1. There are several accounts of the evolution of bioethics in Latin America: Lolas Stepke 2005; Mainetti 2010; Álvarez Díaz 2012a; Lamm 2012; Garcia et al. 2019.

2. A detailed country-by-country study of the regulation of surrogacy can be found in Espejo-Yaksic, Fenton-Glynn, and Scherpe 2023.

3. It should be noted that Beauchamp and Childress’ book does not primarily focus on public health ethics.

4. The Functionings Approach to ethics, as proposed by the Brazilian philosopher Maria Clara Dias (2019), is rooted in the capabilities approach, originally developed by Amartya Sen and Martha Nussbaum.

5. See The Lancet Commission 2015 (Other Internet Resources). Other studies reach the same conclusions (see Bonilla 2021).

6. We refer to PAD as both (i) “voluntary active euthanasia”, i.e., the medical act of intentionally administering a drug that causes death to a patient suffering from a serious terminal or disabling condition, with the patient’s consent, and (ii) physician-assisted suicide, i.e., the medical act of providing a patient suffering from a serious terminal or disabling condition with the means to bring about his or her own death. PAD must be distinguished from other medical practices related to the end of life, in particular from the so-called “death with dignity” (withdrawal of life-sustaining therapeutic measures), limitation of therapeutic efforts, terminal sedation, among others, which will be mentioned below.

With respect to the Catholic Church’s position on PAD in Latin America, see the Episcopal Conference of Colombia (Rozo Prieto 2022). An overview of the political expansion of evangelical churches in Latin America and, in particular, their rejection of PAD can be found in Malamud (2018: 5 [Other Internet Resources]). From the sociology of religion, Esquivel and Irrazábal (2021) argue on the basis of recent surveys that religious affiliations are crucial variables in the positions taken by Argentine citizens in relation to PAD.

7. Tecnológico de Costa Rica, 2017, “Sin recuperar el tiempo perdido…”, Pensis, VI Edición.

8. This case was widely acknowledged in U.S. bioethical discussions and apologies were offered by President Obama in 2010. However, in the region it was considered one of the many cases of unethical conduct done or suspected to be done.

9. For an analysis of people with mental illness, where relational autonomy may be complemented by vulnerability and enable certain decision-making, see Buedo and Luna (2021).