Authority

First published Fri Jul 2, 2004; substantive revision Tue Oct 7, 2025

Large social groups face many grave problems, such as violence, injustice, disorder, public bads, and war, that require a coordinated collective response. Because disagreement about the nature of and solutions to these problems is pervasive, mounting any such response is difficult in the absence of an authority empowered to issue and enforce coordinating directives. The basic question of political authority asks whether anyone has the right to impose such directives, and if so, under what conditions.

Some anarchist philosophers have thought that political authority is neither necessary nor sufficient for solving the social problems above. Indeed, some think that political authority is counterproductive because it debars better strategies for solving them (e.g. Marx and Engels 1846 [1972: 146–202] and Huemer 2012). This entry surveys the main frameworks that philosophers have developed in defense of a positive, non-anarchistic answer to the basic question of political authority. To this end, we discuss different concepts of the political authority’s right to impose directives on others (part 1) as well as different conceptions of who has the right and how it is grounded (part 2). In a supplement on legitimate political authority in international institutions, we highlight distinctive issues that arise when the basic question of political authority is posed at levels beyond the nation-state.

1. Clarifying the Idea of Political Authority and Related Notions

Most contemporary political philosophers distinguish the non-normative, descriptive notion of de facto authority from the normative notion of authority, and they accord explanatory priority to the latter (Raz 1986: 25–28). On this view, to say that the state is a de facto authority is to say that the state maintains public order and it issues commands and makes rules that are generally obeyed by subjects because many of them (or some important subset of them such as state officials) think of it as having authority in the normative sense.

Note that many theorists outside of political philosophy tend to focus on the conditions in which citizens by and large accept the state’s authority in the normative sense. Reflecting this focus, such theorists oftentimes use the term “legitimate authority” to refer to a polity that political philosophers would characterize as a de facto authority (Weber 1918).

Here, we focus on the question of political authority as construed by the bulk of contemporary political philosophers. This question queries the conditions, if any, in which the state has authority in the normative sense over its members.

1.1 Three Concepts of Political Authority

We can usefully distinguish theoretical authorities from practical authorities. A theoretical authority’s judgment (e.g., A’s doctor’s judgment about a medical diagnosis) is a reason to adopt the belief expressed by the judgment. By contrast, a practical authority issues directives that are reasons for action rather than belief.

Some have argued that the idea of practical authority is incoherent and so they have opted for the idea that political authorities are theoretical authorities regarding the existence and nature of the duties and reasons for action that people have (Hurd 2001). This entry sets aside accounts that construe political authority as a species of theoretical authority, focusing instead on the following three commonly presupposed concepts: political authority as (1) the justified issuance and coercive enforcement of directives (the liberty to rule); (2) the normative power to impose duties, and (3) the right to rule. These three concepts respectively refer to three different normative statuses.

The first concept specifies the status of being justified in the governing practice of issuing directives and coercively enforcing them, irrespective of whether anyone is duty-bound to act as directed or to refrain from interfering with the state’s enforcement efforts (Ladenson 1980).

The second concept appeals to the idea of a normative power. A normative power is an agent’s ability to alter her own or others’ normative statuses – i.e., others’ profiles of rights, duties, normative powers, and liberties – by way of following some specified procedure. For example, by promising, I can impose a duty on myself, and by consenting to someone’s using something of mine, I can give them a permission to use it where before they had none.The second concept of political authority refers to the normative power to impose moral duties by issuing directives – specifically, duties to perform the directed acts, and a further duty not to interfere with the authority’s enforcement of its directives. For example, a political authority might enact a speed limit of 55 mph on the highway, thereby imposing a duty on its subjects to keep to that limit as well as a duty not to interfere with the authority’s enforcement of the limit.

A variation of this second concept holds that there is only a duty not to interfere that stops short of a duty of obedience (Morris 1998 and Edmundson 1988). While a duty to obey seems to imply a duty not to interfere, there are cases of duties of non-interference that are not duties to obey, such as the duties of foreign powers not to interfere in the activities of a legitimate state. Furthermore, the duty to obey is clearly the more contentious issue in the question of authority since it requires that one make one’s actions conform to the specific directives of the authority.

The idea of a claim-right is integral to the third concept of political authority. According to this idea, a necessary correlate of A’s claim-right to phi (say, A’s claim-right to the use of Blackacre) is a duty or set of duties binding on others that supports or facilitates A’s realization of the claim-right (say, the duty not to interfere with A’s use of Blackacre). According to the third concept of political authority, to say that the state has legitimate authority is to say that it has authority in the first two senses described above. It is (a) justified in issuing and coercively enforcing its directives and (b) it has the normative power to issue directives to its subjects and thereby impose duties on them. In addition, (c) it has a claim-right to rule that correlates to its subjects’ duties as specified in (b).

Each of these three concepts describes an aspect of the normative status typically claimed by or often associated with political authorities. As we will see, some theorists hold that the third concept describes a higher form of political community, because such authority involves the mutual recognition of rulers and subjects as morally free and equal (e.g., Simmons 2001; Darwall 2010; and Christiano 2008). Others focus on the concept of authority as normative power (e.g. Enoch 2011and Raz 2010: 292). And yet others forefront the concept of authority as a liberty to issue and coercively enforce directives (Ladenson 1980 and Buchanan 2002: ch. 4).

To be clear, not all political duties derive from authority. Some are duties to participate in political authority, such as the duty to vote, and some are duties to change political authority, such as the duty of civil disobedience or even rebellion. This entry only addresses duties that derive from political authority. Also, it bears noting that not all authorities are political authorities. Here, we only address political authority.

In general, when we think of a state in a larger system of states, each of these concepts of authority presupposes duties on the part of other states and non-subjects outside the jurisdiction of the relevant state not to interfere with that state’s authoritative actions or with the abilities of subjects to obey (Buchanan 2002).

1.2 The Normative Character of Authoritative Directives

As Robert Paul Wolff puts it: “To claim authority is to claim the right to be obeyed.” (Wolff 1970: 6). Many theorists, including Wolff, interpret this premise to mean that authorities claim that their directives provide subjects with a distinctive kind of reason for action: “Obedience is not a matter of doing what someone tells you to do. It is a matter of doing what he tells you to do because he tells you to do it.” (Id.; see also Raz 1979: 14–15 and Simmons 2016: 6–7 ). Moreover, such theorists hold that an authority is legitimate only insofar as its directives are reasons of the kind that authorities claim, and this premise informs the common understanding of the idea of authority as a normative power. On this view, a legitimate authority has the normative power to generate reasons of the distinctive kind that authorities claim; hence, an authority is not legitimate if its subjects do not have reasons of this kind for following the authority’s directives.

To be clear, the state is rightly satisfied by conformity with its directives. It does not require any particular motivation (see Frick & Viehoff 2023). Nonetheless, the crucial claim that many theorists of authority make is that a state is not a legitimate authority unless it gives its subjects the reasons that it claims to give them. On this view, the state implicitly claims that there is a special normative relationship or a kind of normative community between it and its subjects. Accordingly, a key issue is what these claims come to.

Common ground among most theorists is that the directives of a legitimate authority are content-independent reasons for their subjects. On this view, the duty of the subject is grounded not in the content of the directive itself but in the nature of the source issuing it. If the directive is issued by the appropriate authority and it has the right form, the subject’s reason to follow the directive is automatically generated irrespective of its content (Hart 1982: 254–55 and Sciaraffa 2009).

Some theorists characterize authoritative directives as especially forceful content-independent reasons (Shapiro 2002 and Buchanan 2011). Others argue that such directives are reasons that exclude and replace competing reasons. The intuitive idea is that authoritative directives defeat competing reasons by preempting rather than outweighing them, reflecting the thought that to be obedient is to surrender one’s judgment to an authority (Raz 1986: ch. 3). Of course, a preemptive reason might operate only with a limited scope and thus preempt only some limited set of considerations.

Joseph Raz supplies an influential precisification of this intuitive idea. He argues that a preemptive reason to phi comprises a content-independent reason to phi and a second-order reason (an exclusionary reason) not to act for reasons for or against phi-ing (see Raz 1999: ch. 2 and Raz 2010: 144). On this view, the scope of a preemptive reason is fixed by the comprehensiveness of the set of reasons that it excludes. For example, it might be that the manager of a workplace has authority over employees that is limited to specifying the employee’s duties in the workplace. If so, the employer’s directive to perform some activity in the workplace would preempt some competing reasons for their employees – e.g., that some other activity would be more efficient or fit better with the workplace goals. However, other reasons might be outside the scope of the manager’s authority, e.g., the activity is dangerous or immoral.

Notably, Raz ascribes a highly comprehensive claim to the state (Raz 1999: 150–51). On this view, the state claims that its laws preempt all reasons for action that apply to its citizens unless its laws explicitly state otherwise (e.g. by issuing a directive requiring the subject to act with reasonable care or in the best interests of a beneficiary).

Many who construe obedience in terms of pre-emptive reasons accept Raz’s conception of pre-emption. However, as Raz acknowledges, there might be other ways of making sense of this intuitive idea (Raz 2010: 298; see also Enoch 2012: 23–28; Schauer 1991: ch. 3; and Gur 2018: ch. 7).

2. Theories of the Conditions of Legitimate Political Authority

Thomas Hobbes (1668) and David Hume (1965) have argued that there is a general duty to obey the law or that political authority is generally legitimate as long as the state secures sufficient peace and public benefit. But most theorists argue that legitimate political authority only obtains under more demanding normative conditions. We review here some of the main theories that attempt to explain when a political authority is legitimate, keeping in mind the distinction between the three concepts of authority canvassed above: the liberty to rule, the normative power to impose duties, and the right-to-rule.

2.1 Consent Theory

A. John Simmons (2001) and Leslie Green (1989) assert that all persons possess a right not to be subjected to another’s imposition of duties and that this right can be waived only by way of consent. Locke’s natural right argument is a historical antecedent of this view. Locke argues that each person has an equal natural right to freedom and that this implies that at the age of maturity no one may be subordinated to anyone else’s commands by nature (Locke 1690). For such subordination would violate the equal freedom of the subordinated person.

Two important features of Consent Theory should be noted. The first is that it provides a prima facie plausible account of the state-subject’s duty of obedience correlative to the state’s normative power to impose duties on its subjects by issuing directives that specify those duties. The idea is that consent functions much like a promise, which is a paradigmatic instance of a normative power to impose duties. However, by consenting to the state’s rule, the subject does not only impose a duty on herself to conform to a broad range of the state’s directives. She also imbues the state with a normative power to impose duties on her by issuing such directives, and she transfers some of her original normative power to regulate her life and order her moral relations with others. Second, any plausible consent theory places limits on the scope of this power. For example, Locke holds that such power only extends as far as consent can extend, and he adds that consent cannot empower any authority “to destroy, enslave, or designedly impoverish [its] subjects.” (Locke 1690: ch. 11, [1990, 135]). It is also worth noting that the Consent Theory provides a prima facie plausible account of a necessary condition of the state’s liberty to issue and coercively enforce its directives.

However, the Lockean natural right thesis combined with the further premise that persons rarely consent to the authority of political institutions implies a kind of philosophical anarchism. This variant of anarchism holds that no state is legitimate and perhaps no state can ever be legitimate because the state rarely receives the requisite consent to its authority, and it is difficult to see how the state might be set up in a way that would systematically secure such consent from the population it governs (see Simmons 2001: ch. 6).

2.2 Tacit Consent

Locke (1690), in part desiring to avoid the obvious difficulties of philosophical anarchism, introduced the notion of tacit consent. The possibility of tacit consent allows that one may consent without having to go through the usual motions associated with expression of consent. For example, at a board meeting, one consents tacitly to the chairman’s scheduling a meeting if one says nothing when the chair asks for objections to the proposal. And that tacit consent is valid to the extent that the failure to object is understood as a kind of consent and is voluntary (see Simmons 1976).

The main problem with tacit consent is the problem of interpretation. How does one interpret the actions of another so as to think of them as consenting though they did not explicitly do so? Simmons argues that for behavior to count as tacit consent, it must be explicitly understood by all to be a kind of consent, it must be clear how and when to perform the act or omission that constitutes tacit consent, it must not be difficult to consent, and the costs of dissent must not be prohibitive (see Simmons 1993: 80–90). But it is not obvious that Locke had this in mind.

An alternative to Simmons’s account of the conditions in which it is appropriate to attribute consent is the following: If a person voluntarily resides in a territory over which the state has jurisdiction, and that person benefits from the establishment of the rule of law and all the other amenities the state provides, then that person must know or ought to know that the state’s provision of these benefits depends on the obedience of the members of the society. But if the person now continues to reside voluntarily in the state, that person must know that others expect obedience from him unless he is under some special exemption. He must know or ought to know, in other words, that others can reasonably interpret his voluntary residence as committing him to obedience to the laws of the state. So, we have adequate reason to interpret a person’s continued voluntary residence as a form of consenting to abide by the laws of the state.

David Hume (1965) criticized this interpretive move. He argued that given the extraordinary costs to most people of moving out of the country of their birth, no one can sensibly interpret the voluntary continued residence of a person in a state as a case of tacit consent. He draws an analogy with a person who has been carried involuntarily onto a ship by others and who now finds himself on the ship subject to the commands of the captain and his only alternative is to throw himself into a stormy sea. Hume argues that such a person’s remaining on the ship cannot be interpreted to be consenting to the authority of the captain. The person is merely attempting to avoid the terrible cost of getting off the ship. Similarly, Hume thinks that we cannot interpret the continuing residence of a person in a state as a case of consent to the authority of the state because we have no reason to think that the continuing residence was chosen as a result of reflection on whether it constituted consent.

One might respond that it should be clear to this person that his compliance is expected of him if he remains in the territory. And his remaining in the territory thereby implies that he consents to the authority of the territory. This would seem to be a basis for interpreting the person’s behavior as a case of consent. Hume argues that they should know, but he thinks that this shows that the argument from consent is an idle wheel. He thinks people are obligated because of the public benefit the state brings and the importance of compliance to the production of that benefit.

The consent theorist will not be happy with this response since it seems to bypass the right of each person to decide whether anyone and who may have authority over them. Simmons thinks that there is no necessity for a person to think about their situation in this way and hence the interpretation problem remains alive. We will see more of this problem below in the discussion of the particularity problem.

Hume’s argument also challenges the voluntariness of tacit consent to state authority, but it is not conclusive. In many cases, persons undertake commitments to avoid some terrible cost, but they nonetheless seem to be bound by those commitments. Consider that people commonly consent to pay insurance premiums to ensure that they will have health care when they most need it, and combatants promise to lay down arms on the condition that the opponent will not harm them. We do not think that these undertakings are invalid or that they fail to obligate. So, the fact that the alternative would be terrible is not a reason to think that persons could not undertake commitments to the state by remaining within its borders (see Beran 1987).

An important objection to the idea of tacit consent is that it begs the question about how a state gets its authority. Some argue that a group of persons that has no authority to issue commands in the first place cannot require people to submit to their commands or leave a piece of territory they falsely claim to be under their jurisdiction (Brilmayer 1989 and Wellman 2001). Lea Brilmayer appeals to a modified version of Simmons’s boardroom example to press this point. In the modified version, a window washer swings in and makes the proposal that the chairman advanced in the original example. She contends that it is obvious that the board’s failure to register objections to the window washer’s proposal would not constitute their consent. For only a duly constituted authority is empowered to make such a proposal. But the claim to authority is precisely what tacit consent is supposed to support. So, the tacit consent view seems to beg the question. This criticism is right as far as it goes, but there are two points to note about it.

First, it is not a criticism of Locke since he clearly thinks that tacit consent only legitimates and obligates under conditions where there is a duly constituted authority. Locke thinks that the right to rule of an authority must be traced back to an original act of consent in the state of nature (where there is no prior political authority) to form a political body. That political body then confers, by the consent of all the members, authority on a particular institutional arrangement (as long as it is minimally just). The function of tacit consent as well as the consent of new members is simply to legitimize this already created authority’s rule over new members.

Second, if Locke is right and consent can create authority out of the state of nature, it may be possible for tacit consent to do the same. We can imagine a state of nature scenario where a highly persuasive person gets up amid the chaos and makes a proposal to create the initial political body from the state of nature and then states very clearly that if there are objections, they should be raised without fear. And we can imagine the very same person making a proposal to create the particular structure of authority over the political body and calling for objections in the same way as before. There is no obvious reason why this could not work. Locke did not suggest this, but it does not seem impossible. Indeed, this could even work with a state that has only de facto authority and hence is still in the state of nature for Locke. It would be clear in this case that the consent or tacit consent was being given to the de facto authority, which then turns the de facto authority into a de jure authority.

These two points defeat the argument that tacit consent requires a prior duly constituted authority. What Locke’s picture suggests is that consent, be it tacit or explicit, can be valid as long as the proposal is made when there is no authority already in place. The proposals can be drawn up by someone who has the right to make the proposal. In the state of nature, anyone presumably has this right.

2.3 Functionalist Theories

Consent Theory holds that consent is a necessary condition of the legitimacy of authority, though it need not be a sufficient condition. Thus, this theory attempts to make political authority compatible with due respect for the opinions of its subjects. But we might wonder if it doesn’t go too far. For if consent is a genuinely necessary condition of political authority, then it appears that individuals may have the option of not obeying a perfectly just state that has jurisdiction over the area in which they live. And they may do this on perverse grounds, or they may simply wish to free ride on the benefits that the state confers without having to undertake any of the burdens. How can this withholding of consent be legitimate, and how can it undermine the authority of a just state? It seems that in the effort to express respect for the reasonable opinions of people, consent theory has gone too far in giving respect to immoral, irrational and unprincipled failures of consent (see Raz 2009: 159–63).

Functionalist theories give voice to this concern. Theories of this kind hold that a state is a legitimate political authority insofar as its rule – its issuing and enforcement of directives – is necessary for the realization of certain morally mandatory ends, where securing Lockean freedom is but one possible characterization of these ends. Other proposed morally mandatory ends include: rescue from the perils of the state of nature (Wellman 1996, Hobbes 1668); democratic governance (Christiano 2008); a minimally just system of social cooperation (Buchanan 2002), and a system of property and contract rights necessary for personal freedom (Kant 1797, Stilz 2009). The core premise common to all functionalist theories is that some ends, the morally mandatory ones, are of sufficient moral urgency to justify the state’s authority, irrespective of its subjects’ consent.

Note that this statement of functionalist theory elides the different concepts of political authority. To remedy this, we distinguish two threads of functionalist theory. The first appeals to functionalist considerations to justify the state’s liberty to rule (e.g. Wellman 1996), whereas the second focuses on the subject’s duty to conform to the state’s directives (e.g. Wellman 2001).

2.3.1 Functionalist Theory and the State’s Liberty to Rule

The key premise of any functionalist defense of the state’s liberty to rule is that the state is justified in issuing and enforcing its duties because doing so is necessary to realize urgent politico-moral values – the morally mandatory ends mentioned above. The consent-theorist might argue that functionalist theory is a kind of illicit utilitarianism of rights that purports to justify the violation of persons’ rights against coercive imposition in order to secure the realization of such ends (see Nozick 1974 and Simmons 2001). On this view, the natural rights of persons are side constraints against actions; they are not to be violated without consent even if urgent goods are better protected as a consequence. At this point in the dialectic, one key issue is whether there are side constraints that cannot be overridden without consent, even for the sake of ends, such as the general public’s realization of minimally just terms of social cooperation, Lockean freedom, democratic governance, and so on mentioned above.

In a similar vein, Simmons (2016) marshals his Boundary Problem to embarrass functionalist theory. At the heart of this challenge is an example in which one state involuntarily annexes territory of another and thereafter secures mandatory moral ends for the annexed population. The point of this example is to elicit the intuition that the annexing state’s rule is not justified. On that basis, Simmons argues that something more than functionalist justification must be required to establish the state’s liberty to issue and enforce its directives. For Simmons, this something more is the consent of the state’s subjects. Anything less is not sufficient to overcome the side-constraint established by the equal right to freedom.

One response to this objection accepts the intuition but suggests that it is compatible with the functionalist approach. That is, the functionalist could argue that the intuitive force of Simmons’ involuntary annexation thought experiment derives from the implicit assumption that one of the defeating conditions of functionalist justification is realized. For in the actual world, annexing states invariably treat the annexed population unjustly, and they often generate increased violence and disorder. In a similar vein, one might argue that the intuition reflects the thought that typically any such annexation involves unjustified coercion .

Anna Stilz joins Simmons in the claim that functionalist justification fails to specify a necessary condition of state authority. However, she disagrees with him about the overlooked condition. For Stilz, the key condition is not Lockean consent; rather, it is that the political authority’s rule must not violate its subjects’ political autonomy or, in other words, their interest “in being subject to political institutions that in some way reflect their judgments and priorities.” (Stilz 2019: 28). Stilz’s idea is that unless political institutions reflect one’s judgments and priorities in the appropriate way, then “substantial aspects of one’s life can come to seem hostile, threatening, and completely beyond one’s grasp” and, as a result, “it can become difficult to maintain any sense of oneself as an agent who charts her life in accordance with her own purposes.” (Id. 31). Stilz further argues that democratic rule on its own is not sufficient. An individual governed by democratic institutions might nonetheless be subject to political institutions that do not reflect her judgments and priorities in the requisite way. (Id. 30) According to Stilz, the state’s rule is not justified absent the subject population’s affirmation of their participation in the political community and their acceptance of the higher-order procedures and values that structure that community. (Id. 33) To be clear the requisite affirmation is not consent but rather a kind of alignment between governing institutions and the attitudes of the population it governs. The gist of Stilz’s reply to the functionalist is now in view. In cases of involuntary annexation, the political autonomy legitimacy condition is not met.

However, Stilz complicates her analysis to accommodate the functionalist’s concern with the perverse withholding of consent to state rule. As she puts it: “Where dissenters refuse to acknowledge the requirements of basic justice, to recognize a duty to cooperate in a legitimate state, or to respect others’ equivalent claims to self- determination, then their values and priorities can be overridden without any moral loss” (Id. 40). But of course, the key question is whether one can be a cooperator, as defined by Stilz, and yet fail to affirm the values and procedures of the annexing state that secures some requisite level of procedural and distributive justice for its members. If there is no gap between the conditions in which it is reasonable to withhold affirmation and the conditions of fully just functionalist rule, then it is not clear that Stilz’s account and functionalism meaningfully differ. To see this, if the only time we can reasonably withhold consent is when there is no good functionalist argument for being ruled by certain institutions rather than others, then Stilz’s argument isn’t, in practice, distinguishable from functionalism. At best, the interests Stilz identifies might function as a tie-breaker between two institutions that are equally justified on functionalist grounds.

Here, we see a recent iteration of attempts to navigate two compelling considerations that are often in tension with one another. The first is that persons have a right not to be subject to coercive rule without some sort of consent or consultation, and the second is the concern that the realization of morally urgent ends might be held hostage to the whims of a capricious few who would perversely withhold consent. Functionalist theory accommodates the concern with the perverse withholding of consent, Simmons’s Boundary Problem illustrates the import of consent, and Stilz’s view is an attempt to strike a balance between these two considerations (see also Quong 2019 and Motchoulski 2022).

2.3.2 Functionalist Theory and the Duty to Obey

In addition to identifying conditions in which the state has a liberty to rule, some theorists appeal to functionalist theory to explain why the state’s subjects are duty-bound to conform to its directives. For illustrative purposes, consider the variant of functionalist theory that focuses on the end of securing justice. This variant posits a natural duty of justice that requires persons to promote just institutions, and it also holds that this duty is satisfied by obeying the directives of a reasonably just state (see Rawls 1971: 98ff).

Simmons marshals the Particularity Argument as an objection to functionalist accounts of the duty to obey the state that appeal to a natural duty to support just institutions (see e.g. Simmons 2001: 47–48). As applied to this stripe of functionalist theory, the key premise of the Particularity Argument is that the minimally just state is but one of many just institutions, and the natural duty of justice accords discretion to the subject to choose which of these to support. The idea here is that just as Amnesty International may not require me to pay dues to it regardless of my membership even though these dues would clearly advance the protection of human rights, so the state may not require me to comply with its commands even though such compliance would advance the purposes of justice. Let us suppose that the reasons clearly favor my support of Amnesty International. Intuitively, it still may not require me to lend it support. Only if I have voluntarily joined and voluntarily remain in Amnesty do I have a duty to do what the conditions of membership require. And I am under no obligation to join Amnesty; I may join other organizations to fulfill whatever duties of aid that I have. So, whether I ought to join Amnesty and be subject to membership dues is up to me. In the same way, so the Particularity Argument goes, only if I voluntarily transact to obligate myself to comply with the minimally just state’s commands can I be said to have a duty to support that particular just institution.

The functionalist rejoinder to the Particularity Argument denies that the state’s subjects have discretion to discharge their natural duty of support by supporting institutions other than the state. In this vein, the functionalist theorist might argue that the state does not merely promote justice; it establishes justice. That is, the state determines what justice requires in the relations between individuals by defining the relations of property and exchange as well as the institutions of the criminal law and tort law. To be sure, justice is still an independent standard of assessment on this account. The idea is that one can establish justice by means of many different sets of rules. So, what is just in a particular circumstance will depend in part on the set of rules that the state implements. To the extent that the state determines the basic framework of rules for a society in a minimally just way, it determines which actions are and are not just. Hence, to treat others justly, one must comply with state’s rules that establish this minimally just framework.

More generally, one way to think of the functionalist’s idea of a morally mandatory end (be it securing a stable social order, instituting justice, and so on) is that any end of this kind can only be realized by a collective coordinated response, centralized institutional coordination is the only or best way to secure such requisite coordination, and the end is of sufficient moral urgency to ground a natural duty to support and comply with the directives of any such indispensable coordinating institution. (Waldron 1993: 27–30; Klosko 2019; and Motchoulski 2022). If we think of morally mandatory ends in this way, then the debate between the functionalist and consent theorist becomes a matter of first-order substantive debate about the reach of the functionalists’ morally mandatory ends and how individuals can, and are morally required to, contribute to their realization.

For example, on Simmons’s view, a plurality of values competes with the functionalists’ morally mandatory ends, and in very many cases, the state-subject has the right to organize her life around such competing values rather than any such putatively mandatory end. As he puts it in one passage: “It is not obviously unreasonable (though it may be un- or anti- many other things) to prefer solitude and independence to cooperation. More importantly, it is surely not unreasonable to prefer more limited or less coercive, small-scale forms of cooperation to states (and all that states involve).” (Simmons, 2001: 151).

Moreover, even if we have no choice but to organize our life around certain values, such as the protection of basic rights, there may be many ways of appropriately responding to that value in lieu of obeying a political authority. For example, we might be free to choose either to pay taxes to help fund the welfare state in accordance with the state’s laws or to donate to Amnesty International.

2.3.3 Functionalism and the Principle of Fairness

Christopher Wellman’s brand of functionalist theory forefronts the end of rescuing the state’s citizens from the perils of the state of nature or, in other words, the end of instilling a stable and predictable social order conducive to persons’ security and harmonious cooperation. Wellman argues that although the minimally just state’s liberty to rule is justified by virtue of the fact that it secures this end by issuing and enforcing its directives, this consideration is not sufficient to explain why the state’s subjects are required to comply with the state’s directives. He puts the key issue as follows: “The plain truth is that any given citizen’s behavior typically has no discernible effect on her state’s capacity to perform its functions, and thus it is descriptively inaccurate to suggest that one’s obedience to the law is necessary to secure important benefits” (Wellman 2001: 742; see also Klosko 2019: 36–37).

Wellman’s thought is that the collective rescue of the state’s citizenry from the state of nature is a chore shared by all the state’s citizens and not just its governing officials. On this view, this rescue is achieved by way of a collective effort in which each subject does her part by conforming to the state’s law. In so doing, the citizens collectively realize the stable social order necessary for security and harmonious cooperation. However, as Wellman points out, this collective effort is a negligible contribution case. That is, it is a case in which some good can only be achieved via a collective effort, but at the same time, no individual person’s contribution to the effort makes a difference as to whether or the extent to which the collective effort’s end is realized (see Nefsky 2017). Thus, it is not immediately clear why any state subject would have a reason other than avoiding sanction or the independent merits of the directed action to comply with the state’s directives. For no subject’s compliance or non-compliance with the state’s directives makes a difference as to whether the citizenry is rescued from the perils of the state of nature.

It should be noted that the realization of most any of the various morally mandatory ends that functionalist theorists cite requires a collective effort that faces the problem of negligible contributions. We distinguished three concepts of authority at the outset of this entry, and the second and third concepts imply a duty to obey. The functionalist that adheres to either of these two concepts must explain how the duty to obey arises, which entails at a minimum explaining how subjects come to have a reason to act as the state directs. The issue is that it is not clear that subjects have any reason to contribute to the collective chore that is inevitably necessary to secure any of the functionalist’s morally mandatory ends. Accordingly, any such functionalist explanation of authority, construed in accordance with the second or third concept, is burdened with addressing the problem of negligible contributions.

In response to this problem, Wellman introduces the principle of fairness. This principle holds that anyone who benefits from a reasonably just, rule-based collective effort in which the effort’s contributors constrain their liberty in service of its end is thereby bound to contribute her fair share to that effort in accordance with that effort’s rules. (Cf. Hart 1955: 185) Wellman argues that the subject’s fair share in the collective chore of mutual rescue from the state of nature is compliance with the state’s directives. Thus, the state’s citizens are bound by a weighty moral reason to comply with the minimally just state’s laws, and this reason is grounded in the principle of fairness and the imperative of rescuing one another from the state of nature.

Robert Nozick’s (Nozick 1974: 93) example of a neighborhood public address system illustrates a key line of objection to this fairness-based account of the reason to comply with the state’s laws. In this example, members of a community take turns using a loudspeaker in accordance with the rules of their cooperative scheme, and they do so in order to provide entertainment for the general community. Nozick argues that this example satisfies the conditions that trigger the principle of fairness; it describes a reasonably just rule-based cooperative venture that benefits others, and the contributors to the venture constrain their liberty in order to provide this benefit. And, yet, as Nozick further argues, it would be implausible to insist that the recipients of this benefit are bound by a duty of fairness to contribute to the loudspeaker scheme. For Nozick, this example demonstrates that the principle of fairness is subject to yet a further condition. Namely, the beneficiaries must in some sense accept the benefit of the cooperative scheme if they are to then be bound to contribute their fair share to the cooperative scheme, but such acceptance rarely obtains (see Simmons 2001: ch. 1 and Klosko 2013).

The functionalist’s main response to this objection appeals again to the idea of morally mandatory ends. On this view, morally mandatory ends are unlike the modestly important end realized by the loudspeaker coordination scheme; rather, they are “indispensable for satisfactory lives.” (See Waldron 1993: 27–30 and Klosko 2019: 48). The functionalist further argues that anyone who reaps the benefit of a morally mandatory end-realizing cooperative scheme is thereby bound by the principle of fairness to contribute her fair share to that scheme, irrespective of whether she accepts the benefit (see Wellman 2001; Klosko 2019; and Motchoulski 2022).

A second objection to the functionalist-fairness hybrid theory rests on the premise that the fairness principle applies only to those who free ride on the efforts of others, but it does not extend to those who do not do their part in a collective effort in service of some other urgent moral end. This premise implies that someone who enjoys the benefits of various tax-funded state projects would not violate a principle of fairness by allocating her earnings to some altruistic end, such as funding Amnesty International or Oxfam, rather than to the state’s tax agency. For in so doing, she does not unfairly reap the benefits that others have foregone; rather she uses what she would have paid in taxes to address others’ urgent needs. If this objection goes through, the functionalist-fairness hybrid theory would seem to fall to a variant of the Particularity Argument. Namely, this strategy for explaining subjects’ reasons to obey the law can establish only that the state’s citizens must either contribute their fair share to state-coordinated cooperative efforts that realize a morally mandatory end or redirect that contribution to some other effort of comparable moral worth.

Notably, the functionalist-fairness hybrid account approximates but does not ground a duty to obey the state’s laws, where obedience is understood as acting as the state directs for the reason that the state directs. For at the most fundamental level, the principle of fairness requires that the beneficiary of the state-organized collective effort contribute her fair share to the collective effort, and it is a separate matter whether this fair share requires strict compliance with the state’s directives. For example, a system of taxation that funds various public goods might require a subject to pay more or less than her fair share of taxes (see Klosko 2019: 102–03).

Moreover, this account does not seem to ground a distinctively pre-emptive reason that some theorists (as noted above) associate with the duty to obey a political authority. For the core functionalist premise is that by acting as the state directs, the subject contributes to a collective effort that secures some morally mandatory good. As Leslie Green (1989) and Raz (1989: 1189) have argued, this premise seems to be a basis for an ordinary first-order reason to act as directed that weighs in the balance against rather than excluding and replacing reasons for not acting as directed.

An alternative functionalist response to the problem of negligible contributions relies on the idea of non-individual reasons rather than the principle of fairness. According to this idea, persons are duty-bound to perform their part in any cooperative scheme that is necessary for the realization of ends of the utmost moral urgency, irrespective of whether their individual contribution makes a difference. The core intuition behind this principle is that without it or something like it, sound practical reasoning would often result in very harmful collective action failure (see Nefsky 2017 and Bajaj & Christiano 2025). For without such a principle, practical reason would leave potential contributors bereft of reasons for contributing in the all-too-frequent cases in which a collective effort is necessary to realize some morally urgent good, but no individual contribution, considered in isolation, would make a difference to the effort’s success.

2.4 Instrumentalist Justifications of Political Authority

Robert Paul Wolff (1970) argues that any rational person is bound by an inviolable duty to act on the basis of her own moral assessment of right and wrong in each instance of action. He further argues that any person who complies with authoritative commands on grounds independent of the moral merit of the commanded action thereby violates this duty. Thus, Wolff defends a robust variant of philosophical anarchism according to which political authority conceived in terms of a duty of obedience to the authority is never legitimate. For theories of this kind hold that for any legitimate political authority, there are some circumstances in which the fact that the authority issues a directive is sufficient reason for them to act as directed, irrespective of their beliefs about the action’s merits. Notably, Wolff’s version of philosophical anarchism is even more strident than the variant based in Consent Theory. For the Consent Theorist allows that it is possible to undertake a duty of obedience by consenting to the state’s rule, whereas Wolff argues that the duty of moral autonomy wholesale prohibits obedience to another in any case.

The Normal Justification Thesis (NJT) is the core tenet of Joseph Raz’s instrumentalist response to Wolffian anarchism. The NJT asserts that “the normal way to establish that a person has authority over another person involves showing that the alleged subject is likely better to comply with reasons which apply to him (other than the alleged authoritative directives) if he accepts the directives of the alleged authority as authoritatively binding and tries to follow them, rather than by trying to follow the reasons which apply to him directly.” (Raz 1986: 53).

The NJT presupposes two other theses. The first is the so-called Dependence Thesis which holds that “authoritative directives should be based on reasons which already independently apply to the subjects of the directives and are relevant to their action in the circumstances covered by the directive.” (Raz 1986: 47). For instance, subjects already have reason to give a fair share of resources for the common good. Authorities merely help them comply with these reasons by issuing directives that establish an efficient and fair system of taxation. The second is the Preemption Thesis. It posits that the directives of any authority exclude and replace first-order reasons.

Taken together, the NJT, the Dependence Thesis, and the Preemption Thesis comprise what Raz refers to as the Service Conception. The key idea behind this conception is that the authority’s power to impose duties is grounded by its capacity to issue directives that serve the authority’s subjects in the following sense. The subjects better conform to reasons that apply to them by following the authority’s directives rather than trying to conform to some of their reasons directly. Notably, this strategy generates a piece-meal justification of authority in which only those persons who would do better by following the authority’s directives are bound to do so, and moreover, any such person is only bound to follow those directives that enable her to better conform to her reasons. For this reason, Raz casts doubt on the state’s comprehensive claim to authority over all its subjects and with respect to any subject matter it might address.

Raz further argues that “[a] major, if not the main, factor in establishing the legitimacy of political authorities is their ability to secure coordination” (Raz 2009: 153). Accordingly, he incorporates these functionalist considerations into his instrumentalist framework.

Knowing the limits of my knowledge and understanding and being aware of the danger that my judgment will be affected by bias, and my performance by the weakness of my resolve, I am aware of the possibility that another person, or organization, might be better able to judge when there are sufficient reasons for social coordination to which I should contribute. (Raz 1989: 1192)

The thought is that sources of state directives, such as courts, regulatory bodies, and legislatures, are often better able than most state-subjects to judge when there are sufficient reasons for the state’s subjects to engage in some coordinated collective action.

In summary, the Service Conception brings into view a forceful response to the Wolffian brand of anarchism. According to this response, it is sometimes immoral to insist on acting autonomously when one may actually act worse as a result of acting directly for one’s reasons rather than following the authority’s directives (see Raz 1986: ch. 3). Perhaps in homage to some of Wolff’s concerns about moral autonomy, Raz’s Independence Thesis (Raz 1989: 1182 and Raz 2010: 136–37) introduces a key circumstance in which the NJT is undercut. Namely, a putative authority might satisfy the NJT yet lack the power to impose duties on its subject insofar as the subjects’ acting from her understanding of her reasons is more important than better complying with them. For example, it might be that a team of government psychologists could in theory issue directives that would lead Alf to better friendships than he would choose on his own, but it would nonetheless be better if Alf acted on his own suboptimal understanding of the relevant reasons.

It is worth emphasizing two different ways of thinking about the instrumentalist response to Wolff’s challenge. According to the first, the subject autonomously and justifiably believes that she will better comply with the reasons that apply to her directly if she simply follows the directives (see Placani 2021 and Raz 2010: 147–48). On this understanding, we can autonomously choose to act in ways that involve some suspension of autonomous decision making in particular cases. Both rule following and obedience to authority might reflect such a choice. The key premise is that persons better accord with the duty of autonomy when they act from such higher order autonomous reflection. This is a direct response to Wolff. It accepts a duty of autonomy but asserts that sometimes that duty requires that one autonomously suspend first-order autonomous decision making in particular occasions of action. Alternatively, one might challenge the duty of autonomy altogether. On this view, we might act in accordance with reasons that we are not even aware of and that are only thought by another (in this case the authority). We still act in accordance with this reason because our action is reliably connected with the reason through the authority. But it is not the product of autonomous reflection. To be sure, the reason could be understood as something one might hypothetically autonomously agree to, but actual autonomy is unnecessary. This is a fully external account and rejects the key premise of Wolff’s account.

2.4.1 The Irrationality of Preemption

However we construe Raz’s Service Conception, its power depends essentially on the cogency of the idea of a pre-emptive reason. The question arises, when are our first-order reasons so strongly opposed to the action that we must override the preemptive reason? In the case of rule-following, we sometimes encounter particular instances in which following the rule is counterproductive. How do we determine when we ought to follow the rule and when we ought not to follow the rule? Does such determination involve the very deliberation about particular instances that was meant to be excluded by the rule? Some have argued that rule following cannot be rational since it cannot be rational to ignore the particular facts of each case, and they have leveled this same charge against Raz’s idea of a preemptive reason (see Hurd 2001; cf. Kiesewetter 2022). Raz’s main response to this criticism has been to say that we look for clear cases in which the rule is to be overridden and ignore the other cases and that only by doing this do we best comply with reason. Limiting exceptions to the rule to clear cases obviates the need for deliberation in every case.

2.4.2 The Service Conception and the Right to Rule

Stephen Darwall (2010) posits that A’s possession of authority over B entails that B is duty-bound to obey A and A has right-to-rule over B, where this right-to-rule is grounded in A’s standing to demand that B comply with A’s directives and B’s accountability to A for failing to comply. He further argues that the NJT fails to specify conditions in which A has a right to rule over B, and, hence, it fails to specify conditions in which A has authority over B.

Darwall illustrates this objection with the example of a financial advisor that provides her client with investment instructions. (Id. 258). Darwall stipulates that by following these instructions, the client is likely to do better with respect to her prudential reasons for investing than she would if she tried to follow these reasons directly. Thus, this case satisfies the NJT, and, hence, the Service Conception must hold that the financial advisor has authority over her client. Darwall maintains that although it is in the client’s financial interests to comply with the advisor’s investment instructions, it is deeply counterintuitive to hold that the client is accountable to the advisor for failing to do so or that the advisor has standing to demand her client’s compliance. Given Darwall’s premise that A’s authority over B entails A’s right to rule over B, i.e. B’s accountability to A and A’s standing to demand compliance, Darwall concludes that the NJT fails to specify conditions in which A has authority over B.

In response, Raz insists that the question of whether a person has a normative power to impose duties by issuing directives is distinct from the question of whether she has a right to rule over the subject that correlates to the authority-subject’s duty to obey her directives. (Raz 2010: 290). On his view, a characteristic feature of any duty is that it is a categorical reason – a reason that applies to an agent irrespective of her desires, preferences, or goals that she happens to have. Raz adds that the kind of duties that political authorities impose are pre-emptive reasons; they are reasons that exclude and replace rather than outweigh competing reasons. (Raz 2010: 291–92). Crucially, Raz allows that someone might be bound by a duty so construed, but this need not entail any correlative claim-right. More pointedly, Raz holds that Darwall’s argument that the NJT does not establish a duty that correlates to the authority’s claim-right is beside the point. For the NJT only purports to establish that the subject is bound by a duty to act as the authority directs, where this duty need not correlate to any claim-right.

For his part, Darwall maintains that an authority’s normative power to impose duties cannot be so cleanly separated from its right to rule. For the central thesis of Darwall’s moral theory holds that “there are four interdefinable, irreducibly second-personal notions that together define a conceptual circle: the authority to make a claim or demand, a valid (authoritative or legitimate) claim or demand, accountability or responsibility to someone (with the relevant authority), and a second-personal reason for acting (that is, for complying with an authoritative claim or demand and so discharging the responsibility).” (Darwall 2010: 257). On this view, if an authority’s subjects are duty-bound to conform to the authority’s directives, there must be someone who holds the claim-right that correlates to these duties. For all duties correlate to claim-rights. Darwall further assumes that the authority must be the bearer of this claim-right – albeit on the community’s behalf. Accordingly, Darwall objects to Raz’s Service Conception on the following basis:

The rough idea is that the NJT is only plausible at all in cases where the relevant reasons involve background obligations of some kind or other and that the idea of obligation is itself conceptually related to that of accountability (I argue, ultimately to one another as representative persons or members of the moral community). (Darwall 2010, 257)

To be sure, we could set aside Darwall’s concern with whether the client is accountable to the financial advisor, and an interesting issue would remain. Namely, the financial advisor appears to satisfy the NJT, but it seems unintuitive to claim that the client is bound by a duty to act as the advisor directs, even if we construe duties as Raz does (see Hershovitz 2011).

In response, Raz might deny that the financial advisor satisfies the NJT (see e.g. Raz 2010: 300–01; but see Hershovitz 2011: section 3). To this end, Raz could argue that the financial advisor is merely giving conditional recommendations. Since we are permitted to choose not to pursue financial goods, we needn’t follow the advice. This way of thinking of the issue would require further conditions on the NJT. A second response appeals to the Independence Condition, according to which there are some cases in which we are directed to follow our best conception of our reasons irrespective of whether the NJT is satisfied (see Raz 2010: 136–37). For example, it might be that I would do better with respect to some of my reasons by following my friend’s directives regarding a gift for my parent, but in this case it might well be more important that I choose the gift myself. Perhaps, the same could be said of the financial advisor’s recommendations about her client’s decisions about how to organize her life.

2.4.3 The Wrong Kind of Reason

Darwall’s second objection to Raz’s Service-Conception is that it provides a reason of the wrong kind for the obligation to comply with authority. (Darwall 2010: 260). The basic idea is that the NJT asserts that A has authority over B when B has to treat A as if A has authority over B. This, Darwall argues, gives us the wrong kind of reason for complying with authority. Darwall compares this with Kavka’s toxin puzzle case in which a person acquires a belief for pragmatic reasons (because it would be better for her welfare to have the belief than not). Though pragmatic reasons support having the belief, they are reasons of the wrong kind for justifying the belief. Likewise, Darwall argues that the NJT gives us a reason for treating a person as an authority or as if she were an authority, but it supplies a reason of the wrong kind for justifying that person’s authority.

We believe that Darwall moves too quickly in saying that the NJT implies that if one has reason to treat someone as if they were an authority that they are an authority. The NJT can avoid any kind of locution containing “as if” in its formulation (see e.g. Raz 2009: 136–37). The NJT states that A has authority over B when B has a complex categorical reason to act as commanded and to exclude other reasons for and against performing the commanded acts (i.e., has a pre-emptive reason to act as commanded) because acting as A commands and excluding reasons for and against performing the commanded acts facilitates B’s acting in accordance with categorical reasons that apply directly to him. The idea is that when the NJT is satisfied, the authority subject does not merely have reason to act as if she has a duty to act as directed; rather, she is bound by such a duty. For on Raz’s account, to be bound by a duty to phi just is to have a categorical and pre-emptive reason to do so.

2.4.4 An Ideal Form of Political Authority

Even if these responses to Darwall’s wrong-kind-of-reason objection are successful, there is something puzzling in the neighborhood of this concern. Christiano modifies Bernard Williams’s George and the Nazis case to press this point. (Christiano 2008: 233–34). As in the original example, George is an opponent of the Nazis but has been asked by them to run a chemical weapons factory, which he also opposes. Nonetheless, George accepts the Nazis’ offer because he rightly believes he would be less effective at it than any other candidate. By dint of this comparative incompetence, he will better conform to his reasons for slowing down the Nazis’ weapons production by acting as the Nazis direct and excluding some of the reasons for and against the directed actions. Thus, the NJT implies that the Nazis have authority over George, and yet, this does seem like the wrong kind of reason for thinking that the Nazis have authority.

The Razian might argue that the intuition that the Nazis do not have authority over George derives from a failure to distinguish the various concepts of authority. In this vein, Raz suggests that although governments claim to have authority construed as a normative power to impose duties, they do not claim the right to rule. (Raz 2010: 290). Hence, the key question is whether the state has authority in this limited normative-power sense.

A potential problem with this response is that it seems perverse to say that the Nazis in this case have authority of any kind. The idea is that irrespective of whether it is construed as the liberty-to-rule, a normative-power, or the right-to-rule, a legitimate authority relation must be embedded in a minimally just system of cooperation. Accordingly, the relationship between George and the Nazis is not a legitimate authority relation because it is not embedded in a minimally just scheme. At most, the Nazi political system can have some pockets of authority, such as in the system of traffic regulation and maybe some parts of the criminal law. The rest is thuggery, which one might have to go along with to achieve good outcomes as George does, but it does not display authority in any normatively relevant sense.

Some people argue that the Nazi case could be analyzed in a different way. They distinguish between justified authority and legitimate authority. On this view, to have justified authority is to have the normative power to impose duties, but to have justified authority is not yet to have legitimate authority. The pivotal thesis is that an authority might have a normative power, but there might be all things considered compelling moral reason for not having authority with such power (see Marmor 2025). If so, the authority would be justified but not legitimate. So contrary to the above claim, they might say that the Nazis have a normative power over George and therefore have justified authority though not legitimate authority. Although he might not have the weapons-factory example in mind, Nathan Adams suggests a way of modifying or refining the Razian position in a way that aligns with this alternative analysis.

Adams observes that the Service Conception does not explain the state’s “standing to issue commands” or, in other words “the power to demand practical deference from others” (Adams 2018). Accordingly, Adams introduces further conditions that an authority must satisfy to have standing to issue directives. Specifically, the authority must be sufficiently trustworthy, and it must recognize the responsibility that comes with its ability to issue directives that alter its subjects’ reasons. Note that here, Adams idea of standing is similar to but not exactly the same as Darwall’s. For Adams, to have standing is to be justified in exercising one’s power as an authority to change other persons’ duties by issuing directives. In summary, augmented as Adams suggests, the Service-Conception can respond to Christiano’s modified weapons factory example as follows: Although the Nazi supervisors satisfy the NJT and thereby have the normative power to alter George’s duties by issuing directives, they do not have authority over George. For they do not satisfy the requisite acceptance and responsibility conditions.

But one might respond to this by saying that the putative authority does not possess a normative power at all in this case, even though they do make changes to the environment that generate duties. To say that the putative authority possesses a normative power is to say that there is something right about the entity’s possession of the normative power not just that the supposed subject acquires a reason. To say that the authority is justified is to say there is some important value realized by the entity possessing authority and not just that reasons are generated in other persons. A key question is how to distinguish between actions that are exercises of normative powers in the relevant sense and actions that merely change reasons. One might argue, as Raz does, that a person or person has a normative power in this narrower sense only if there is undefeated value in that person having that power (see Raz 2022: ch. 7)

In a more conciliatory vein, one might say that there is merely a terminological dispute here and that as long as the relevant distinctions are maintained, there is no harm in characterizing the situation in one way or another. But on the side of a less conciliatory approach, one might argue that the difference depends on whether something important is at stake in the distinction between actions that are exercises of normative power and those that merely change other persons’ reasons. The opponent of the conciliatory approach might argue that both authority and the normative power characteristic of authority imply a special kind of relationship of convergence in which the authority and subject share the reasons at issue in some way. Arguably, any theory of authority and its companion notion of normative power must account for that relationship.

2.4.5 Authority, Normative Powers and the NJT

In several passages, Raz seems to characterize authority in terms of his conception of normative powers. So understood, an authority has the normative power to impose duties on subjects by issuing directives insofar and because its having this power is of undefeated value. (Raz 1979: 16–21; Raz 1999: 102–103; Raz 2009: 135–37; and Raz 2022: 172). Raz leaves unanswered the question of whether and how his Normal Justification Thesis relates to this characterization of authority.

A tempting thought is that the NJT specifies conditions in which it is valuable for an authority to have the power to alter its subjects’ duties by issuing directives. Namely, by having the power to impose duties, the authority realizes the value of its subjects’ better conformity to the reasons that apply to them. However, there are at least two objections to this line of argument.

First, Raz’s account of normative powers seems vulnerable to a second wrong-kind-of-reasons objection. Commonly referred to as the wishful thinking objection, this criticism holds that the question of whether it is valuable for someone to have the power to change the normative condition of others seems distinct from the question of whether someone actually has that power (see Watson 2009: 162). In response, some argue that the inference from “it would be good that P” to P is illicit only in some contexts (see e.g. Bruno 2022; Enoch 2009; and Heuer 2025). On this view, the inference from “it would be good if I had the physical power to move mountains” to the conclusion that I have such power is invalid, whereas the inference from “it would be good if I had some normative power” to the conclusion that I have that normative power is valid.

The second issue is that the NJT does not seem to specify conditions in which an authority’s having the power to impose duties would be valuable. (See Enoch 2020: 166n18, citing Richard Healey's discussion of this issue). To be sure, under such conditions, the subject realizes something valuable by following the authority’s directives. Namely, the subject better conforms to her reasons by doing so. However, to establish that the subject’s regular conformity to the authority’s directives is valuable is not the same as establishing that the authority’s possession of the power to change the subject’s duties is valuable. 

In light of these two concerns, a proponent of the NJT might appeal to an alternative to Raz’s conception of normative powers. For example, some theorists appear to characterize the normative power of an authority as the power to generate a content-independent reason or, in David Enoch’s terms (2012), a robust reason for action.

Enoch holds that the exercise of this authoritative power has two success conditions. First, the authority must attempt to give its addressee a robust reason. As Enoch characterizes such an attempt, the authority must intend to give the addressee a reason to act, the authority must communicate this intention to the addressee with the intention that the addressee recognize the intention, and the authority must intend the addressee’s given reason to act to depend in an appropriate way on the addressee’s recognition of the authority’s communicated attention. Second, the authority’s attempt must succeed in giving the addressee a reason in the appropriate way.

Enoch adds this second condition to distinguish instances in which the given reason is generated in the appropriate way, thereby resulting in the successful exercise of this normative power, from instances of the wayward generation of the given reason. Enoch illustrates the need for this distinction with the following example borrowed from David Estlund: A dictator’s child issues an order with the intent described in the first success condition above, and if that order is not satisfied, his father’s government will respond with violence. In such a case, the dictator’s son has met the first success condition, and he has generated a reason for compliance with his order. However, this seems to be an instance of wayward reason-giving rather than the generation of a reason via the exercise of an authority’s normative power. Reminiscent of the Nazi supervisors discussed above, it seems perverse to characterize the orders of the dictator’s son as the successful exercise of an authority’s power – hence, Enoch’s second condition.

A worry about this strategy is that the crucial distinction between the appropriate and wayward generation of reasons is elusive (see Monti 2021: 3741–44; Tadros 2020: 312; and Raz 2022: 163n4). For his part, Enoch (2012: 9) concedes that little more can be said than “usually we know a deviant causal chain when we see one.”

2.4.6 Justifying the Normative Power of Political Authority

At this point, it should be clear that the proper characterization of normative powers is an important issue for any theory that adheres to the second or third concept of political authority. Any adequate theory of the conditions in which a political institution possesses authority so conceived must explain the conditions in which the institution possesses the normative power distinctive of political authority. Because rival accounts of these conditions rest on different conceptions of normative powers, it is useful to briefly explicate some of the main conceptions that inform this debate.

One key distinction is between theories that construe normative powers as in some sense original and not reducible to other normative elements from those that take powers to be constructed from other materials and reducible to them. Here, it seems that persons have the power to impose duties on themselves by virtue of their moral status as persons. Plausibly, Locke and contemporary Lockean theorists, such as Simmons and Nozick, hold such a view. On this account, persons possess an original normative power to regulate their lives and reorder their moral relations to others by virtue of their moral status as persons, and consent to state authority is one way to exercise this power. The effect of such consent is to give some of one’s powers to the state, which now may exercise those powers over one. I can normally impose duties on myself, and I can give some of this power to the State, which then can impose duties on me. For example, I have powers over my property, some of which I give to the state which in turn may now regulate that property or tax it (see Simmons 1993: 62–64).

By contrast, reductivist views hold that more basic normative considerations create or ground normative powers. As we have seen, Raz holds that political authorities have the power to impose duties on their subjects by virtue of the fact that it is valuable that they have such power, and other theorists (e.g. Enoch 2012) characterize this normative power as the capacity to generate a content-independent or robust-reason in the appropriate way. Several democratic theorists hold that the duty to treat others publicly as equals grounds the power of the democratic assembly. When a group makes a decision that treats everyone publicly as equals in accordance with the publicly egalitarian procedure and does not violate public equality, the members have a duty of equality to act in accord with the decision. They treat their fellow members publicly as unequals if they fail to comply with the decision, which they have duties to do. Here the prior duty of treating others publicly as equals is simply triggered by the publicly egalitarian decision process (see e.g. Christiano 2008, and see Enoch 2011 for the idea of a triggering reason).

Notably, Darwall’s account of political authority rests on a contractualist ground that is difficult to categorize as either reductive or non-reductive.

The lesson to draw from the failure of the NJT, I believe, is that the only justification that can succeed is one that proceeds from within the second-person standpoint, beginning with the assumption that we all share a common basic authority to make claims and demands of one another at all, and proceeding from there to consider what differential claims to authority anyone could sensibly accept, or no one could reasonably reject on that basis. (Darwall 2010: 277–78).

Here, Darwall seems to hold that A has the power to impose duties on B only insofar as no one could reasonably reject A’s having that power.

2.5 Reasonable Consensus Conceptions of Legitimate Political Authority

A key concern about the instrumentalist and functionalist approaches is that they seem committed to the idea that an authority can be legitimate even if most of the members of the society do not agree with what it is doing. These views seem implausibly committed to the thesis that political authority is completely independent of the considered opinions of its subjects. Considerations of this kind underpin the appeal of consent theory. For it requires that for the state to have authority over any person, the state must obtain that person’s consent.

Reasonable consensus views of political authority attempt to find a mean between the extreme individualism of consent theory and the lack of respect for people’s opinions exhibited by instrumentalist and functionalist views. John Rawls argues that the liberal principle of political legitimacy requires that coercive institutions be so structured that they accord with the reasonable views of the members of the society. On this view, it is not necessary that the authority subject voluntarily consents to an authority. All that need be the case is that the basic principles that regulate the coercive institutions be ones that the reasonable members can agree to. (Rawls 1996).

Views of this kind do not allow individuals to divest themselves of obligations on spurious or merely self-interested bases; for they specify what is and is not a reasonable basis for agreement to the basic principles of the society. At the same time, they evince respect for the opinions of the members of society since it requires that the basic principles that regulate the society accord with the reasonable views of the members.

A key worry about reasonable consensus views is that they demand a level of consensus among members of society that is incompatible with the ordinary conditions of political societies. (Christiano 1996 and Waldron 1999). If one attempts to come up with a notion of reasonableness that is sufficiently robust to generate agreement on the basic principles of society, then one is likely to have a notion that is quite controversial. And then the view does not seem to take a sufficiently respectful view of the opinions of the members of society since so many are likely to disagree with the conception of the reasonable. (Cf. Quong 2010: ch. 6) On the other hand, if one elaborates a conception of the reasonable that is sufficiently weak for most persons in the society to satisfy it, then one is not likely to generate agreement on society’s basic principles.

One way in which Rawls has argued in favor of the attainability of the consensus is to say that it need only be an overlapping consensus. The overlapping consensus idea is that if a group of citizens agrees on a set of principles for regulating society and some of the citizens also think that some other principles apply, the citizens who hold the idiosyncratic views must take those particular demands off the table and must argue only on the basis of the shared principles. As long as there are certain principles that everyone agrees to, which apply to the basic structure of society, full consensus is not necessary. Hence, the consensus need only be an overlapping one, and a legitimate exercise of political power is one that is grounded only in those principles that lie in the overlap. This seems to diminish the amount of agreement necessary to make a society legitimate.

But this appearance may be an illusion. To see why, consider a society in which some hold that as a matter of justice, people ought to receive in accordance with their desert, but others reject this desert-based conception of justice. It would seem that in such a society this desert-based view would fall outside the overlapping consensus; it would be an idiosyncratic principle. In this case, the principle of legitimacy implies that if the desert principle is used to ground the basic institutions of society, then the basic institutions of society are illegitimate. For they are not based on principles everyone accepts.

But surely the same can be said of those who hold the idiosyncratic desert principle. They can complain that they are required to go along with institutions that are unjust by their lights. The imposition on them implied by the basic institutions that fail to distribute in accordance with desert is as great as would be the imposition on the others implied by institutions that do distribute goods in accordance with desert. There is a complete symmetry here. Indeed, one way to put this point is to say that those who hold that desert is not a genuine principle of justice are themselves holding an idiosyncratic view when we take into account the fact that many think that desert is a genuine principle of justice.

As a consequence of these considerations, only a complete consensus of political principles will satisfy the principle of legitimacy that Rawls defends. But complete consensus on political principles is impossible to achieve given the conditions of ordinary political societies. And so, to the extent that this principle of legitimacy is unsatisfiable in ordinary political societies, it appears to be an unacceptably utopian principle (see Christiano 2009).

The “convergence” view proposed by Gaus (2012a and 2012b) belongs to the broader family of reasonable consensus views. This view does not require agreement on underlying principles but merely requires agreement on social norms and rules. Agreement here is a complex notion because it does not imply agreement on the best rules; it is more like coordination. Each person may have their separate and distinct principles for evaluating political and legal organization. And these principles help them rank different forms of organization. The coordination involved is to be understood not in terms of the interests of the parties but in terms of their moral rankings of forms of organization. And the coordination is to be understood in terms of improvements relative to some baseline, although the nature of this baseline is a matter of debate. One possibility is improvement relative to a baseline of no rules at all. Of course, this will mean that often some will get a lot of what they think appropriate while others will only get a bit. How one gets to these coordination points is unclear though it could be through bargaining. The view generates authority because each person has some reason based in their perspective to adhere to the rules. Some rules are first order such as the rule not to commit murder. Other rules are second order, such as the rules constituting authority, which tell us how to create first order rules. Societies generally coordinate on second order rules of authority. So many have some reason to follow the authority (see also Vallier 2011 and van Schoelandt 2015).

2.6 Democratic Conceptions of Legitimate Political Authority

Like reasonable consensus views, democratic conceptions of political authority attempt to find a mean between the extreme individualism of consent theory and the lack of respect for people’s opinions of the functionalist views and the Razian view. The basic idea behind the democratic conception of legitimate authority is that when it is important that persons structure their shared world together despite pervasive disagreement, the appropriate way to proceed is by way of a decision-making process that is fair to the interests and opinions of each of the members. On this view, those who refuse to act in accordance with the rules or laws created in such a way thereby treat their fellow members as unequals and unfairly.

When there is disagreement about how to organize the shared system of law, property, public education and the provision of public goods, no one can have his way entirely in this context without someone else not getting her way. Each person thinks that the ideas about justice and the common good with which the others wish to organize their shared world are mistaken in some way. Yet there is a need for collective action. To settle on a course of collective action in a way that treats all members equally and is reasonably fair to each, it is necessary to do so by way of a democratic decision-making procedure.

Democratic theorists disagree about the fundamental grounds of the democratic requirement. Some argue that there is a fundamental duty of equal respect for the opinions of others that grounds democratic decision making in the context of pervasive disagreement (see Singer 1974 and Waldron 1999). Others wish to ground this duty of respect for the opinions of others in a deeper principle of equal concern for the interests of each member of society (See Christiano 2008). Others still argue that this must be grounded in a principle of equal status (see Beitz 1989; Anderson 1999; Viehoff 2014; and Kolodny 2014).

However grounded, views of this kind hold that the democratic assembly has a right to rule that correlates to a duty of obedience borne by each of its members. This right of the democratic assembly is grounded in the right of each member of the assembly to be accorded equal respect. The duty of equal respect requires that the collective decision process gives each a vote in a broadly majoritarian process and a robustly equal opportunity to participate in the deliberations and negotiations leading to decisions. Some theorists add that this duty of equal respect also requires each citizen to advance proposals for organizing their shared institutions on the basis of reasons that are compelling to their fellow citizens. (E.g. Cohen 1999; but see Christiano 2009). In any case, the idea is that the equal rights of each of the members are in effect pooled in the democratic assembly so that because one owes each person equal respect, and the democratic way of making decisions embodies this equal respect, one owes the democratic assembly respect.

The democratic assembly can be understood as the assembly of all adult citizens or better as the assembly of all the democratically chosen representatives of citizens. A conception of a democratic assembly requires, on this view, an account of the appropriate form of democratic representation (see Beitz 1989 and Christiano 1996). In addition, the democratic assembly is only one part of the complete system of government. It is concerned with legislation only. In addition to this a government requires executive and judicial functions whose legitimacy may depend in part on other factors better grasped by the instrumentalist view. The democratic theory we are discussing attributes a kind of intrinsic authority to the democratic assembly and an instrumental authority to the executive and judicial branches. The latter are instruments for the realization of democratic decision making and for limiting democratic decision making in the name of equality. (For a dissenting view opposing the merely instrumental importance of courts, see Lafont 2020).

The thought is that when an outcome is democratically chosen and some people disagree with the outcome, as some inevitably will, they still have a duty to go along with the decision because otherwise they would be treating the others unjustly. If they refuse to go along and disrupt the democratically chosen arrangements, they assume for themselves a right to determine how things should go that overrides the equal rights of all the others. They act contrary to the collective decision that treated all as equals. To be sure, they are not likely to undermine the whole system because each person’s obedience to law only makes a very small contribution to the maintenance of law. But a collection of such actions similar to their own will do damage to the legal system and thus will interfere with the ability of equal citizens to determine the character of their society. Hence, they have non-individualistic reasons to act in accordance with egalitarian collective decisions, which are grounded in the idea that one must treat one’s fellow citizens as equals.

Notably, the duties owed to the democratic assembly are content-independent reasons. For each member has the duty just because the assembly has made a decision. Arguably, these duties are also preemptive. On this view, the idea of equal respect requires not only acting in accordance with the decision of the democratic assembly. It also requires deference to the decision of the majority and not acting on one’s own judgment when the majority disagrees. So, the decision of the majority gives a reason to obey that preempts or replaces the considerations one might act on were there no majority decision (see Christiano 2008).

Democratic decision making on this account can be evaluated from two very different angles. On the one hand, one can evaluate a democratic decision in terms of the justice or efficiency of the outcome of the decision. One can ask whether the legislation is just or for the common good. This is the standpoint of the citizen who argues in favor of legislation and against others and tries to organize a coalition of more or less like-minded people to advance the legislation. On the other hand, democratic decision making can be evaluated in terms of the way in which the decision was made. Did the process of decision-making treat all of its members fairly or with equal respect? Are the institutions of legislative representation, political rights, and of electoral campaigns, among others, fair?

But why should the equality embodied in the democratic assembly trump other considerations of justice? The democratic conception of authority requires each person to submit issues to a democratic vote. So if someone advocates some policy P on the grounds that it conforms with what they take to be the correct principle of justice J, and the majority chooses a different policy P’ on the grounds of an incompatible principle L, the democratic theory says that they ought to accept the policy that is grounded in L because only in this way do they accord the proper equal respect to their fellow citizens.

But someone might ask, why should the principle of equal respect take precedence over principle J? They are both principles of justice, so we need some reason for favoring the equal respect principle in general over the others. One answer to this is to say that social justice demands that principles of justice be public in the sense that they involve principles that can be shown to be implemented to everyone who is reasonably conscientious and aware of some basic facts of political life (such as disagreement, fallibility and cognitive bias). This is a version of the basic maxim of justice that justice must not only be done, it must be seen to be done. The thought then is that to the extent that there is significant disagreement about the substantive principles of justice in play when policy is being decided, a just society requires some way in which publicly to embody the equal treatment of all the individuals in society. The controversial principles guiding the formulation of policy do not generally satisfy this constraint of publicity. Indeed, given the controversies over justice, individuals will think that the policies do not accord with their favored conception of equality. The democratic process does seem publicly to embody the equal standing of all citizens and the equal worth of their interests against the background of disagreement and fallibility and all the facts that attend these phenomena. So, the democratic process seems uniquely capable of publicly embodying the principle of the equal importance of each person and the equal importance of the advancement of their interests (see Christiano 2008 and Estlund 2007).

Critics of this democratic conception of political authority might still take issue with the thesis that social justice requires that principles be public and that this gives priority to the principles that underpin democracy over those that underpin substantive policy proposals. The question must be, why is publicity, in the sense sketched above, so important? (See Arneson1993 and Wall 2006). The answer some have given is that there are fundamental interests in being able to see that the society one lives in is reasonably just and advances the common good, at least in the circumstances marked by disagreement, fallibility, and cognitive bias. (Christiano 2008).

It is worth looking at some features of this democratic conception. First, it is a direct response to Wolff’s anarchistic challenge. The thought is that the need to treat others as equals grounds a reason to exclude one’s particular views about justice when considering obedience in the context described above. For one’s views have been taken into account in an egalitarian process of collective decision-making. Second, the relation to Raz’s Normal Justification Thesis and the Service Conception is complex. According to the democratic conception, each person acts better in accordance with reason by obeying democratic law. So, in that respect, Raz’s Service Conception is satisfied. But there is one difference: the consideration of treating others as equals in the context outlined above is meant to be front and center to each person’s reason for compliance. Furthermore, the reasons that are excluded are not excluded in order to act in accordance with them but rather to act in accordance with equality. I obey because this is necessary to treating my fellow citizens as equals. Third, the theory proposed here suggests a highly reductive account of the normative powers of the assembly. The duties to obey are triggered by the collective decision-making of the assembly. Fourth, we can also say something about how this abstract structure can respond to consent theories’ central concerns. The democratic view is a kind of functionalism, but it takes into account people’s disagreements; it takes account of the fundamental interests of persons in advancing their understandings of justice. Fifth, some legislation will undermine even the most basic equality among persons and so this will not be legitimate (at least for most views in this group). Thus, there are limits to the authority of democracy grounded on the very same principles that generate the authority of the democratic assembly (see the entry on democracy).

2.7 Associative Obligations

Another strategy for explaining the state’s authority relies on the idea of associative obligations, the rules and norms that govern and constitute communities of various kinds, such as families, friendships, and political societies. This approach has a storied history, beginning with Plato’s recapitulation of an account of this kind in the Crito. (Plato 1948). Ronald Dworkin’s account of political obligation (1986) is an influential contemporary attempt to ground the legitimacy of political authority in this way. If successful, this account would explain how a political society can have legitimate authority even if it is not a voluntary association.

Dworkin argues that communities that satisfy four conditions for being genuine communities thereby generate obligations to go along with the terms of the association. We can summarize these conditions as follows:(1) The members of the community must see the community’s terms of association as special obligations holding within the group rather than general duties owed equally to persons outside the group; (2) they must see these obligations as owed by each member to each other member personally rather than to the group as a whole; (3) they must see these obligations as flowing from a more general responsibility that each group member has of concern for the well-being of others in the group; (4) and they must understand the obligations as flowing from a plausible version of equal concern for each community member. On this view, the community that satisfies these four conditions is a genuine community in which all members are obligated to comply with the community’s terms of association. (Dworkin 1986: 199–200).

Dworkin’s idea of constructive interpretation plays a key role in his explanation of the normative ground and content of these associative obligations. In the case of political communities, the interpretive target is the community’s past political decisions – roughly speaking, the decisions made and enforced by the community’s political institutions, such as legislatures, executive agencies, and courts. In this context, constructive interpretation seeks to adduce principles of justice, fairness, and procedural due process (politico-moral principles) that best fit and justify the body of the community’s past political decisions, considered as a whole. Crucially, a key constraint on this interpretation is that it must specify principles that satisfy a minimally plausible conception of equal concern for the association’s members, as mentioned above. Dworkin argues that insofar as the constructive interpretation of a community’s past political decisions yields underlying politico-moral principles that satisfy this constraint, the community’s officials are justified in enforcing and the community’s citizens are duty-bound to follow the rights and duties that those principles imply. These rights and duties comprise the associative obligations of the political community or, in other words, they comprise the community’s political obligations.

It is important to note that Dworkin’s theory of political obligation decisively rejects what we might call the standard picture (see Greenberg 2011). Consider again the questions of political authority framed by the three senses of political authority that we have been considering. Is the state justified in issuing and enforcing its directives? Does the state have the normative power to impose duties on its citizens by issuing directives that specify the content of those duties. Does the state have a claim-right to rule that correlates to a duty to obey its directives owed to it by its subjects? According to the standard picture, the contents of the authority’s directives are fixed prior to and independently of whether those contents satisfy any objective moral tests. Whereas on Dworkin’s view, the very content of the directives must be understood in the light of objective moral principles. Thus, Dworkin reverses the standard picture’s order of explanation. He argues that the content of a community’s political obligations is derived in part from principles that fit and justify the community’s past political decisions. His view is that the content of political obligations cannot be ascertained independently of the principles that justify a community’s political decisions taken as a whole.

To help see Dworkin’s idea, consider Riggs v. Palmer, a 19th century New York state court case contesting the right of a grandson to inherit his grandfather’s estate on the grounds that the grandson murdered his grandfather. Dworkin observes that this inheritance would satisfy the letter of the relevant New York statutes. On the standard picture, a key question is whether the state’s directives, such as those codified by New York law, are authoritative. If so, there is a political obligation. By contrast, Dworkin argues that Riggs v. Palmer corroborates the claim that the content of political obligation is instinct within the body of state political decisions, including New York Statutes and other materials, considered as whole. On this view, there is a political obligation to follow the principle that no one shall profit from his wrong. For this objective moral principle best fits and justifies the state’s decisions. Accordingly, the state’s officials are not only legally obligated to debar the grandson’s inheritance, they are required as a matter of political obligation to do so, irrespective of whether this obligation strictly complies with the letter of the state’s directives.

A key question is whether the various theories of political authority we have been considering can accommodate this non-standard picture. One possibility is that some of these theories could construe constitutional provisions in accordance with this non-standard way. For example, the Lockean consent theorist might argue that any constitutional provision in violation of the natural law must be interpreted in a way that remedies this violation, and subjects have a political obligation only with respect to this interpretation. By contrast, it might be that the authority of the democratic assembly is different than the authority of the constituent assembly. That is, the former is an authority that determines the content of political obligation because the background condition is serious disagreement about the principles that ought to regulate the creation of statutory law, whereas constitutional provisions are subject to a kind of constructive interpretation animated by objective moral principles.

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