own existence—and so on ad infinitum. Thus, within the context of the discussion of God’s essence, Avicenna clearly denies the priority of essence over existence, even if it is just the causal priority that he discusses here.

If God’s essence is pure existence, then how is the existence of Bucephalus, for example, not identical with God? We cannot introduce any qualitative distinction between God’s existence and the existence of Bucephalus to explain the numerical distinction between them because the presence of any additional qualities in God’s existence would violate its simplicity. This violation, in turn, would compromise its unique and necessary status (Mayer 2003). To solve this problem, Avicenna introduces one last twist to his doctrine of essence and existence: the doctrine of the modulation or analogy of existence (tashkīk al-wujūd). This doctrine derives historically from the Aristotelian pros hen predication, which Avicenna understands as something falling in between purely equivocal and univocal predication (Treiger 2012). Thus, according to Avicenna, existence is neither an equivocal notion, as we saw above, nor an entirely univocal one. Different types of existence vary in accordance with the ontological status of the things that exist (Druart 2014; De Haan 2015; Janos 2020, 2022a, 2022b; Zamboni 2020). For instance, the existence of substances differs from the existence of accidents. In the same vein, the existence of God differs from the existence of Bucephalus—not qualitatively, but by way of modulation or analogy. Avicenna’s analogy of existence shows that he, despite accepting a strict distinction between essence and existence, still sees a close link between the essence of a thing and the type of existence that it has.

5. Realism and Conceptualism After Avicenna

One of the striking features of Avicenna’s theory of essence and existence is his assumption that the difference in meaning between essence and existence leads to a distinction in reality. We have seen in the previous section that both of Avicenna’s main arguments in favor of the distinction between essence and existence are based on the conceptual difference between what something is and the fact that it is. Avicenna does not present a clear-cut argument in favor of a real distinction between essence and existence. The majority of post-Avicennan philosophers notice this issue with Avicenna’s theory. Consequently, they often accept the conceptual distinction between essence and existence but reject the idea that what things are is different from the fact that they are in extramental reality (Wisnovsky 2011; Eichner 2011; Benevich 2017; Zamboni 2023).

The reasons for denying any real distinction between essence and existence revolve around the issues that arise when considering both the essence of something and its existence as two real entities outside the mind—something akin to two pieces of Lego that are joined together when something comes into being. As innocent as this picture may seem, it implies salient metaphysical issues regarding the ontological status of these two pieces of Lego when analyzed separately. Take, for instance, the essence in isolation from its existence. What is the status of this essence? We cannot say that it does not exist yet because that would imply that existence as an attribute is attached to something non-existent. However, if we say that the essence exists, then we ascribe some kind of second-order existence to the essence before it exists. This is absurd in itself and leads to an infinite regress, as we can continue inquiring about the ontological status of the essence taken in isolation from the second-order existence, and so on ad infinitum. Avicenna addressed a similar priority problem in his discussion of whether God’s essence is distinct from its existence, as we saw in the previous section. Now, the same issue is applied to contingent beings as well. This argument against the real distinction between essence and existence can be found, for instance, in the treatises of ʿUmar al-Khayyām (d. 1123–24) and Athīr al-Dīn al-Abharī (d. 1264) ([HA], 2: T11, T45).

Another way to encounter a similar issue with the infinite regress is to focus on the side of existence, taken in isolation from the essence to which it belongs. If existence is genuinely distinct in the extramental world, should we not say that existence exists itself—just like anything else in the world? However, accepting that existence exists implies that it has a second-order existence. This leads to an infinite regress, as we can pose the same question regarding the second-order existence—and so on ad infinitum. Al-Khayyām, once again, stands among the post-Avicennan philosophers proposing this argument ([HA], 2: T8).

Another, similar argument involves applying the logic of Avicenna’s argument from conceivability to existence itself. If existence is something distinct from essence, then, just as we could conceive of the essence of a triangle while doubting that it exists, we could also conceive of the essence of existence itself while doubting that it exists. Hence, we could argue that, insofar as we can conceive of the essence of existence without some kind of second-order existence belonging to it, there is a real distinction between existence itself and the second-order existence that belongs to it. Consequently, we would apply the same conceivability test to the second-order existence—and so on ad infinitum. The most famous proponent of this argument is also the most famous opponent of the distinction between essence and existence in post-Avicennan philosophy, the aforementioned Shihāb al-Dīn al-Suhrawardī ([HA], 2: T38–T40).

As a result of these arguments, the majority of post-Avicennan philosophers reject that Avicenna’s conceptual test implies any real distinction between essence and existence or that there is such a distinction in the first place. I will refer to these philosophers as the “conceptualists”. For the conceptualists, there is no such thing as existence outside the mind. Rather, the conceptualists argue that “to exist” means to “be instantiated” and is applied to concepts in our minds when we, for instance, say that the notion of a horse has real correspondents in the world (e.g., al-Khayyām in [HA], 2: T9).

For the conceptualists, existence as such is not anything real in the world; there are only the objects themselves. In a move that can be interpreted as a return to al-Fārābī’s first sense of existence, al-Suhrawardī argues that existence is a “secondary intelligible”—that is, a notion that can be applied only to other notions in the mind, those that are called “primary intelligibles”. Only primary intelligibles, such as the notion of “white”, refer to real entities outside the mind. Secondary intelligibles, such as “existence”, fail to refer to anything extramentally real. One may ask how this does not violate the truth conditions of their predication. Al-Suhrawardī replies that when we say, for instance, that Socrates is an individual, we say something that is true, but there is no such thing as “individuality” outside the mind ([HA], 2: T36). For al-Suhrawardī, in some sense, all conceptual considerations (iʿtibārāt dhiniyya), including existence, are epistemically grounded in reality despite not having any distinct reality outside the mind (Kaukua 2020). Thus, the conceptualists conclude that, despite meaning two different things, essence and existence refer to one and the same concrete being (huwiyya)—another notion that they draw from the tradition of early falsafa but give it a new meaning ([HA], 2: T37, T46).

There are few post-Avicennan philosophers who appear to resist these conceptualist tendencies and remain faithful to Avicenna’s real distinction between essence and existence (henceforth called “realists”). The realists employ several strategies to resist the arguments of the conceptualists. For instance, on the side of existence, they attempt to avoid the infinite regress by differentiating between two types of predication. One type of predication implies attribution. We say that, for instance, an apple is red because the attribute of redness belongs to it. However, when we look at redness itself, we can also say that it is red, yet not in virtue of any further redness that belongs to it. Similarly, when we say that something exists, we attribute existence to it. However, when we say that existence exists (something Avicenna himself would probably simply deem unintelligible), we do not need to attribute any further, second-order existence to existence. Existence exists through itself ([HA], 2: T12, T14).

A potentially more convincing solution on behalf of the realist is a partial abandoning of the reality of existence outside the mind. The core idea in this context is something that may be referred to as the “non-entitativity of existence”. The non-entitativity of existence means that existence is not an attribute or an accident that resides in essence in the same way as redness is an accident that resides in an apple. Existence is not an entity as such. Rather, existence is being existent (mawjūdiyya), the realization (taḥaqquq), or the occurrence (ḥusūl) of entities. Therefore, we do not need to attribute any further existence to existence since it is not an entity in the first place. This solution can be attributed to Avicenna’s own disciple Bahmanyār (d. 1044) as well as to the most influential proponent of the real distinction between essence and existence after Avicenna, Fakhr al-Dīn al-Rāzī ([HA], 2: T5, T27). In many ways, this solution is reminiscent of the classical Basran Muʿtazilite position, which regards being existent as a state (ḥāl) that is distinct from what objects are in themselves and yet has no grounding attribute of existence behind it (Zamboni 2023).

Still, Fakhr al-Dīn’s most influential contribution to the defense of the real distinction between essence and existence concerns the side of essence, not the side of existence. In response to the priority issues outlined above, Fakhr al-Dīn most decisively bites the bullet and accepts that essences are prior to their existence. He refuses, however, to accept that the priority of essences over existence pushes him to affirm that they either exist or do not exist before existence attaches to them (with both options leading to problems we observed above). For Fakhr al-Dīn, applying either existence or non-existence to the essences considered in themselves is a category mistake. Essences are prior to their existence in themselves (fī anfusihim) and insofar as they are essences (min ḥaythu hiya hiya)—not insofar as they have some kind of ontological status ([HA], 2: T22–24). What Fakhr al-Dīn probably means by this is some kind of essential (or definitional) priority of essences over their individual instantiations, without any ontological priority implied. This solution is akin to what we saw Avicenna suggested himself in the previous section (at least according to some commentators). It is also closely connected to Avicenna’s own statement that applying the notions of numerical identify and non-identity to essences taken in themselves is a category mistake (Avicenna, Healing, Metaphysics, 5.1).

Fakhr al-Dīn is very consistent about his acceptance of the priority of essence over existence. For instance, he applies this principle to rule out one exception from the distinction between essence and existence that Avicenna himself was ready to make: the case of God’s essence. Avicenna suggested that God’s essence cannot be distinct from God’s existence because to cause its own existence, it would need to be prior to it. However, Fakhr al-Dīn is more than happy to accept that God’s essence is prior to God’s existence—just as the essence of anything else is prior to its own existence. God’s case is unique because God’s essence causes its own existence, unlike in the case of everything else when essences merely receive existence from external causes ([HA], 9: T29).

For Fakhr al-Dīn, there is no difference between God and contingent beings in terms of existence. Fakhr al-Dīn, in fact, is a very consistent defender of the position of the univocity of existence. “Existence” refers to one and the same phenomenon of ontological presence in all cases, including God. What is different are essences, not existence.

That said, Fakhr al-Dīn’s approach to God’s essence and existence remains a minority view in the first two centuries after Avicenna’s death. The majority of post-Avicennan philosophers accept Avicenna’s explanation of God’s existence based on the notion of the analogy or modulation of existence (tashkīk al-wujūd). This is mostly due to the influence of al-Suhrawardī, who develops a philosophical idea that things can be numerically distinct while they have all the same qualities, merely because they have those qualities to a different extent or grade. This way, the post-Avicennan proponents of the Avicennan view that God’s essence is pure existence manage to sustain a numerical distinction between God’s existence and the existence of contingent beings within the universe without violating the principle of the identity of indiscernibles (Benevich 2020a and 2020b).

The doctrine of the analogy or modulation of existence helps the conceptualists solve one important issue that arises from accepting Avicenna’s view that God’s essence is existence. If conceptualism is correct, existence is a secondary intelligible, and there is no such thing as existence outside our minds, then how can Avicenna be right in saying that God is existence? In response, most conceptualists are willing to make an exception for God. For them, God is the only real instantiation of existence (wujūd) outside the mind.

At least since Naṣīr al-Dīn al-Ṭūsī (d. 1274), Islamic philosophers distinguish between two different ways of analyzing existence. On the one hand, we can take existence in the absolute sense (wujūd muṭlaq), meaning any kind of ontological presence in the world. In this sense, all things partake in existence; they all exist in some sense. This notion of existence merely designates a concept in our minds. Existence, taken in the absolute sense, is merely a conceptual consideration (iʿtibār dhihnī) or a secondary intention (maʿqūl thānī)—whether applied to God or to a cup on the table. When we say that something exists—God or a cup—we mean that a primary notion (God or a cup) has an instantiation.

However, we can also look at existence as a modulated term (bi-l-tashkīk). In this sense, existence applies to different things differently. God is the paradigm case of existence, while everything else receives existence in gradation. Now, it is that modulated kind of existence that constitutes the divine essence. God’s special kind of existence is God’s essence (wujūd khāṣṣ)—a notion Avicenna himself used to designate essence (Avicenna, Healing, Metaphysics, 1.5). In fact, even for all other things, modulated existence appears to be identical with their essences, albeit probably not in the same sense as for God ([HA], 9: T56; see further Pourjavady 2011 and 2017 on the various interpretations of this move in the Safavid period of Islamic philosophy).

6. Primacy of Essence vs. Primacy of Existence in Later Islamic Metaphysics

As we observed in the previous section, considering essence and existence as two pieces of Lego that need to be brought together in the process of creation for anything to come into being leads to issues regarding the ontological status of either piece of Lego in isolation from the other. The core tendency behind the predominance of conceptualism in the first two centuries of post-Avicennan philosophy is an attempt to solve those issues by doing away with the notion of existence outside the mind, one way or another. For the conceptualists, the only entities outside the mind are the essences of things. Existence merely is a conceptual consideration (iʿtibār dhihnī) or a secondary intention (maʿqūl thānī). No existence, no problems.

However, starting from the thirteenth century, we can observe the emergence and development of an opposite tendency. This tendency, instead of doing away with existence, does away with the essences of things. The most famous representative of this approach to essence and existence is a later philosopher, Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Shīrāzī, better known as Mullā Ṣadrā. He believes that the essences of things are sheer conceptual considerations of our minds. In reality, there is existence alone. When we look at the world, we distinguish between “human” and “horse”. In reality, however, the world is a continuous flow of unified existence. “Humans” and “horses” are just the way the world appears to us. In reality, again, there are no distinct humans and horses, only unified existence. Based on the aforementioned doctrine of the analogy of existence (tashkīk al-wujūd), Mullā Ṣadrā argues that, if anything at all, we can distinguish between different gradations of existence in reality, but not between different essences (Rahman 1975; Rizvi 2003 and 2009; Kalin 2010).

The Sadrian existence-based ontological monism is a position radically opposed to the conceptualism of the earlier post-Avicennan philosophers, such as al-Suhrawardī. For al-Suhrawardī, it is existence that is just a notion which we use to account for real things; essences are real. For Ṣadrā, it is the other way round. The radical split between these two tendencies in approaching essence and existence in post-Avicennan Islamic philosophy is usually referred to as the debate between those who accept the primacy of essence (aṣālat al-māhiyya), such as al-Suhrawardī, and those who accept the primacy of existence (aṣālat al-wujūd), such as Mullā Ṣadrā.

The implications of the split between the doctrine of the primacy of essence and the primacy of existence can be best explained if we look back at the old question of whether God creates essences. In the previous sections, we have seen the Basran Muʿtazilite position stating that things are what they are independently of God. We have also seen Avicenna accepting the doctrine of essential independence—the idea that essences are necessarily what they are independently of God. For Avicenna, God’s task was to make essences exist, not to make them essences.

In the post-Avicennan tradition, Avicenna’s view was quickly associated with the Muʿtazilites, and both doctrines were rejected altogether. One of Avicenna’s core arguments, as observed above, was that if someone made four an even number, in the absence of that someone, it would be possible that four is not an even number. Saʿad al-Dīn al-Taftazānī (d. 1390) replies to this argument by drawing a difference between two kinds of negation. It is one thing to say that four would not be an even number. It is another thing to say that four would be a non-even number. The first proposition is true. If someone makes four to be an even number, then in the absence of that someone, there is no four and, hence, four is not an even number. The second, metathetic proposition, however, is false as it accepts that there would still be four and it would be a non-even number. For al-Taftazānī, Avicenna’s argument confuses the two types of negation. Accepting that God made four four leads to accepting the first type of negation only (in the absence of God, there is no four, and, hence, it is not even), but not the metathetic type of negation (in the absence of God, four is a non-even number). Based on this and similar arguments, the doctrine of the “creation of essence” (jaʿl al-mahiyya) is commonly accepted in the post-Avicennan tradition, both by authors who generally present themselves as anti-Avicennists and Avicennists (Ibrahim 2020).

Turning back to Mullā Ṣadrā and the doctrine of the primacy of existence, we can now see its implications. Mullā Ṣadrā rejects the traditional view that God creates essences, which had become mainstream by his time. Instead, Ṣadrā suggests that God creates existence. He does not mean it in the same sense as Avicenna did. Whichever way we understand Avicenna’s doctrine of the creation of existent things, it must preserve the reality of both essence and existence. One could say, for instance, that Avicenna’s God creates the existence of a cup in the first place, and—by implication—its essence as well (it would work at least for those commentators who reject the priority of essence over existence for Avicenna). On the contrary, for Ṣadrā, God just creates existence. As for the essence, there is nothing to create there in the first place, since all essences merely are conceptual considerations (Ibrahim 2020).

The historical roots of Ṣadrian doctrine of the primacy of existence and his existence-based ontological monism lie in the works of the Sufi philosophers Ibn ʿArabī and Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Qūnawī. This tradition establishes universal monism through the unity of existence (waḥdat al-wujūd). For the Sufis, God’s existence, in fact, is the only existence in the world. Everything other than God is a mere manifestation of His existence (Chittick 1981 and 1989).

The tradition of ontological monism gradually impacts Islamic metaphysics of essence and existence after the fourteenth century. Jalāl al-Dīn al-Dawānī (d. 1502) argues, for instance, that God is the only existence (wujūd) in the world. Everything else is “existent” (mawjūd). Created things are, in a sense, derivatives of God’s existence without having any reality of their own. This way of expressing himself has led to al-Dawānī’s rival, Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Dashtakī (d. 1498), accusing al-Dawānī of mixing up philosophical and Sufi concepts. However, describing al-Dawānī simply as an ontological monist is problematic (Pourjavady 2017). Similarly, al-Dawānī’s views on the creation of essences may be interpreted as aligning with Mullā Ṣadrā’s direction, but there seem to have been different interpretations of al-Dawānī’s position regarding the creation of essence already in the Islamic philosophical tradition itself (Ibrahim 2020).

Mullā Ṣadrā’s doctrine of the primacy of existence signifies an important turn in the history of the analysis of essence and existence in Islamic philosophy. It continues to define the ways of Islamic metaphysics in the modern period until our days (Pourjavady 2019).

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