1. Bonaventure wrote two pieces of hagiography on Francis of Assisi: The Legenda Maior a text mean to be read aloud within Franciscan houses and the Legenda Minor a liturgical text meant to be read during the eight day celebration of Francis's feast within the Order of Friars Minor. The critical edition of the Legenda Maior and Minor is in the Analecta Franciscana, volume X. Often scholars cite a reprinting of this edition without all of its notes an apparatus from the collection Fontes Franciscani, eds. Enrico Menestò and Stefano Brufani (Assisi: Edizioni Porziuncola, 1995). The translation of all of Bonaventure's texts on St. Francis may be found in the collection Francis of Assisi Early Documents (FA:ED), volume 2.

2. For Bonaventure’s chronology, see Bougerol 1961 earlier study of Distelbrink 1975.

3. The English translation of the letter is taken from Monti 1994: 39–56. The edition may be found in Quaracchi VIII, 331–336 and in Delorme 1951.

4. Quoted in Bougerol, Introduction (1988), 178. T. Crowley (1974) erroneously thought Salimbene meant Bonaventure incepted as Master of Theology in 1248. On his chronology see also Quinn 1972, Quinn 1982, Monti 1994, Schlosser 2014. The most recent review of Bonaventure works is Horowski 2016.

5. On the office of lector see Şenocak 2012: 54–59, 231–232 and elsewhere. On the Franciscan’s internal chair, see Dufeil 1972: 6–9 and elsewhere.

6. On one year Sentences lectures see William Duba and Chris Schabel 2017. On the order of Bonaventure’s lectures see Ryan Thornton 2021.

7. Cf. Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I, no. 219: 242, April 1253, expelling the friars from the University. On this conflict see M.-M. Dufeil, 1972.

8. Condemnation of William of St. Amour, Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I, no. 287–88: 329–33. In Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I, no. 293: 339, referring to Odo of Douai and Christian of Beauvais, Alexander IV ordered

that the Friar Preachers and Minors present at Paris, masters and their students, and especially by name, Friars Thomas of Aquino of the Order of Preachers and Bonaventure of the Order of Minors, doctors of theology, with maximum effort they shall receive them into the academic community and to the University of Paris, and expressly they shall receive these doctors as Masters; and that, while they are in Paris, they shall publicly make this same promise, and, in accordance with the aforesaid ordinance they shall attempt to have those doctors received by the University, both masters and students, with good faith; and they shall not plan or agree to anything contrary to the foregoing.

Christian of Beauvais did so, Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I, no. 317: 366.

9. Bonaventure’s name became attached to a great deal of spiritual literature in the Middle Ages. His authentic spiritual works, in addition to the three mentioned above, may be found principally in Quaracchi VIII.

10. Joseph Ratzinger (later Benedict XVI upon his election to the Papacy) wrote his habilitationsschrift on the theology of revelation in St. Bonaventure, only a small part of which was accepted at the time—specifically, the part on the theology of history in St. Bonaventure. This part was published and eventually translated into English. In 2009, Benedict XVI was presented with the full published text of his entire habilitationsschrift, which is now available as part of Ratzinger's Gesammelte Schriften. This full text has not yet been translated into English.

11. For a brief description of these issues see Hammond 2018, 17–21. The literature on the problem of the eternity of the world is vast but see Richard C. Dales 1990. On the problem of one intellect for all see B. Carlos Bazán 2005.

12. F. van Steenberghen:

In short, St. Bonaventure’s philosophy is an eclectic Aristotelianism with neo-Platonic tendencies, put at the service of an Augustinian theology. (1946 [1955: 162])

The difference between the two lies in this: St. Thomas had meditated deeply on philosophical problems and had carved out a solid system of philosophy before using it in theology; while St. Bonaventure did not do this to the same extent. (1946 [1955: 159])

The existence of God Bonaventure “treated in summary fashion”. Cf. Steenberghen 1966: 268–271. For an extensive review of how Bonaventure has been regarded as a philosopher, see Quinn 1973: 17–99.

13. “Rarely if ever has the relation between the philosophical doctrine of being and the trinitarian dogma of faith been worked out with such elaborate care” (Hayes 1979: 27, “Introduction”).

14. Philippi Cancellarii, Summa de bono, “De bono naturae”, q. 3 (49: 48–54):

Haec enim est intentio secundum proprietatem illius philosophiae ut ostendatur mobile et motum et tempus esse coaequeva, neque in amplius possunt rationes quae ibi sumuntur ex principiis illius philosophiae. Quod si ipsum mobile esset aeternum, motus esset aeternus et tempus. Non fuit autem de proprietate illius philosophiae investigare exitum primi mobilis in esse et sic separare mobile ab immobili, ut in planetis, sed quod motus sit ab immobili. Nec determinat quod ille motor sit prima causa.

Albertus Magnus, In II Sent., d. 1, B, art. 11 (ed. Borgnet, 30b):

… Aristoteles in veritate non dicit hoc, quod tria vel duo sint principia mundi. Sed ipse probat duo non incepisse per motum, scilicet materiam et motorem primum: et ideo imponitur ei quod duo dixerit esse ab aeterno;

and In II Sent., d. 1, B, art. 10 (ed. Borgnet, 27a):

…ergo etiamsi concedunt philosophi quod Deus est principium totius mundi, sicut omnes philosophi concedunt, non est necesse ponere propter hoc mundum incepisse.

15. Robert Grosseteste, Hexaemeron, I.viii.4 (60–61):

Ex his itaque et multis aliis quae afferri possent nisi prohiberet prolixitas, evidenter patet quod plurimi philosophorum simul cum Aristotele asseruerunt mundum carere temporis principio; quos unius verbi ictu percutit et elidit Moyses dicens: In principio. Haec adduximus contra quosdam modernos, qui nituntur contra ipsum Aristotelem et suos expositores et sacros simul expositores de Aristotele haeretico facere catholicum, mira caecitate et praesumptione putantes se limpidius intelligere et verius interpretari Aristotelem ex littera latina corrupta quam philosophos, tam gentiles quam catholicos, qui eius litteram incorruptam originalem graecam plenissime noverunt. Non igitur se decipiant et frustra desudent ut Aristotelem faciant catholicum, ne inutiliter tempus suum et vires ingenii consument, et Aristotelem catholicum constituendo, se ipsos haereticos faciant.

Guillelmi Alverni episcopi Parisiensis, De universo, Secunda pars primae partis principalis, cap. 8 (p. 690, col. 2, H):

Quidquid igitur dicatur, et quicumque conentur excusare Aristotelem, haec indubitanter fuit eius sententia, quod mundus est aeternus et quod non coepit esse; et de motu similiter sensit, et Avicenna post eum. Et adduxerunt rationes et probationes ad hoc. Similiter et alii expositores eiusdem Aristotelis id ipsum senserunt atque fecerunt.

16. “Et magis rationabile est quam suum oppositum, scilicet quod materia fuerit aeternaliter imperfecta, sine forma et divina influentia, sicut posuerunt quidam philosophorum; et adeo rationabilius, ut etiam ille excellentior inter philosophos, Aristoteles, secundum quod Sancti imponunt, et commentatores exponunt, et verba eius praetendunt, in hunc errorem dilapsus fuerit.”

17. “Respondeo: Dicendum quod ponere mundum aeternum esse sive aeternaliter productum, ponendo res omnes ex nihilo productas, omnino est contra veritatem et rationem, sicut ultima ratio probat; et adeo contra rationem, ut nullum philosophorum quantumcumque parvi intellectus crediderim hoc posuisse. Hoc enim implicat in se manifestam contradictionem.—Ponere autem mundum aeternum, praesupposita aeternitate materiae, rationabile videtur et intelligible…”

For the differing interpretations of Bonaventure’s position on creation and the eternity of the world, see Stephen Baldner 1989; Matthew D. Walz 1998.

18.“…impossibile est, quod habet esse post non-esse habere esse aeternum, quoniam hic est implicatio contradictionis; sed mundus habet esse post non-esse; ergo impossibile est esse aeternum. Quod autem habeat esse post non-esse, probatur sic: omne illud quod totaliter habet esse ab aliquo, producitur ab illo ex nihilo; sed mundus totaliter habet esse a Deo; ergo mundus ex nihilo; sed non ex nihilo materialiter; ergo originaliter. Quod autem omne quod totaliter producitur ab aliquo differente per essentiam, habeat esse ex nihilo, patens est. Nam quod totaliter producitur, producitur secundum materiam et formam; sed materia non habet ex quo producatur, quia non ex Deo; manifestum est igitur quod ex nihilo”.

The term “after” needs to be carefully understood here; “after” does not function as a temporal designator since we are explaining, in part, the very origin of time itself. Bonaventure himself prefers the locution that things are created with time (see In II Sent., d. 2, p. 1, dub. 2 [Quaracchi II: 69b–70b])

19. The term “physical matter” is being employed instead of simply “matter” because matter in its essence is actually broader than physical matter. Insofar as matter denotes a principle of potentiality, matter is found even in non-physical entities such as angels and human souls. See section IV, rational creatures.

20. “…cum privationes et defectus nullatenus possint cognosci nisi per positiones, non venit intellectus noster ut plene resolvens intellectum alicuius entium creatorum nisi iuvetur ab intellectu entis purissimi, actualissimi, completissimi, et absoluti, quod est ens simpliciter et aeternum, in quo sunt rationes omnium in sua puritate. Quomodo autem sciret intellectus hoc esse ens defectivum et incompletum, si nullam haberet cognitionem entis absque omni defectu? Et sic de aliis conditionibus praelibatis”.

21. “Cum autem non-esse privatio sit essendi, non cadit in intellectum nisi per esse; esse autem non cadit per aliud, quia omne quod intelligitur, aut intelligitur ut non ens, aut ut ens in potentia, aut ut ens in actu. Si igitur non ens non potest intelligi nisi per ens, et ens in potentia per ens in actu, et esse nominat ipsum purum actum entis: esse igitur est quod primo cadit in intellectu, et illud esse est quod est actus purus. Sed hoc non est esse particulare, quod est esse arctatum, quia permixtum est cum potentia; nec esse analogum, quia minime habet de actu, eo quod minime est. Restat igitur, quod illud esse est esse divinum”.

Much of Bonaventure’s argumentation here depends upon the teaching of Guibert de Tournai.

22. “Intellectum autem propositionum tunc intellectus dicitur veraciter comprehendere, cum certitudinaliter scit, illas veras esse; et hoc scire est scire, quoniam non potest falli in illa comprehensione. Scit enim, quod veritas illa non potest aliter se habere; scit, igitur, illam veritatem esse incommutabilem. Sed cum ipsa mens nostra sit commutabilis, illam sic incommutabiliter relucentem non potest videre nisi per aliquam lucem omnino incommutabiliter radiantem, quam impossibile est esse creaturam mutabilem. Scit igitur in illa luce, quae illuminat omnem hominem venientem in hunc mundum, quae est lux vera et Verbum in principio apud Deum”.

23. “Sic credendum indubitanter, quod animae humanae non tantummodo dederit [sc. Deus] intellectum possibilem, sed etiam agentem, ita quod uterque est aliquid ipsius animae”.

24. The disjunctive transcendentals are: posterior and prior; from another and not from another; possible and necessary; relative and absolute; qualified and absolute; from another and from itself; by participation and essentially; potential and actual; composite and simple; and changeable and unchangeable.

25. “Volens igitur contemplari Dei invisibilia quoad essentiae unitatem primo defigat aspectum in ipsum esse et videat, ipsum esse adeo in se certissimum, quod non potest cogitari non esse”.

26. “Quia ipsum esse purissimum non occurrit nisi in plena fuga non-esse, sicut et nihil in plena fuga esse. Sicut igitur omnino nihil nihil habet de esse nec de eius conditionibus; sic econtra ipsum esse nihil habet de non-esse, nec actu nec potentia, nec secundum veritatem rei nec secundum aestimationem nostram”.

27. “Cum autem non-esse privatio sit essendi, non cadit in intellectum nisi per esse; esse autem non cadit per aliud, quia omne, quod intelligitur, aut intelligitur ut non ens, aut ut ens in potentia, aut ut ens in actu. Si igitur non ens non potest intelligi nisi per ens, et ens in potentia non nisi per ens in actu; et esse nominat ipsum purum actum entis: esse igitur est quod primo cadit in intellectu, et illud esse est quod est purus actus”.

28. “Sed hoc non est esse particulare, quod est esse arctatum, quia permixtum est cum potentia, nec esse analogum, quia minime habet de actu, eo quod minime est. Restat igitur, quod illud esse est esse divinum”.

29. Cf. J. Seifert 1992: 218, for whom the argument takes its “starting point in the objective essence and not in a mere concept of God”.