Legitimate Political Authority in International Institutions

Various international bodies issue and seek to secure compliance with directives that significantly impact the interests of many on a global scale. For example, the United Nations Security Council is tasked with preserving international peace, and to this end it is empowered to authorize the use of military force between states. To name a second example, the World Trade Organization issues and enforces a system of rules with the ostensible purpose of maintaining a reasonably free trade environment between countries, and these efforts profoundly affect the level of global economic productivity as well as the distribution of income and wealth within and between states. Moreover, one might argue that the effectiveness of such institutions depends on broad acceptance of their legitimacy. Accordingly, a pressing question queries what it is for international bodies to be legitimate and the conditions in which they enjoy this normative standing.

Any contemporary state is constituted by a network of centralized and coordinated political institutions (e.g. provincial and federal legislatures, courts and executive bodies) with comprehensive de facto authority to make law, adjudicate disputes, and enforce such legislation and rulings across virtually any subject matter. By contrast, the international normative order is a highly fragmented system of rules organized around three core principles: pacta sunt servanda, jus cogens, and customary international law. Pacta sunt servanda holds that states must uphold their treaty commitments. Customary international law comprises rules that states follow as a matter of general practice and accept as legally binding (opinio juris), and jus cogens are rules that prohibit various forms of particularly egregious state conduct, such as genocide, piracy, human trafficking, and slavery. Roughly stated, the international normative order is one in which states have no obligations to each other save for jus cogens, customary international law, and duly undertaken treaty commitments.

At the root of the differences between the international and state-level normative order is the different role played by putatively authoritative institutions. Whereas de facto state authorities rarely emerge by way of the agreement of its subject citizens, the only putatively authoritative bodies at the international level are those created by treaty, such as the World Trade Organization and United National Security Council mentioned above, and the scope of any such institution’s authority is limited by the specific purposes and terms of the originating treaty. Thus, a key question about the legitimacy of the authority of international bodies queries whether any such treaty-created international institution has the normative power to impose duties on states or the right or liberty or right to issue directives and take steps to secure state compliance.

Conceptions of legitimacy in international institutions tend to be placed between two poles. On one pole, many advocate for a democratic conception of legitimacy and argue for global democracy of one form or another (MacDonald 2008 and Held 1995). They favor starting with the international institutions and figuring out how to democratize them. At the opposite pole, some argue in favor of state consent as the basis of legitimacy. And there are many intermediate positions in between.

The first pole is animated by the idea that democracy is the gold standard for legitimate political authority for these authors. But the approach is bedeviled by the problem of how to realize or even define democracy at the global level in any way that is not a sham. For global democracy at this stage suffers from a number of insuperable defects. First, societies have radically different stakes and bargaining power in the international system. We can see this from the fact that the trade-to-GDP ratios of some countries, such as the United States, are markedly lower than those of many others. Second, the social institutions, such as parties and interest group associations, necessary for a functional democracy are not even at a germinal state at the international level (see Christiano 2012). We will address two broadly intermediate positions. One is essentially a functionalist approach, and the other appeals to state consent but tries to solve the problems that consent-based views seem to generate. Before turning to these intermediate views, it is useful to start with a perspective that is deeply skeptical about the viability and legitimacy of international institutions.

A.1 Realism in International Relations

Realism is the doctrine that the relations between states is essentially a struggle for survival (see Carr 1939). Each state sees its survival as threatened by all the other states. Realism was dominant in the classical tradition (Thucydides HPW and Rousseau SW), but countered by some important opposing views such as Dante (1331) and the late scholastics (Vitoria PW). This view has become more sophisticated in the last century allowing for the emergence of alliances between states seeking to protect themselves against other powerful states (see Mearsheimer 2003). For expositional purposes, we will describe a simple version of realism characterized by two major theses. First, states are concerned primarily with relative advantage as opposed to absolute advantage. States are not concerned with maximizing wealth or power but only with having more power than other states. Second, state behavior is not fundamentally driven by the character of the regimes that they have. Whether states bear a republican or dictatorial form of government, relative advantage is their predominant motive. These two theses suggest a third. States are hesitant to cooperate, oftentimes engaging in little more than the superficial appearance of cooperation. On this view, interstate cooperation is precarious and superficial, and rules restraining the starting and conduct of war are very brittle at best. Moreover, some realists argue that the world of states is significantly more peaceful when state actors eschew moral ideals; for states motivated by such ideals tend to be more war-like and destructive, as illustrated by the Thirty Years War and the French Revolutionary Wars (see Morgenthau 1948 [1960]).

To be sure, many international relations theorists recognize the importance of mutual advantage in the creation of international institutions and the distinctive contributions of democratic states (e.g. liberal internationalists, such as Keohane 1984), and others recognize the centrality of something like moral norms to international politics (e.g., constructivist theorists, such as Wendt 1999). We call attention to the realist position because it challenges a presupposition of the philosophical literature on political authority beyond the state. This presupposition holds that the recognition of the authoritative standing or status of international bodies and the obligatory force of international obligations is or could be a significant driver of state behavior (see, e.g., Buchanan 2002 ; Buchanan 2011; and Buchanan & Keohane 2006). This view sits uneasily with the core realist thesis regarding the motivational primacy of the pursuit of relative advantage.

A.2 Functionalism at the International Level

A number of theorists turn to functionalist considerations to explain the legitimacy of international bodies. The key thesis is that the authority of such institutions is justified insofar as they issue directives that secure valuable forms of international coordination, such as the international efforts necessary for mitigating global climate change, securing international peace and security, and maintaining the health of the global economy (Buchanan & Keohane 2006). On this view, state-consent is relevant to the legitimacy of international bodies. For widespread recognition of its authoritative standing is a precondition of any international body’s ability to secure valuable forms of consideration, and state consent is the main way for an international body to win such recognition.

To be sure, the same worries about adequate democratic representation or consent that apply to functionalist accounts of state authority are germane to the international context. In response, the functionalist apologist might point out that international bodies exercise authority that differs from and is less demanding than state authority, and hence, the justificatory burden for such actions is commensurately less demanding (Buchanan 2011). One such difference is that rather than purporting to impose new duties on state subjects international bodies oftentimes purport to waive existing duties. For example, the Security Council authorizes states to prosecute wars against a background of a general prohibition of all war except in the case of self-defense. Likewise, the Dispute Settlement Mechanism of the World Trade Organization first determines whether a state has in fact violated its agreements on trade and tariffs with another state, and upon finding some such violation it permits the plaintiff state to retaliate in a way that would normally violate WTO rules. Crucially, the WTO authorizes retaliation but does not impose a duty to do so. These examples bring a second difference into view. International bodies rarely directly enforce the rules of the international order; rather, they authorize states to do so. However, it is not clear that these differences significantly lessen or alter the justificatory burden for establishing the authority of international bodies. For international bodies profoundly impact the level and distribution of well-being for many natural persons, irrespective of whether they directly enforce state-compliance or enlist states for this task.

Allen Buchanan discusses at length yet another function that some international bodies perform. Namely, they issue directives and rulings that enhance the legitimacy of participating subject states.

Even the most democratic, rights-respecting states sometimes fail to protect the rights that their own constitutions accord to their citizens.… To the extent that there is congruence between international human rights and the civil and political rights that are recognized in a particular state, the state’s participation in international human rights regimes can provide a ‘backup’ for domestic rights protection. (Buchanan 2011: 11)

Buchanan further argues that by performing such a legitimating function, international bodies thereby realize a kind of reciprocal legitimation of their own authority. For example, treaty-created international human rights committees commonly issue comments that clarify the meaning of international rights, they regularly enumerate human rights violations of signatory states and recommend steps that states should take to come into compliance with the international human rights regime, and they require states to reply to their findings and recommendations. Notably, Buchanan’s thought is reminiscent of Raz’s Normal Justification Thesis. For the core idea is that an international body is justified in regularly engaging in such exercises of authority and the state is generally required to participate regularly in this process, including heeding the international body’s recommendations, rulings, or directives, insofar as this pattern of interaction enhances or helps maintain the state’s legitimacy (Buchanan 2011; see also Tasioulas 2010).

A.3 State-Consent and International Authority

From the point of view of the international legal order, there is a clear answer to the question of legal legitimacy. Unless inconsistent with jus cogens, state-signatories are bound to their treaty commitments, including commitments to comply with the intra vires directives of treaty-created bodies. Moreover, customary international law rests in effect on a doctrine of tacit consent. For it holds that all states are bound by any norm that states follow as a matter of general practice and accept as legally binding (opinio juris), with the caveat that any state that persistently dissents to a particular customary norm is not bound by it. Here, we have an idea of state-consent as a way of binding states to international rules.

However, few, if any, theorists would accept that state-consent simpliciter is sufficient justification of the authority of these institutions. One worry is that state consent does not speak to the key concern. As noted above, international bodies significantly impact both the level and distribution of well-being among natural persons within and across state borders. In this context, the consent or democratic representation of the natural persons so affected rather than state-consent is most directly relevant.

In response, some thinkers have responded that though highly imperfect, states are by far and away the most responsive and accountable collective institutions in the modern world to the natural persons who are their subjects. Democratic states are much more so but almost all states have some degree of responsiveness. It is hard to see how any other institution in the international system will be more responsive to the interests of natural persons for the foreseeable future (see, e.g., Christiano 2012.) Others argue that the consent to the authority of international bodies by sufficiently democratic states is a means of securing the adequate democratic representation necessary to legitimate the authority of international institutions (see, e.g., Buchanan 2011). However, this claim faces several objections.

The first is that oftentimes, treaty-signatories are not democratically governed. This is virtually unavoidable with respect to the most important multilateral treaties of global reach, such as those that created the international human rights regime, the Security Council, the World Trade Organization, and the United Nations. The worry is that the interests of the citizens of the non-democratic signatories are not adequately represented in treaty negotiations or the decision-making of treaty-created institutions (Christiano 2012). Second, even if all parties to a treaty were democratically governed, there would still be great disparities of bargaining power and effectiveness that undermine the legitimating effect of state consent (Buchanan 2002 and Christiano 2012). For the relative costs of no-agreement for smaller and poorer states are typically much higher than they are for larger and wealthier states. Moreover, larger and wealthier states are able to field larger and better resourced teams of experts and advocates than smaller states. Third, even in generally democratic states, democratic representation in the treaty-making process is typically highly attenuated. Fourth, the doctrine of state consent seems to permit states to avoid entering highly desirable institutions just by declining to consent for unreasonable or even irrational considerations.

But this does suggest an amended broadly democratic principle of legitimacy. The principle is that international institutions are legitimate to the extent that they are consented to as the result of fair negotiation among highly representative states (mostly democratic ones) and that they do not lead to the systematic undermining of basic human interests and rights. Nonconsent that is the result of reasonable disagreement is to be respected but unreasonable or irrationally grounded failures of consent need not be respected. This leads to a conception of international society as a society of representative states bound together by the voluntary and fair pursuit of morally mandatory ends such as the protection of human rights and fundamental human interests, a fair economic system and the avoidance of severe public bads such as environmental disaster (Christiano 2012). To the objections that the current system has a lot of very non-representative states and that fair negotiation is hard to come by, one could argue that the implication of this principle is that the system is not very legitimate though it may have some legitimacy.

A.4 Conflicting Authorities

States distinctively claim authority that is both supreme and comprehensive. The claim to supremacy is the claim that no other institution or body has the power either to alter the state’s liberty to enforce its directives or to alter the duties that the state’s directives impose on its subjects. The claim to comprehensiveness is the claim to authority over virtually any subject matter. By contrast, international bodies typically claim authority that is supreme but not comprehensive. For example, the WTO claims supremacy, but only with respect to issues relating to determining whether there has been a violation of the duties specified by the WTO’s terms of trade, and the Security Council claims supremacy, but only with respect to the question of whether a state has violated international law in a way that would justify its authorization of other states to use force in response. Because different subject matters might nonetheless overlap, international bodies are susceptible to a kind of conflict. For example, the WTO might require a state to enforce patent laws in ways inconsistent with international human rights committees’ recommendations regarding the provision of adequate universal health care. Accordingly, one facet of inquiry into the authority of international bodies concerns how to determine which, if any, international institution has the authority it claims in the case of such conflicts (see, e.g., Tasioulas 2010 and Sciaraffa 2017).

Nicole Roughan (2013) questions the foregoing framing of this question. She argues that the authority of potentially conflicting international bodies turns on whether they engage in ongoing dialogue that mutually informs and improves the quality of their respective directives and enforcement activity. On this view, insisting on the supremacy of any international body might well be inimical to better governance; for it might put a stop to legitimacy-enhancing dialogue and consultation. For Roughan, the key question is whether the conflicting bodies engage in the appropriate kind of mutually consultative behavior. Insofar as they do not, their attempted exercises of authority are illegitimate. Notably, Roughan makes similar claims about the authority of potentially conflicting political institutions at the state level.