Robert Boyle

First published Tue Jan 15, 2002; substantive revision Mon Aug 4, 2025

Best known today as the father of chemistry, Robert Boyle (1627–1691) has, since the early 1990s, emerged as a significant figure in early modern philosophy, not only through his influence on the likes of John Locke and Isaac Newton, but as a thinker in his own right. His key philosophical contributions were to early modern matter theory, the theory of material qualities, the critique of the scholastic theory of forms and the philosophy of experiment. Boyle’s intellectual range was broad and included ethics, natural theology, and especially natural philosophy. His literary output was also varied, ranging from autobiography, essays, romance, natural history, natural theology, to philosophy. His major contributions to the development of new literary genres included the genre of the natural philosophical desiderata, especially lists of queries, and most of all, the experimental report. He was also responsible for a number of important neologisms, including ‘corpuscularian,’ experimentum crucis (crucial experiment) and ‘secondary quality’ in the Lockean sense.

1. Life

Robert Boyle was the leading natural philosopher in England before Newton. The second youngest of fifteen children to the Earl of Cork, Richard Boyle (Canny 1982), and Lady Catherine Fenton, the precocious Robert wrote an autobiography around the age of twenty-one entitled “An Account of Philaretus during his Minority” (Boyle 1994) which is the major source for information concerning his early life.

Boyle was born at Lismore Castle in Ireland but spent most of his adult life in England. Like many sons of leading aristocrats, he was sent on a grand tour during his teens, spending time in Geneva where he mastered the French language and underwent a Christian conversion experience, and in Florence, where he was when Galileo died.

Initially, the young Boyle aspired to the writing of moral philosophy (Boyle 1991b; Corneanu 2020) and romances (Principe 1994b, 1995), however, around 1649 he turned to the study of nature (Hunter 1995b, 2015b) and over the next decade was to undergo an intellectual transformation that would see him emerge as England’s leading natural philosopher. The seminal years were those from the mid-1650s where at Oxford he was a member of the Oxford Philosophical Club together with the likes of John Wilkins and where he undertook ground-breaking experimental work in pneumatics, hydrostatics, chymistry and animal physiology (Chalmers 2017; Principe 1998). He was a central figure in a group now dubbed the Oxford physiologists (Frank Jr 1980) and a founding member of the Royal Society which began in 1660. Indeed, in the list of founding members of the Royal Society, Boyle is second only to the President, Viscount Brouncker.

Boyle was a prolific experimenter and writer, penning some forty-two published books and leaving a huge Nachlass that contains much material that is yet fully to be exploited by scholars (BP; Hunter 2007). He corresponded with and influenced leading philosophers such as Spinoza, Leibniz, Hobbes and Henry More, but his most important philosophical legacy is found in the philosophy of Locke (Anstey 2020) and the natural philosophical writings and practice of Newton. Boyle was popularly known as The English Philosopher, though this appellation meant ‘natural philosopher’, and it is important to point out that the disciplinary boundaries of the twenty-first century are very different to those of the late seventeenth. He was also known as a Christian Virtuoso because of his piety and sustained commitment to the Christian faith which manifested itself in many writings of Christian apologetics as well as his bequest for the establishment of the Boyle Lectures which, in turn, issued in many influential writings, such as Richard Bentley’s correspondence with Newton (Bentley 1756). Above all, however, Boyle was known as an experimental philosopher and was often called the father of experimental philosophy (D’Alembert 1995, 86). Indeed, he was at the vanguard of the new experimental philosophy that emerged in England in the late 1650s and was to become the preeminent approach to the study of nature by the early eighteenth century (Anstey and Vanzo 2023).

Boyle left Oxford to be permanently domiciled in the house of his sister Lady Ranelagh in Pall Mall in 1668 where he resided for the rest of his life. He died on 31 December 1691 just one week after the death of his beloved sister. In his Will he appointed Locke as one of three executors of his chymical papers and copies Locke had made have proven to be a wonderful resource for understanding early modern chymistry (see Starkey 2004). (The definitive biography of Boyle is Hunter 2009. The best older biography is Maddison 1969.)

2. Experimental Philosophy

It was common in the latter half of the seventeenth century in England to distinguish between experimental and speculative philosophy. The early modern experimental–speculative distinction applies, in the first instance, to two contrasting methods of practising natural philosophy or the study of nature. Experimental philosophers gave priority to observation and experiment in the acquisition of new knowledge about the nature and behaviour of the material realm; speculative philosophers, by contrast, reasoned from predetermined principles or hypotheses and used observation and experiment to confirm their theories or, in some cases, ignored observation altogether. The distinction is a historical one and, in the case of Boyle, it is a structural feature that characterises his philosophy. (Of course, early modern experimental philosophy is only a distant ancestor of contemporary experimental philosophy or x-phi: they differ vastly in scope and methods but share some broad epistemic values. See Anstey and Vanzo 2015.) Boyle’s experimental philosophy had two salient features: first, it used a Baconian approach to the study of nature; and second, it included a philosophy of experiment.

2.1 Boyle’s Baconian approach to the study of nature

Boyle’s approach to the study of nature was strongly influenced by the writings of Francis Bacon (Sargent 1995; Knight 2020; Anstey and Vanzo 2023). Like virtually all his contemporaries, Boyle was committed to the view that scientific knowledge, scientia, has to be demonstrated from foundational principles. The task of the natural philosopher, what today we would call the philosophically-minded scientist, is to discover these principles and then to demonstrate the science from them.

In a series of elaborate methodological writings and natural historical works, Bacon had claimed that the way to discover the principles or axioms of nature was to construct natural histories of the subject at hand. These natural histories were to be vast collections of observations and experiments that were to be ordered and sifted in such a way that one could discover intermediate causes or axioms and eventually proceed to the ultimate axioms (principles) of the science.

Furthermore, Bacon’s conception of natural history encompassed everything from the heavens to the seabed (see Parasceve, Bacon 2004: 449–85); it was a far cry from the sort of classificatory natural history that began to flourish in the seventeenth century and reached its zenith in the writings of Karl Linnaeus in the mid-eighteenth century. Baconian natural histories were to be made not simply of natural kinds but of the qualities of bodies, the states of bodies, geographical regions, meteorology, and even life and death. Thus, Book Two of Bacon’s New Organon is largely given over to an exemplar natural history of heat, heat being one of the four Aristotelian primary qualities along with cold, wet and dry. It is hardly surprising, therefore, that Boyle’s first fully developed natural history is his History of Cold (1665, BW, 4), the second of the Aristotelian primary qualities. (Though see §3.2 below for Boyle’s new approach to the theory of qualities.) In fact, Boyle conceived of many of his large-scale research projects as natural histories, and he wrote provisional natural histories of cold, the air, colours, fluidity and firmness, mineral waters and human blood. It is not too much to claim that all his scientific achievements are constituents of and arise from this ambitious program of Baconian natural history.

Moreover, the process of fact gathering for the multifarious natural histories undertaken by Boyle and his contemporaries were too large for any one individual to carry out on their own: it was regarded as a community and often an international enterprise. And Boyle and many others in the early Royal Society of London pursued means of accumulating the data for natural histories from abroad. Boyle, famously, published instructions on how to go about this in the Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society (BW, 5:508–11). This process of the accumulation of observations and experiments was facilitated by the new scientific societies in England, France, Ireland and Italy in the latter decades of the seventeenth century. It was also structured around lists of queries and desiderata and the query forms a crucial constituent of Boyle’s scientific methodology (Boyle 2005; Hunter 2015c).

These features of Boyle’s scientific methodology may seem arcane and irrelevant to contemporary philosophers of science, however, they are crucial for explaining why it is not simply anachronistic but incorrect to think of Boyle and his ilk as practising a form of hypothetico-deductive reasoning or as being empiricists in the post-Kantian sense; they were experimental philosophers practising natural history and seeking the ultimate principles of nature.

2.2 Boyle’s philosophy of experiment

Boyle was one of the first philosophers ever to develop a philosophy of experiment. His view, which derived in part from Francis Bacon, has many parallels with that of his fellow experimenter Robert Hooke and this Bacon–Boyle–Hooke philosophy of experiment is one of only a handful of philosophical treatments of experiment from the late seventeenth century (Sargent 1995; Anstey 2014). The salient feature of Boyle’s philosophy of experiment is his typology of experiments, deriving from Bacon, which is tied to his view that experiments are required for the discovery of the principles of the sciences and are constituents of natural histories. Boyle’s typology of experiments is rich and extensive; only the major types will be discussed here (see Anstey and Hunter 2008 for more types of experiment in Boyle).

2.2.1 Experiments of light and fruit

The most broad-ranging types of experiments are the contrasting pair, experiments of light (luciferous experiments) and experiments of fruit (fructiferous experiments). Experiments of light reveal underlying causes, whereas experiments of fruit produce knowledge or artefacts that are useful. Experiments of light take us closer to the principles of a science, such as the relation between the volume and the pressure of the air; fruitful experiments have practical or utilitarian outcomes, such as gunpowder. Boyle was aware, however, that many experiments are both light-bearing and fruitful (BW, 6:433–4). One might instance the experiments that gave rise to Boyle’s discovery of a precursor to litmus tests for distinguishing acids from alkalis (BW, 10:224–33).

2.2.2 Exploratory experiments

Interestingly, Boyle coined the term ‘exploratory experiment’ to describe a form of experimentation that includes “The devising of New and convenient Tools or other Instruments for altering the usual State or the common course of things, and for thereby reducing nature to vary her Course and afford the Enquirers some new Phaenomena” (BP, 9:52). This is clearly a precursor to the contemporary notion of exploratory experiment (Steinle 2016).

2.2.3 Unsuccessful experiments

As a prolific experimenter, Boyle was fully aware that many experiments do not succeed, while others do succeed once but are then unable to be replicated. He reflected on unsuccessful experiments at various places in his writings, including two long essays on the subject, illustrated with copious examples, in his Certain Physiological Essays (1661, BW, 2:37–82). First, Boyle details problems with the experimental materials. This was a particular problem for early modern chymists who regularly had to deal with impure and inferior chymical substances. Second, Boyle sets out examples of the contingencies involved, often hidden, in performing experiments. For example, some chymical experiments can only be performed on small quantities of the relevant material and that the effectiveness of many chymical procedures is not scale invariant (BW, 2:59). Nevertheless, for Boyle, an experiment or experimental program should not be dismissed even if it fails to meet its immediate objective. Some of these reflections seem almost amateurish to us today after nearly 400 years of the development of experimental techniques and protocols, yet in many areas Boyle was the first experimental natural philosopher to write about these matters in the abstract.

2.2.4 Crucial experiments

Another term coined by Boyle was Experimentum crucis or ‘crucial experiment’ (BW, 3:50). This notion also has Baconian origins, deriving from Bacon’s broader notion of crucial instances which are constituents of a natural history and include both observations and experiments (Bacon, New Organon, II:36). Boyle’s notion was more constrained, applying only to those experiments which enable one to choose between two competing explanations of a phenomenon. The notion would be picked up by Newton in his early optical writings, though Newton abandoned the notion by the late 1680s when he began to draft the Opticks which first appeared in 1704 (Newton 1672:3079; 1704).

2.2.5 Proof by experiment

If an experiment proves decisive when it comes to the choice of an explanation, as in the case of a crucial experiment, it seems only fitting to speak of the experiment as compelling assent or as proving the explanation under consideration. Boyle adopted this intuitive notion of proof by experiment and used the term ‘experimental proof’ and its cognates widely in his experimental writings (BW, 2:221–2, 304; 5:196). In this, he was possibly following Blaise Pascal who had used similar locutions in French (Pascal 1698, 52–3). Boyle was aware that experimental proofs are not demonstrative, that is, they are unlike geometrical proofs, however, they were still rationally compelling.

2.2.6 Thought experiments

Boyle was acutely aware of the practical and physical limits of experimental design and that in some cases the natural philosopher had to resort to appendices containing descriptions of thought experiments. He speaks of:

fictitious Experiments, wherein Processes and other wayes of Operating are propos’d to supply the defect of real Experiments, when we want them to determine doubts, to resolve Questions or for other Purposes; and these may be so contriv’d that probably which way soever the Event falls out, useful considerations may be rais’d upon it. And to this Appendix may belong the grand transition which is to serve as it were for a Bridge to pass on from what is already perform’d in the foregoing History, to a continuation of it, and a further progress in the discovery of universal Nature. (Boyle 2008a, 5)

Boyle is possibly the first philosopher ever to speak of what we now call thought experiments, though he does so in the context of the practice of natural philosophy and not philosophy more generally. His use of and reflections on thought experiments also give the lie to Thomas Kuhn’s claim that practitioners of what he called the Baconian sciences, and in particular, Boyle, were strongly opposed to thought experiments (Kuhn 1976, 13).

2.3 Boyle’s Law

Boyle’s Law does stem from Boyle’s work, but it is not what Boyle took himself to have demonstrated. Boyle’s Law holds for ideal gases and can be summarized as \(PV = k,\)where \(k\) is a constant, and \(P\) and \(V\) are pressure and volume respectively.

It was suggested to Boyle by Richard Townley, on the basis of Boyle’s experiments with the Torricellian apparatus inside his air-pump, that the ‘spring’ (pressure) and volume of the air might stand in an inverse relation. So, Boyle conceived of two new experiments to show the way in which, as we would say, the pressure and the volume of the air vary, when the air is, in Boyle’s words, either “compressed or dilated.” He had a long J-tube made and began to make a few measurements of variations of the height of the air trapped at the end of the j-tube as the quantity of mercury in the J-tube was increased or decreased. Subsequently, he made similar observations on the expansion of the air with a long pipette and concluded that “the pressures and expansions to be in reciprocal proportion” (BW, 3:59) It is important to recall, however, that there was no conception of the gaseous state in the seventeenth century: the air was considered to be a liquid. Nevertheless, Boyle did establish experimentally that the air had spring and that the spring (pressure) and volume of the air are in an inverse relation – e.g., if you halve the volume you double the pressure of a quantity of air.

He does not take himself to have shown anything more than this. He does remark that further experiments may show that the relationship holds outside the boundary conditions imposed by the experimental set-up, but the experiments he made certainly do not show that. What Boyle expressly said was,

till further trial hath more clearly informed me, I shall not venture to determine, whether or no the intimated theory will hold universally and precisely, either in condensation of air, or rarefaction: all that I shall now urge being, that…the trial already made sufficiently proves the main thing, for which I here allege it; since by it, it is evident, that as common air, when reduced to half its wonted extent, obtained near about twice as forcible a spring as it had before, so this thus comprest air being further thrust into half this narrow room, obtained thereby a spring about as strong again as that it last had, and consequently four times as strong as that of the common air. (BW, 3:60)

Thus Boyle’s Law, for Boyle, was not a universal generalization about ideal gases: it was a strictly limited claim about common or atmospheric air. Boyle did add that “there is no cause to doubt, that if we had been here furnished with a greater quantity of quicksilver and a very strong tube, we might, by a further compression of the included air, have made it counter balance the pressure of a far taller and heavier cylinder of mercury” (BW, 3:60). Importantly, he did not claim that the same ratio between pressure and volume would hold in such more extreme cases. Nor did he claim that there are no limits to the possible compression.

3. Speculative Natural Philosophy

Boyle’s speculative natural philosophy has four salient features: first, a corpuscular matter theory; second, a sophisticated theory of material qualities; third, a set of explanatory principles that constrain the types of explanations that are acceptable in natural philosophy; and fourth, an account of how God relates to nature. Yet this is not all, for Boyle went to great lengths to use his experimental natural philosophy as an evidential base for his speculative theories and principles so that they formed a unified whole. Thus, the work which contains his most sustained “Theoricall” (theoretical) discussion of the theories of qualities and forms, namely Forms and Qualities, also contains a very long “historical” section listing copious experimental evidence for his own speculative theories (BW, 5:305–77 theoretical part; 318–443 historical part). Our discussion here sets out the four features of his speculative philosophy and concludes with an example of one of the experimental strategies that he used to combine the experimental with the speculative and so to provide an integrated philosophy of nature.

Like most of his contemporaries, Boyle conceived of all beings in terms of the substance–attribute distinction; he was a dualist about substances, believing that there are material and immaterial substances; and his worldview was shaped by his Christian theological commitments. These are the terms of reference he used when developing a philosophy of nature.

3.1 The corpuscular theory of matter

There was enormous variety and complexity among early modern matter theories. Old theories, such as Democratian and Epicurean atomism were revived, different versions of the Aristotelian theory were widely endorsed, and new theories, such as Paracelsian and Helmontian theories, emerged. One of the key battlegrounds in the rejection of the Scholastic theory of forms was matter theory, and exciting developments in chymistry – the precursor to modern chemistry (Newman and Principle 1998) – had implications for theorising about the nature and behaviour of matter. Boyle’s many writings and experiments on matter theory can only be understood against this background but this area of Boyle’s studies is highly technical and quickly shifts from strictly philosophical questions to the history of early modern chemistry, geology and pneumatics. The summary provided here aims to keep philosophical issues to the fore.

A corpuscular matter theory is one in which the qualities and behaviour of matter are explained in terms of the motions and structure of sub-microscopic corpuscles (extremely small bodies) that may or may not be infinitely divisible (see Lüthy, Murdoch and Newman 2001). As such, corpuscular matter theories deploy a particulate rather than continuous conception of matter in order to explain material phenomena. The primary focus of corpuscular matter theories was explanatory rather than metaphysical and they remained neutral on the question of the existence of uncuttable atoms versus infinite divisibility. Boyle was the leading early modern advocate of corpuscular matter theory; indeed, he coined the terms ‘corpuscularian’ and ‘corpuscular philosophy’ (BW, 2:85, 87; Anstey 2019, 37) and believed that his promotion of the theory had been quite successful:

I acknowledge, it is not unwelcome to me to have been (in some little measure) instrumental to make the Corpuscularian Philosophy, assisted by Chymistry, preferred to that which has so long obtained in the Schools. (BW, 5:393)

For Boyle, the basic explanatory unit of matter is the prima naturalia. These are material particles with shape, size and motion that cannot be broken down through experimental processes, even if they are not in principle indivisible (BW, 5:325–6; Newman 2006, chap. 6). These are the ‘ground-level’ explanatory units of the corpuscular matter theory from which all else arises, both material qualities and the behaviour of bodies.

3.1.1 Homogenous matter

According to Boyle, all matter is homogeneous: it is the same stuff (BW 5:305, 333). So, if the prima naturalia were divisible, say, by God, then their constituents would be the same stuff. There are no material elements, or better, there is just one element, namely, matter. This commitment to homogeneity set Boyle at odds with scholastic theories of matter that posited four elements, earth, air, fire and water (though Boyle saw a parallel with prime matter (BW, 8:308)), as well as the Paracelsian tripartite theory of salt, sulphur and mercury, and various other pluralist theories of his day. The commitment to homogeneity aligned Boyle with Descartes and with early modern atomists, such as Gassendi, and Boyle’s corpuscularianism is rightly seen as an experimentalist’s via media between the Cartesian and atomist positions on the divisibility of matter (BW, 2:87).

3.1.2 Matter and empty space

While he performed ground-breaking experiments in pneumatics that involved the creation of what we now understand to be partial vacuums, Boyle hedged his bets on the question of the truth of the Cartesian definition of matter and therefore on the question of the possibility of a vacuum (e.g., BW, 6:386). He claims that matter is impenetrable (BW, 5:305, 335; 12:391) but in one place expresses doubt as to whether impenetrability is an essential attribute of matter (BW, 8:308).

3.1.3 Causal powers of matter

Boyle was far more decisive on the question of matter and motion: motion is not intrinsic to matter (BW, 5:306, 333). Yet Boyle did not go as far as many Cartesians and deprive matter of all causal efficacy. He claimed that matter has the power to transfer motion on collision (BW, 10:188, 457) to persevere in a state of motion (BW, 10:509) and can change the direction (determination) of motion (BW, 9:407–8). While Boyle does not develop these aspects of his conception of matter in a systematic manner, it seems likely that these powers are related to matter’s impenetrability. This conception of matter also precludes Boyle from holding a strong form of occasionalism.

3.2 The theory of material qualities

The longstanding scholastic theory of qualities held that the primary qualities (primae qualitates) are the two pairs of opposites hot/cold and wet/dry. These primary qualities, in conjunction with the theories of natural states, places and motions, were used to explain all other qualities of bodies as well as the elements themselves. Thus, the differences between the secondary qualities heavy/light and dense/rare were explained using hot, cold, wet and dry together with the doctrines of natural motions and natural places. Boyle rejected the doctrines of natural states (e.g., that the natural state of water is liquid), natural places and natural motions (Anstey 2000, chaps 5 and 6) and developed a mechanical theory of qualities. Under the influence of Descartes and the long tradition of atomism beginning with Democritus, Boyle claimed that the most basic “inseparable accidents” of bodies were shape, size, motion (BW, 5: 307), and for compounds, texture (BW, 5: 334). As a result, the explanantia on the Aristotelian theory, namely, hot, cold, wet and dry, become the explananda and, indeed, Boyle wrote natural histories of cold and fluidity and firmness, following the precedent of Bacon who began a natural history of heat in Book Two of the New Organon (see Anstey 2013).

3.2.1 The mechanical affections

Shape, size, motion and texture are, thanks to Locke’s influence, normally called primary qualities (Locke 1975, 2.8). However, for Boyle, they are normally designated the mechanical affections of matter, that is, they are inseparable features of all matter that feature in the ‘mechanical explanations’ of the other qualities of bodies. To be sure, sometimes Boyle follows Suárez and Descartes by calling them modes of matter (BW, 5:316; 6:267), however, since they are the foundation upon which one can build a theory of qualities, all other material qualities are founded upon the mechanical affections.

3.2.1 Secondary qualities

The foundational nature of the mechanical affections accounts for the naming of the sensible qualities as secondary qualities:

I say not, that there are no other Accidents in Bodies then Colours, Odours, and the like; for I have already taught, that there are simpler and more Primitive Affections of Matter, from which these Secondary Qualities if I may so call them, do depend: and that the Operations of Bodies upon one another spring from the same, we shall see by and by. (BW, 5:317)

Though, for Boyle, strictly speaking, the secondary qualities – he only uses the term in this sense once – are all those qualities that are derived from the mechanical affections. (See Downing 2011; Anstey 2000, chap. 4.)

3.2.3 Dispositions and relations

As a practising chymist, Boyle was acutely aware that substances can acquire and lose powers. In reflecting on this fact he deployed, famously, the example of the lock and key:

in Regard that these two Pieces of Iron might now be Applied to one another after a Certain manner, and that there was a Congruitie betwixt the Wards of the Lock and those of the Key, the Lock and the Key did each of them now Obtain a new Capacity and it became a Main part of the Notion and Description of a Lock, that it was capable of being made to Lock or Unlock by that other Piece of Iron we call a Key, and it was Lookd upon as a Peculiar Faculty and Power in the Key, that it was Fitted to Open and Shut the Lock, and yet by these new Attributes there was not added any Real or Physical Entity, either to the Lock, or to the Key, each of them remaining indeed nothing, but the same Piece of Iron, just so Shap’d as it was before. (BW, 5:310)

On the one hand, Boyle claims that the lock and the key obtain new powers when one came to exist at the same time as the other; on the other hand, this new power does not seem to be any addition of being. How is this so?

The interpretation of Boyle’s views about dispositional properties is contested. The central question is the ontological status of dispositions, but there are dangers of anachronism for the interpreter on this question. Boyle did not have the distinction between dispositional and categorical properties; nor did he have the distinction between extrinsic and intrinsic powers. What is clear from his various discussions of the nature of material powers or dispositions is that he thoroughly explored the philosophical contours of the problem within his own terms of reference; what is unclear is whether one can extract a consistent, definitive position on the problem from his writings. In some places Boyle claims in unambiguous terms that dispositions are relations and he appears to claim that they are extrinsic properties (BW, 6:282, 521). However, elsewhere he implies that they are fully reducible to the mechanical affections of bodies that have them. (Anstey 2000, chap. 4 claims Boyle ultimately held no determinate view; Molnar 2003, 102–5 focuses on extrinsic versus intrinsic powers; Pasnau 2011, 521–5 denies Boyle believed bodies have powers.)

3.2.4 Occult and real qualities

One of the whipping boys of the scholastic theory of qualities was the category of occult quality, such things as the dormitive virtue of opium. The charge was that positing them provided no explanatory advance. However, the term ‘occult quality’ had a more neutral sense connoting ‘hidden’ in contrast to manifest quality. Boyle accepted the existence of many occult qualities in this sense, qualities that were not explananda but were rather those whose explanations were desiderata for the natural philosopher (M. B. Hall 1987, 124–43; Anstey 2000, 22–4).

Boyle was far more critical of the doctrine of real qualities, used, for example, to explain the Catholic doctrine of the eucharist. These were qualities that supposedly could exist independently of an underlying substance. For Boyle, these were substances, “Accidents in name” only, and since they could not be substances, they are not “real and distinct Entities” (BW, 5:309).

3.3 Speculative and explanatory principles

Needless to say, Boyle’s speculative corpuscularianism called out for philosophical justification. He achieved this by appealing to a range of explanatory principles. Here, it is important to distinguish between ontological and propositional principles, the former being such things as matter and motion (BW, 8:105, 115), the latter being propositions such as the law of non-contradiction or the principle of sufficient reason. Boyle’s Excellency and Grounds of the Mechanical Hypothesis is an extended argument based on explanatory principles for the superiority of the corpuscular hypothesis. He appeals to: 1. the clarity and intelligibility of the corpuscular matter theory; 2. the parsimony of the principles; 3. their ontological primacy; 4. their simplicity; and 5. their comprehensiveness (BW, 8:105–7). He concludes on grounds of comparative plausibility that, together with his experimental evidence, the corpuscular matter theory is more plausible than its competitors (see Anstey 2019; Downing 2011).

Yet all this is predicated on some further, background explanatory principles such as the efficacy of structural explanations as well as certain claims about ontological reduction. In particular, Boyle was committed to what we might call the Familiarity Condition: all explanations of the unobserved must be made in terms of properties, causes and laws with which we are already familiar. He claims that to explain a phenomenon is “to deduce it from something else in Nature more known to Us, then the thing to be explain’d by It” (BW, 5:351–2; see also Anstey 2000, 55–7). Thus, “the Mechanical affections of Matter are to be found, and the Laws of Motion take place, not onely in the great Masses, and the middle-siz’d Lumps, but in the smallest Fragments of Matter” (BW 8:107).

Moreover, Boyle, who was the main promotor of the mechanical philosophy in the seventeenth century, sometimes used the term ‘mechanical philosophy’ and its cognates as synonyms for ‘corpuscular philosophy’ (BW, 2:87; 8:32) where ‘mechanical’ connotes explanations of natural phenomena by analogy with the functioning of machines that operate only by physical contact. According to Boyle, all natural phenomena “are Physically produc’d by the Mechanical affections of the parts of Matter, and what they operate upon one another according to Mechanical Laws” (BW, 8:104). Again,

yet whatever is done among things Inanimate, which make incomparably the greatest part of the Universe, is really done but by particular Bodies, acting on one another by Local Motion, Modifi’d by the other Mechanical Affections of the Agent, of the Patient, and of those other Bodies, that necessarily concur to the Effect, or the Phænomenon produc’d. (BW, 10:470)

3.4 God and nature

Boyle’s talk of bodies operating “according to Mechanical Laws” seems to presuppose that matter has causal powers and naturally invites inquiry into his conception of the laws of nature.

3.4.1 Laws of nature

It is important to appreciate that Boyle was among the very first generation to incorporate Descartes’ new notion of laws of nature into a general philosophy of nature. Nevertheless, Boyle’s notion of laws is not fully divested of its anthropocentric origins:

A Law being but a Notional Rule of Acting according to the declar’d Will of a Superior, ‘tis plain, that nothing but an Intellectual Being can be properly capable of receiving and acting by a Law. (BW, 10:457)

Since matter, being inanimate, cannot “moderate and determine its own Motions; especially so, as to make them conformable to Laws” (ibid.), the “ordinary and general Concourse” of God is required for matter to behave in a lawlike manner:

the Laws of Motion, without which the present State and Course of things could not be maintain’d, did not necessarily spring from the Nature of Matter, but depended upon the Will of the Divine Author. (BW, 11:302)

Furthermore, the laws of nature are contingent. They may not apply in all worlds:

the Laws of this propagation of Motion among bodies [in other worlds], may be not the same with those that are established in our World: so that but one half, or some lesser part, (as a third,) of the Motion that is here communicated from a body of such a bulk and velocity, to another it finds at rest, or slower mov’d than it self, shall there pass from a Movent to the body it impells; though all circumstances, except the Laws of Motion, be suppos’d to be the same. (BW, 10:174; see also BOA, 264–5)

Indeed, they may not even apply everywhere in our world (BW, 6:305). This, no doubt, is one reason why Boyle was reluctant to generalise what was later to become Boyle’s Law (see §2.3).

3.4.2 Occasionalism

While Boyle explored the doctrine of occasionalism explicitly in an unpublished essay (Anstey 2000, 210–13), in print he is committed to the causal efficacy of matter with regard to its ability to persevere in motion, to transmit motion on collision and to change the direction of motion on collision. Material interactions that involve contact or collisions occur in a lawlike manner because of God’s concurrence. Just how these notions should be unpacked is disputed in the secondary literature on Boyle. In our view, however, the interpretation of best fit is that Boyle is a nomic or rule occasionalist who attributes causal powers to matter, which powers require God’s concurrence for them to manifest themselves in a lawlike manner. In short, one billiard ball has the power to transfer motion to another, but it is God who determines how much motion is transferred and the direction of that motion (see Anstey 2000, chap. 7; Molnar 2003, 103–5; Shannahan 1988).

3.4.3 Final causes

As for teleology, Boyle wrote an influential treatise entitled A Disquisition about the Final Causes of Natural Things which appeared in 1686 (BW, 11). In opposition to Epicurus, he argued that there are final causes and in opposition to Descartes, he claimed that in many cases we can have epistemic access to these final causes, though he agreed that we ought not be presumptuous in these matters. According to Boyle, there are four types of final cause that we can know. First, there are the “grand and General Ends of the whole World, such as the Exercising and Displaying the Creators immense Power.” Second, are the ends in the nature and motions of the celestial objects and the Earth. Third, there are the ends that pertain to the parts of animals and fourth there are human ends (BW, 11:87). Boyle was quite adamant that there are no ends that pertain to inanimate objects. In particular, he rejects any form of immanent teleology in virtue of which material objects are able to direct their behaviour: “For inanimate Agents act not by choice, but by a necessary impulse, and not being endow’d with Understanding and Will, cannot of themselves be able to moderate or to suspend their actions” (BW, 4:267; see Carlin 2011, 2012, 2020; Osler 1996).

3.5 Experimental evidence for the speculative philosophy: Reduction to the pristine state

Boyle, of course, was fully cognisant of the fact that he did not have epistemic access to the corpuscular level of material things. It was not possible, therefore, to provide direct observational evidence for corpuscularianism. However, there was one powerful abductive argument for the existence of his prima naturalia and that was chymical experiments in which a substance is put into solution and then recovered in its original form (reductio in pristinum statum). The natural inference is that the underlying corpuscular structures of the prima naturalia are preserved. In fact, the first experiment in the historical part of Forms and Qualities, the dissolving and recovery of strong-smelling white camphor, offers just such evidence (BW, 5:395–8). This is indicative of the best empirical evidence Boyle had for his speculative matter theory and it goes some way to satisfy his aim “to make it Probable … by Experiments … That almost all sorts of Qualities … may be produced Mechanically … by virtue of the Motion, Size, Figure, and Contrivance of their own Parts” (BW, 5:302). (See Newman 2006, chap. 7.)

4. Theory of Knowledge

Boyle seems to take a largely Cartesian approach to perception and even knowledge. Like Descartes, Boyle accepts innate ideas, and like Descartes, he describes the process of perception as involving both mechanical components in the body and brain and an interface of the brain with the soul. We will begin with his account of perception.

4.1 Sense perception

Boyle’s account of sense perception—as was typical among seventeenth-century thinkers—accepted in general outline the position of Roger Bacon, who was in turn simply collating the views of earlier Islamic writers on the subject, though of course the details of the causal interaction between percipient and perceived varied from writer to writer (See further Lindberg 1976; MacIntosh 1983; and Sutton 1998).

For Boyle, perception begins with information entering the brain as a result of causal interactions between the perceiver and the perceived object. While the details of this view are complicated and not fully spelled out, the initial causal interactions in the process of perception begin in the sense organs and are described in purely mechanical terms. In his unpublished essay “Divers Phenomena depend upon the Superficial Pores of Bodies” we are told that each sense organ is structured to admit only the particles in the environment that conform to the shapes or sizes of their minute openings (BW, 14:92). This is how he thinks we see but cannot hear with our eyes; the particles that the eyes let in are a different size and/or shape from the ones the ears let in. The same holds for all other sensory organs, i.e. their openings only let in or respond to the particles of a specific size or shape. A similar story is told in Determinate Nature of Effluviums (BW, 7:281–92), however, in the Appendix of Christian Virtuoso I, he drops the particles/pores talk and simply attributes the interaction between sense organs and the material in the environment to mechanical action (BW, 12:399). So, the essence of his account is that sense organs are mechanically stimulated by specific kinds of external bodies. A consequence of his account of sensation is that it sets a natural limit to the acuity of our sense organs. Each sense organ is only affected by a specific type of material in the environment, so if the organ is not affected in the right way, then either there is no perception, or the perception is obscure.

After the sense organs have done their jobs, the neural pathways conduct the sensory information to the brain. Once in the brain the information is processed by a subsystem or set of subsystems devoted to presenting it to the cognitive system, and to storing it thereafter in memory. Again, these processes are given a mechanical description: “There must be in the brain and its appendix the cerebellum, far more of mechanism than is obvious to the vulgar eye” (BW, 12:461).

The initial processing is done by a system, the common sense, that combines the inputs from the various sense organs (left eye + right eye; eyes + ears; etc.) which both discerns the objects of sense that are discoverable by multiple sense organs, such as motion, size, shape, and distinguishes the proper objects of one sense from those of another, such as light from sound, heat from taste, etc. (BW, 12:461–2). The brain then uses the faculty of imagination to both create an image of the sensed objects as well as to contract, enlarge, divide, compound, or in other ways alter the images of the sensed objects (BW, 12:63). The kind of image Boyle speaks of however – as we see in Kepler and Descartes – is not a conscious, optical image. After all, consciousness requires the brain to interact with the soul. Nevertheless, for Boyle, pre-conscious imaging, as well as storage of images in memory, are all accomplished in the brain.

At this point the information is ready to be perceived. And, just as we might expect from a substance dualist, Boyle thinks that perception occurs in the incorporeal soul, not the brain. The brain processes prepare the information for cognition, and the union of the immaterial mind with the brain, perhaps via the pineal gland, allows the mind to perceive the external objects. (BW, 5:316–22, 7:346–53, 8:67–9) On this point, Boyle gives the Cartesian account as the best current explanation of how perception includes the union of body and soul: the soul interacts with the pineal gland to receive the information from the brain and thereby perceive that information (BW, 8:67–8).

Thus, sense perception for Boyle is not a purely mechanical affair. Even though everything that occurs outside the body, inside the sense organs, and within the peripheral and central nervous systems are all given mechanical descriptions, that process is not the whole story. Once the information arrives at the pineal gland, it is the soul that perceives the sensory information.

These perceptions are the result of a divine law. According to Boyle, God has established a set of arbitrary laws that govern the interactions between created souls and brains. Boyle calls this metaphysical hybrid process supra-mechanical; the act of perception by the soul is not mechanically describable, nor is it a purely supernatural event because the majority of the process is mechanical (BW, 6:754). Hence, sensory perception is supra-mechanical, i.e. above, but not fully independent of, the mechanical. These laws are arbitrary in the sense that God could have set them up any way he liked, but once God has established the laws, they are sufficient to produce perception in the soul.

Given that souls are incorporeal adjuncts of the body, it follows that they are not materially destructible, and that the laws of interaction between soul and body are not laws of natural philosophy. Why grass looks green is a feature of the world which God decided upon and upholds. His reasons for this decision, says Boyle, were no doubt weighty, but they are, as to us, arbitrary (see, e.g., BP 2:62, BOA §3.5.1, p247; 2:105, BOA 3.5.21, p258; 9:40; 36.46v). (For a detailed discussion of Boyle’s views on perception see Anstey 2000.)

There are clear similarities here between Boyle and Descartes. Like Descartes, Boyle’s account of corporeal ideas posits three faculties: common sense, imagination and memory. Like Descartes, Boyle identifies the pineal gland as a likely location for the mind–body union, as well as claiming that God established arbitrary laws for that union, such that, sense-perceptions take place in the soul as a result of that union (BW, 3:23, 25). Of course, there are some differences between the two accounts. Unlike Descartes, Boyle does not give an account of how these faculties relate to each other. Moreover, Boyle distinguishes between three categories of causal interaction: mechanical, supernatural and supra-mechanical. Finally, he thinks of his discussion of the mind–body union as theological, not strictly philosophical: “[the aim of this discourse] is to find, by a heedful inspection into the works of God, just motives to admire, to praise, and to thank him for them” (BW, 12:477; see Anstey 2000).

4.2 Knowledge

While Boyle believes that knowledge is valuable for its own sake (BW, 13:350), he also believes that we should use our knowledge to improve the conditions of humanity and to relieve suffering (Hunter 2020). He was convinced that a new experimental approach to medicine and technology would produce better pharmaceuticals and healthier living conditions for all. He went so far as to propose that the recipes for effective and safe medicines be put into the public domain, to build (with his nephew Robert Fitzgerald) a water desalination system that can be used on board ships, and to suggest improvements to the designs of ships (see ibid.).

To be sure, there are several examples of Boyle passing along fantastic reports from travel journals, nevertheless, he repeatedly urges caution in attributions of knowledge. There are truths available to the human mind, but they require effort, patience and ingenuity to tease out. He also advocates for a pious epistemic humility on the part of all philosophers and naturalists:

For, whatsoever the Cause of the imperfection of our Knowledge about Physical matters be, that there is an Imperfection in that Knowledge is manifest; and that ought to be enough to keep us from being puffed up by such an imperfect Knowledge, and from undervaluing upon its account the study of those mysteries of Divinity, which … have their obscurity attributed to the weakness of our humane Understandings. (BW, 8:69–70)

Our lack of knowledge, again, is attributed to our human limitations, and though we have discovered – and will continue to discover – truths about physical reality, he warns us that nature has a way of reminding us of what we do not know. He ends this passage with a further warning against undervaluing Christian theology; if we know that there are gaps and mysteries in our knowledge of physical reality and yet we do not think of natural philosophy as an unprofitable field of inquiry, then we should not think that the gaps and mysteries in theology make it an unprofitable field of inquiry either.

His cautious temperament also guides his approach to the acceptance of theories and systems in natural philosophy: “That then that I wish for, as to Systems, is this, That men in the first place would forbear to establish any Theory, till they have consulted with … a considerable number of Experiments in proportion to the comprehensiveness of the Theory to be erected on them” (BW, 2:14). Boyle was aware that laboratory experiments with the same procedures, materials and experimenters could have different outcomes, and so it takes a lot of evidence to justify any conclusions in natural philosophy. His advice in the face of these realities is to be cautious. The confidence one has in one’s conclusions should align with the evidence, and the evidence should be proportioned to the scope of the conclusion. Moreover, and perhaps presaging the Duhem–Quine discussions of the underdetermination of theory by evidence, (https://plato.stanford.edu/entries/scientific-underdetermination/) Boyle warns that experiment and argument should not be taken as confirming only one explanation of natural phenomena at the expense of the others (BW, 3:255–6) except in the case of proof by experiment (see §2.2.5). Normally, there are too many unknowns to safely conclude that a series of experiments confirms only one explanation (BW, 8:122).

Despite the limits on human knowledge and the hurdles involved in attaining it, Boyle was convinced that human understanding would progress and yield practical results, upon which future generations would build (BW, 10:96–7). And though the contributions of any particular scientist are small, they all add to the body of human knowledge. And the efforts to increase our knowledge are justified by both the benefits to humanity and by the glory they give to God. Nevertheless, these are not the only reasons Boyle gives to continue in the search for scientific knowledge. The cumulative effect of the work of the ‘Virtuosi’ over the long run will be significant scientific progress. He was so convinced of the progress of science he made a wish list, or ‘desiderata,’ (BP 8, fol. 208v–9r) of the kinds of achievements he hoped would be realized through experimental natural philosophy, including prolonging life, cure of diseases by organ transplantation, and the art of flying. Boyle’s optimism was not misplaced; twenty of the twenty-four of his desiderata have been achieved.

4.3 Certainty

When thinking specifically of certainty and demonstrative knowledge, Boyle distinguishes between three degrees of demonstration: metaphysical, physical and moral. Metaphysical demonstrations begin with necessarily true axioms, e.g., the law of non-contradiction, and yield the highest degree of certainty—metaphysical certainty—because their conclusions are validly derived from necessary truths (metaphysical axioms). The next highest degree of certainty is physical certainty which is derived from what he calls “physical demonstrations,” so-called because they are based on the contingent truths that serve as the foundations of our physical theories, e.g., ex nihilo nihil fit (BW, 8:281–2). The lowest degree of certainty is moral certainty that is derived from moral demonstrations. In most practical matters, for example, in ethics, economics, or jurisprudence, the precision of metaphysical or physical demonstrations is unattainable and so the best we can do is to rely on probabilities. Moral demonstrations are highly cogent arguments that are compatible with the current standards of reasoning on subjects (or in conditions) where only degrees of probability are attainable (BW, 8:281). Consequently, moral certainty is achieved when a belief has a high degree of probability – putting it beyond reasonable doubt – as a result of a moral demonstration.

While moral certainty is a legitimate guide to all practical affairs, Boyle insists that it can also be applied to the claims of religion. Even though the claims of both natural science and natural theology fall short of metaphysical certainty, they can still yield a degree of certainty. Natural science aims at physical certainty but should not be ashamed to accept moral certainty. Natural theology aims at moral certainty but should not be ashamed to fall short of metaphysical certainty. After all, Boyle tell us that moral demonstrations can adequately justify the “Articles of the Christian Religion” (BW, 8:282).

4.4 Nativism

Unlike his friend John Locke, Robert Boyle adopts the view that God has indeed endowed human souls with innate concepts, which play a religious role in human knowledge.

In Christian Virtuoso I, we are told that experimental philosophy and natural theology are not only beneficial to the Christian believer, but ways the creator reveals himself to humans. That is, God gave humans a rational mind and an intellect to “Contemplate the Works of Nature, and by them acquire a Conviction of the Existence, and divers Attributes, of their supremely perfect Author” (BW, 11:300). That is, philosophy and science—when done correctly—are ways that humans can acquire knowledge both of God’s existence and of his attributes. Boyle goes on to claim that “God hath planted Notions and principles in the Mind of Man, fit to make him sensible, that he ought to Adore God” (BW, 11:300–1).

These dual claims play an important role in his reconciliation of experimental philosophy, which focuses on the deliverances of nature, with the commitments of Christian theology, which are not directly confirmable by empirical means. But more on this below. For now, it is important to see that Boyle is committed to the divine origin of both the rational human mind and intellect (which justifies the use of these faculties) and of the existence of innate concepts in the human mind.

To be clear, Boyle does not say much about the innate notions and principles. From what little he tells us, it is not at all clear what these innate concepts are, or how many there are, but they all seem to be directed toward awakening the soul to a duty to worship God. It is therefore plausible to conclude that Boyle held that human minds possess an innate notion of God. After all, how could our innate notions help us discover our duty to worship God if the notion of God were not innate too? And he seems to confirm this: “the Goodness & Wisdome of God be such, that he has not left him selfe without witness in the minds” (BOA, 61). Moreover, he not only does not criticize Descartes’ claim to innate knowledge of God but even seems to endorse it (BOA, 217).

That said, however, within his proposed “a little Tract about Atheism,” Boyle mentions proofs for the existence of God based on the innate idea of God but does not endorse them. His worry is that they rely on the concepts of infinity and perfection, neither of which are fully understood by mortal minds, and thus arguments based on them are prone to errors (BOA, 50, 52, 145–8). When Boyle makes his own arguments for the existence of God, they are usually design arguments. So, given that an innate notion of God is not explicitly appealed to, or developed and integrated into his own theistic arguments, and that he does not appeal to any specific innate notions or principles in his natural philosophy, it is therefore plausible to conclude that Boyle is not laying any philosophical weight on these innate concepts in the construction and defense of either his natural philosophy or natural theology.

4.5 A priori knowledge

Like innate concepts, there is an equal paucity of references to a priori knowledge in Boyle, the only notable reference to which is in Usefulness of Natural Philosophy, where he says, “we know very little a priori” (BW, 3:313). The natural implication of this statement is that there is some a priori knowledge, but since he does not describe the source or conditions of the a priori, we cannot say for certain whether he is referencing the innate concepts discussed above, or whether he is thinking about propositions that are true by definition, or a combination of the two, or perhaps something else altogether.

4.6 Testimony

Acquiring knowledge and beliefs by testimony is accepting the first-hand reports of others as probably true. Boyle gives two kinds of criteria for evaluating the probability of testimony: quantitative and qualitative. Assuming their reports are independent, the more individuals who attest to the same facts, the higher the probability that their reports are true. His reasoning is that the probability that two independent witnesses will be wrong is lower than the probability that one person will be wrong. Qualitatively, the consistency of the accounts and the character of the witnesses also play a role in determining the probability of the testimony. As the degree of consistency among the proffered testimonies increases or decreases, so too does the probability of truth. Similarly, if the moral quality of the person, their expertise, or their intelligence is not in doubt, then neither should be their reports (BOA, 278).

4.7 The limits of experience

Every scientist, Boyle included, understands that we cannot expect every natural object or phenomenon to be observable by our current tools and methods or explainable by our current theories, but that does not prevent us from acquiring valuable information about nature now. Boyle acknowledged that observations and experiments could vary widely even when special care is taken to reproduce the conditions or experiments. He was also acutely aware that the proper tools for making adequate experiments or observations were not readily available. For this reason, he warns his fellow natural philosophers to be epistemically humble. That is, to proportion their confidence to the strength of the evidence, and that the scope of their conclusions should fit the scope of the evidence. Moreover, Boyle warns that no experiment or argument should be taken as confirming only one explanation of natural phenomena at the expense of its rivals (BW, 3:255–6). Normally, there are too many unknowns to safely conclude that a series of experiments confirms only one explanation (BW, 8:122).

He is also aware that new tools, further evidence, and differing approaches can yield new understanding that replaces our older, seemingly well-confirmed conclusions (BW, 8:77–9). Natural philosophy is a long-term project, and one should not be too confident that what one believes now is the final word. New instruments, new experiments, new observations will continue to push back the boundaries of human knowledge, but those boundaries move slowly. Thus, an oft repeated complaint in Boyle’s natural philosophy is that nature reveals her truths slowly, piecemeal and grudgingly (BW, 8:58).

Nevertheless, unlike Locke, Boyle is bullish on scientific knowledge. In Things Above Reason, we are told that it is not unprofitable to pursue knowledge even in cases where the subjects, such as the nature of matter, the seemingly absurd paradoxes of geometrical figures, the nature of God, etc., are beyond our understanding. For even in these cases, some of the properties belonging to those objects “do not surpass our Reason, and … knowledge may therefore be attain’d, by the due employment of it” (BW, 9:391).

4.8 The limits of human knowledge

The limits of human knowledge stem from both our natures and the purpose of creation. As humans, our faculties are too limited to reveal the answers to all the mysteries of nature (BOA, 115), and our sense organs only gather a limited amount of information. Moreover, Boyle holds open the possibility that God did not create the world with the intention that it be intelligible to humans: “if God be allowed to be, as indeed he is, the Author of the Universe, how will it appear that He … should, in his Creating of things, have respect to the measure and ease of Humane Understandings; and not rather, if of any, of Angelical Intellects” (BW, 3:257). In other words, why should we suppose that God’s aim in creating the universe was to make its truths available to human understanding, as opposed to that of a higher class of beings, such as angels? Of course, Boyle holds that there are truths of nature that are available to the human intellect. The purpose of creation, however, is not so much to teach us about nature, but for nature to teach us about God. Here he employs the two books metaphor: the “Booke call’d Scripture” and “the World is the great Book, not so much of Nature, as of the God of Nature” (BW, 5:39). Insofar as nature can instruct us about God, it must be intelligible to the human intellect.

The limits of human knowledge also include those things that, while understandable to us, are not discoverable by us, e.g., whether physical lines are infinitely divisible as geometry tells us ideal lines are (BW, 3:257), as well as things above reason, that is, truths that “surpass human reason rather than conflict with it” (Holden 2007, 283), for example, the resurrection of the dead. To say that the dead will eventually rise is not a contradiction in terms, but it is not knowable solely by human reason or experience.

This distinction between what is above reason and what is contrary to reason makes up a large part of Reflections Upon a Theological Distinction. There he presents the distinction thus:

By such things then in Theology, as may be said to be above Reason, I conceive such Notions and Propositions, as mere Reason, that is, Reason unassisted by supernatural Revelation, would never have discover’d to us: Whether those things be to our finite Capacities, clearly comprehensible or not. And by things contrary to Reason, I understand such Conceptions and Propositions, as are not only undiscoverable by mere Reason, but also, when we understand them, do evidently and truly appear to be repugnant to some Principle, or to some Conclusion, of Right Reason. (BW, 11:333–4)

Some truths in theology are not discoverable by reason alone and are therefore above reason. Those claims that are contradictory or that conflict with a principle of reasoning, e.g., the law of excluded middle, the law of non-contradiction, etc., are contrary to reason. The distinction is employed to defend the view that the truths of religion may not be knowable by reason or experience, but that fact does not in se make them false or contrary to reason, there is another possibility, they can be above reason.

5. Philosophy of religion

5.1 The soul

Two distinct notions of the soul occupied centre stage in the seventeenth century. One, stemming from Plato and the Pythagoreans, with theological trimmings by Augustine, had been given immense prestige by Descartes’ championing of it. The second main account, stemming from Aristotle, had been taken over and made Christian by Thomas Aquinas according to which the human person (even when the person in question was Christ in human form) was not merely a soul with an attached body, but was the body informed by the soul: if your soul alone were to survive death you would not. Bodily resurrection is essential to the survival and immortality of humans. As we shall see, even though there are passages where Boyle seems tempted by the Thomist substantial-form version of the soul, Boyle hews closely to the Cartesian dualist account.

Cartesians and Thomists alike believed on scriptural grounds that there were actual cases of separated souls, namely, the angels, so the possibility that the human soul might itself be subsistent was simply the possibility that it might sufficiently resemble an already accepted ontological group. Despite the problems that substance dualism raises, a number of which presented themselves clearly to Boyle, there was no general problem concerning incorporeal entities, and there were, Boyle felt, strong arguments for the incorporeality of the human soul.

In defense of substance dualism, Boyle adopted a strategy found amongst the Cartesians and the Aristotelians. That is, he argues that our mental abilities indicate that there must be something incorporeal about our minds. Like Descartes, Boyle takes it that imagination is a matter of material images being formed in the brain. But they both also believe that we have knowledge of things which are unimaginable — that is, they cannot be accurately represented by a corporeal image in the central nervous system, e.g., things which are too large, or too small to be imaged. Hence some non-material faculty was needed to account for this ability. Additionally, there are things which are not image-able because they cannot be represented accurately by any physical system, for example, the incommensurability of the sides and diagonal of a square. Since √2 is irrational no discrete (corpuscular) system can accurately represent both. But we do have knowledge of squares. Therefore, we must be employing a non-material system. Also, there were things such as Descartes’ chiliagon which, while they could be represented physically, could not be represented accurately by our physical imaging system. Additionally (a familiar Aristotelian point), our ability to abstract — to consider universals and not merely particular instances — was held to provide further evidence for the incorporeality of the soul and hence for the possibility at least of human immortality.

Boyle also noted, as did his contemporary Henry More, the Cambridge Platonist, the occurrence of ecstasies. Boyle, like More, took the existence of ecstasies seriously and, accepting the literal meaning of the term, thought that such experiences showed the actuality of non-corporeal, out-of-body, experiences. Boyle indeed offers the case as a refutation of the Aristotelian view that images are required for human thinking. Locke was more cautious on the issue: “whether that, which we call Extasy, be not dreaming with the Eyes open, I leave to be examined” (Locke 1975 2.19.1; see More 1662, 2:121; BW, 12:390).

Thus, for Boyle, souls were almost certainly Cartesian souls, though as mentioned earlier he hesitates about whether the human soul may not be a substantial form (BW, 5:300).

5.2 The Christian Virtuoso

Two foci of Boyle’s mature philosophical works, the new science of mechanism and the Christian religion, were often thought to conflict with each other. Indeed, Boyle was deeply concerned with what he saw as an increase in atheism and irreligion among the cognoscenti. His response in The Christian Virtuoso (1690) was to fight this battle on three fronts. First (as we will see again in 5.4 and 5.5), Boyle was keen to defend the Christian religion and to defang the arguments of the atheists against it (BW, 11:285).

Second, he defends the view that the new science and Christianity can mutually support each other. Studying nature is learning directly from the handiwork of God (BW, 3:242). The study and practice of natural philosophy opens our minds to the power, providence, omnipresence and goodness of God; it also helps the student become more disciplined, rational, and epistemically humble. In this way, the practice of natural philosophy dovetails nicely with his early moral writings. Thus, because the study of nature teaches us so much about God, and has a positive effect upon our character, natural philosophy is a religious duty of every theist.

Third, he defends the claim that an excellent natural philosopher, i.e. a scientific virtuoso, can also be a rational and committed theist; that there is no intellectual tension in committing to both: “I shall endeavour to make them think it at least less strange, That a great Esteem of Experience, and a high Veneration for Religion, should be compatible in the same person” (BW, 11:291).

5.3 Arguments for the existence of God

The seventeenth century is notable not only for the number but also for the variety of arguments which were offered to prove God’s existence. Although writers such as Pascal and Bayle felt such arguments to be both unnecessary and unavailable, demonstrations of God’s existence were felt by many to be not only possible but desirable, since they were necessary in the fight against atheism. Descartes famously felt that God’s existence could be, and epistemologically had to be, demonstrated, and offered a variety of proofs to provide such a demonstration. His version of the ontological argument, his proof from the supposed innate idea of God, his proof from the need for an eternal conscious being, and his proof from the need for continuing creation, all found supporters in the later seventeenth century, though the first two were generally held to be unlikely to convince anyone.

Apart from a brief reference to it in the printed works, Boyle does not mention the ontological argument (BW, 9:413). This distancing was not uncommon at the time. Ralph Cudworth, though clearly fascinated by the ontological argument, recognized that most would “Distrust, the Firmness and Solidity of such thin and Subtle Cobwebs,” and offered an alternative argument in the hope that it would prove more “Convictive of the Existence of a God to the Generality” (Cudworth 1678, 725).

Boyle held that design arguments (for more on design arguments, see https://plato.stanford.edu/entries/teleological-arguments/) were both available and the most likely to persuade rational, open-minded hearers. Such arguments were intended to form a large part of a book on atheism, something he worked on throughout his adult life but never published, though parts of it were used in various other works of a theological nature. Boyle did, however, leave a plan of the intended work, to which he refers as “a little tract about Atheism” but for which a vast amount of manuscript material survives. He fastens on two main types of design arguments: those involving the complexity of animate beings, and those which highlight the need to explain the origin and continuing function of natural laws: God must not only sustain his creatures, Boyle argues, he must also sustain the regularities which we recognize as lawlike.

Boyle certainly thought that the design arguments he intended for his project should convince the open-minded. Moreover, he thought, such arguments should particularly convince those who were knowledgeable about nature; who knew enough about the details of the world to be impressed by the intricacy of the presumed workmanship. “[T]here are,” he wrote, “positive Reasons afforded by Philosophy to prove a Deity, namely … the Cartesian Idæa, the Originall of Motion, the use of Parts in Animalls, especially the Eye, the valves of the heart, the musculi perforantes & perforati, & the temporary [parts] of a foetus & the Mother” (BOA, 310).

Most of the hundreds of theistic arguments to be found among his manuscripts were unfinished and merely appear as notes to himself. There are some, however, that are mostly complete and can give us some ideas of what he took to be a strong theistic proof. Here are a few examples from his selection of design arguments.

A means-ends argument:

Tis of no force to say, that in the structure of an Animal, or of the world, the Parts that compose it are fit and sufficient to produce the Phenomena it exhibits; since that dos not excuse the necessity of an Intelligent Being, that both fram’d those Parts and adapted them in order to such ends or performances. This may be illustrated by the sufficiency of the Letters of the Alphabet for all the several words contain’d in Books; which hinders not, but that a very intelligent Being was necessary to invent an alphabet, and duely range the Letters it consists of to make up words & sentences. And to the same purpose we may consider a water mill, wherein, tho all the parts are so fram’d and put together, that by a series of Actions, the effect (the grinding of the corn) must needs ensue; yet it requires a skilful Opificer to contrive the engine for such motions & operations: and his wisdom will the better appear, if it be consider’d that he set up this engine not on the top of a Hill, but <on> or by a stream, so dispos’d by nature or skill, that the water shall at seasonable times be determin’d to move that which would elsewhere be useless. (BOA, 238)

A watch analogy:

For, to know there is a God that has made the World, it may suffice to know that the World, which is admirably fram’d & contriv’d, cannot have made it self; and therefore must have been made by another, who having Impress’d such conspicuous characters of Wisdom, Power, and Goodnes on his works, warrants us to conclude that the Supream Cause of such Effects, is both Wise, Potent, and Good; and as such deserves our Thanks and Adoration: tho there may be many things in his most Singular Nature, and <some of his> Attributes, which we cannot clearly conceive. As, if an Indian or Chinois, should have found a Watch cast on shore in some Trunk or Casket of some shipwrackt European vessel; by observing the Motions & Figure of it, he would quickly conclude That ‘twas made by some Intelligent & Skilfull Being; tho he would not understand, Why the Parts were made just of such a number, such shapes, and such sizes, put together after that determinate manner; nor how the whole Engine, whose spring lyes conceal’d in the Barrel, is made to move so regularly. (BOA, 239)

Design arguments are ancient, perhaps dating back to Anaxagoras (Sedley 2007), but when we see a watch analogy like Boyle’s, we usually think of William Paley’s 1803 argument in Natural Theology. Both Boyle’s and Paley’s arguments take the complex, intricate, and scaled systems of nature—including the whole of nature itself—as reasons to think that an intelligent designer is more likely than the alternative explanation that nature and natural systems came into being on their own. Another similarity is that neither argument constitutes either a metaphysical or physical demonstration.

Indeed, none of Boyle’s theistic arguments satisfy the stringent conditions for either a metaphysical or physical demonstration, however, Boyle insists that these arguments constitute a “proof” or moral demonstration because the conclusions are adequately justified by the premises:

And lastly, there are Moral Demonstrations … where the Conclusion is built, either upon some one such proof cogent in its kind, or some concurrence of Probabilities, that it cannot but be allowed, supposing the truth of the most receiv’d Rules of Prudence and Principles of Practical Philosophy. And this third kind of Probation, though it come behind the two others in certainty, yet it is the surest guide, which the Actions of Men, though not their Contemplations, have regularly allow’d them to follow. (BW, 8:281)

This moral certainty, Locke remarked, “is not only as great as our frame can attain to, but as our Condition needs” (Locke 1975, 4.11.8). Similarly, for Boyle, given that we are not omniscient and that a great many truths lay beyond our grasp, we cannot hope for anything but moral certainty in some matters of natural philosophy and natural theology. However, this epistemic limitation does not mean that we do not have strongly justified beliefs that are highly probable (given our presuppositions and understanding) and are such that “they cannot but be allowed.”

In the seventeenth century, moral certainty was an expression that was often used in jurisprudence to refer to putting the conclusion beyond reasonable doubt, and perhaps it is this context that sheds some light on how Boyle applies it. If we look at the design arguments above, we can get a feel for why he may have thought of them as proofs, i.e. as showing that the conclusion that God exists must be allowed. The first thing to notice is that Boyle did not expect his (or anyone’s) proofs to convince most atheists (BP 2:64, BOA, 384). By his estimation, resolved atheists are (among other things) unwilling to take the evidence seriously enough to find the arguments convincing. He insists that if honest seekers of truth are willing to entertain the argument, rather than remain a “resolved enemy” of it, they have a chance to see its force. So, Boyle takes it that those who find the arguments for the existence of God persuasive are those who start off being open to the possibility that God exists. He also laments the fact that the premises in theistic arguments are easily misunderstood or misrepresented because they involve subtleties and concepts that are not easily understood by even the initiated (BOA, 63–4).

Another reason to think that Boyle’s strategy is simply to produce moral certainty comes from the context of the arguments. His theistic arguments are given against the background of some familiar and deep philosophical problems: the problem of consciousness, the problem of knowledge of necessary truths, and the problem of contingent existence, just to name a few. How can consciousness emerge from mere matter in motion? How can humans with limited experience of exclusively contingent facts come to know the necessary truths of mathematics and metaphysics? How can a universe of contingent beings exist without a necessary creator? How can a universe with conscious, intelligent beings exist without a creator? All of Boyle’s peers would have been aware of these issues, and many of them were actively crafting philosophical responses to them.

If we combine these considerations, i.e. that one must be open to the possibility of the existence of God, that there are deep questions at the foundation of our scientific worldview, and that these theistic proofs only aim at moral certainty, then we will see that what Boyle is really offering are inferences to the best explanation (IBE).

Boyle gives several arguments in defense of his claim that IBEs yield moral certainty (BOA, 56). His strategy is to defend the use of IBE’s in natural theology by leveraging the Atomist’s practice of reasoning from the effects to the cause by hypothesizing unobserved explanatory entities. His claim is that if the IBE form of reasoning in natural philosophy yields moral certainty, then there is no reason – at least in principle – why the same method cannot be used to yield moral certainty in natural theology. It is this kind of parity of reasoning argument that receives penetrating scrutiny from David Hume.

5.4 Epicureanism and atheism

While Boyle shares a great many philosophical commitments with the Epicureans, he is keen to distance himself from their atheism, repeatedly asserting that there are immaterial souls (BW, 5:300, 340) and that God initiated and directs motion in the created world (BW, 8:103–4, 107–8). His main polemic against Epicurean atheists takes the form of a series of philosophical challenges. If, as the Epicureans assert, all that exists is matter and motion in the void, then they are in the unenviable position of accepting that the seemingly contingent facts of nature are inexplicable, and that theism offers something less problematic. En route to these conclusions, he marshals a whole host of arguments against the Epicurean philosophical commitments. Here are a few highlights.

We will begin with the problem of atoms rebounding after a collision. If, as the Epicureans claim, every atom is self-existent, i.e. uncreated and eternal, then all atoms are indestructible. The Epicurean atheist must also claim that the attributes of each atom, e.g., the determinate size and shape of each atom is a brute fact about it and there is no explanation of why it has those determinate attributes. Similarly, there would be no explanation for atoms possessing weight or solidity, or continual self-motion, or their differing sizes, or their uniform speed, or their downward tendencies, all of which their theory says they must have. These seemingly contingent facts of nature will be unexplainable (BOA, 337–41).

On the uniform velocity issue, Boyle points out that the Epicureans claim that all atoms, regardless of size, always have the same velocity. In response to this, he argues that there is no rational explanation for that fact. Simply attributing uniform velocity to mere chance or embracing it as a brute fact about atoms does not help. After all, he argues, there are “millions” of atoms, it would be astounding that all of them, regardless of size, were to be assigned the same velocity and natures as all the others. How is mere chance an explanation of those facts? And attributing it to a brute fact does not alleviate the oddity of this uniformity (BOA, 342–4).

Moreover, when atoms collide with another solid body, what explains why the atoms rebound from that body instead of continually pushing against it? If the continual downward motion of an atom flows from its eternal nature, then atoms should not rebound from any body after a collision; their only motion—even in collisions—should be to continue in their natural downward direction. More to the point, how can atoms even collide when they are all moving downward at the same velocity? The solution offered by Epicurus is declination, or “the swerve in the void,” which is the occasional non-downward motion of atoms that prevents them from purely parallel motion and helps them to make contact and therefore combine with each other. This random declination too, Boyle argues, is unexplained and undefended by argument. Moreover, declination fails to address the previous issue of the conceptual problems associated with atoms being unable to rebound from collisions (BOA, 342).

Another of Boyle’s criticisms concerns the parsimony of theism. The Epicurean doctrine is that atoms are indivisible and impenetrable, but these facts are not explainable by appeal to any other features of the atom and so must be brute facts as well. But since the Epicureans accept these claims, it follows that they accept truths that exceed their understanding and for which they cannot give an account. But why, Boyle asks, is a belief in God any different? This creates a dilemma: since the Epicureans admit that self-existent, self-moving, eternal beings exist, then they can exist as either atoms or God. If they pick atoms, then there are innumerable unexplained entities with unexplained properties in the world. And the problems of how atoms came to be what they are is no less serious than the same problem as applied to God. However, if they pick God, then there is only one unexplained entity with unexplained properties (BOA, 341–2). Parsimony, Boyle believes, will favour the one over the many in this case.

Against the claims of blind chance and brute fact, Boyle presses the explanatory power of theism from an intelligent design perspective (BOA, 344). His main claims are that mere matter moving in the void is, on its own, a less plausible explanation of the vast array of intricately connected and mutually supportive structures we observe in the universe than is God; and that matter on its own might be expected to form heaps or chaos, but what we have looks like intelligent design.

He also gives a parity of reasoning argument. The Epicureans are committed to the existence of unobservable atoms as an explanation of the phenomena of nature and arrive at atomic theory based on an abduction: the best explanation of the phenomena of the material world is the existence of atoms. Boyle then asks why the Epicureans cannot use the same reasoning to conclude that God exists? Theists reason from the existence of apparent design in nature—that would presumably be unlikely without a creator—to the best explanation of those facts, i.e. the existence of God. In fact, he claims, the theist’s inference is so natural that nearly all humanity makes it upon noticing order in nature (BOA, 344–5).

The cogency of these arguments is controversial, nevertheless, Boyle’s commitment to them is both sincere and strategic. He is arguing for a mechanical philosophy that is akin to that of the ancient atomists, but without the atheistic implications of their natural philosophy. He uses these arguments to create some space between the new mechanical natural philosophy and its distinctly atheistic ancient counterpart.

5.5 Miracles

Miracles play an important epistemic role in Boyle’s philosophy of religion. His main discussion of miracles includes the warning that he is not offering a complete account of miracles, nor is he willing to address all the related philosophical questions. His only intention is to defend miracles as both real and as performing the epistemic role of indicating which religion is true (BOA, 274). He is occasionally ambivalent on this point – as we’ll see below – but he usually argues that miracles cannot be used to prove that God exists, after all, the assertion that an event is miraculous presupposes the existence of God, rendering it circular (BOA, 293–4). To prove the existence of God, he preferred design arguments; to prove that the Christian religion is true, he relied on the argument from miracles.

Boyle was aware that most believers held their belief on insufficient grounds (see BP 4:60, BOA, 301–2), but felt himself fortunate in that sound philosophy showed that the religion to which he was born was the correct one. For Boyle, miracles (in particular the miracle of Pentecost) were crucial evidence for the truth of Christianity. The Christian miracles, he felt, clearly bore the stamp of God upon them. There were, he agreed, other apparent miracles, but the miracles which purported to establish Christianity were neither false nor diabolical, and they were miraculous (BP 7:99, BOA, 390).

His analysis of miracles is complicated by the fact that he gives two versions: one akin to St Thomas’ wherein miracles are events that exceed the productive power of nature alone (St Thomas Aquinas, SCG 3.103; ST 1.110, art. 4), and another akin to David Hume’s wherein miracles are violations of the laws of nature. Here’s Boyle’s Thomist version:

by the word Miracles, that you will often meet with in the following Discourse, I understand those strange & wonderful Operations, Productions, and Phenomena, that surpass the setled or common Course of Nature in some such manner, as that upon the whole matter they cannot justly be attributed either to Nature left to her self, or to the skill, Power, frauds, mistakes, or credulity of men. (BOA, 263–4)

Miracles, on this analysis, are any events that alter the usual course of nature and cannot be adequately explained in any other way. An important feature of this analysis is that it is epistemic; it focuses on what is explainable by appeal to the “[observed] common course of nature.” Nevertheless, he also claims that some miracles are violations of the laws of nature. Here’s Boyle’s Humean version:

there may be, nay and have been, Divine Miracles properly so call’d, that is such as cannot with probability be suppos’d to proceed from any other than the First cause, that is from God. For, that the Supream Being may, if he thinks fit, perform things above the Powers, and contrary to the Laws, of Corporeal Beings. (BOA, 264)

Thus, Boyle countenances two kinds of miracles: ones that “surpass the ordinary course of nature” but that do not violate the laws; and ones that violate the laws “of corporeal beings.”

When speaking of “the laws of corporeal beings,” he has in mind fundamental laws of motion, for he gives examples of some of the laws, such as a version of the law of inertial motion, that were widely discussed in the late 1660s (BOA, 262; see Murray et al. 2011). When referencing the ordinary course of nature, he is thinking of the causal powers of bodies and gives examples of the different effects fire has on gold, silver, wax, clay, wood and gunpowder (BOA, 262–3). The miracles that merely surpass the ordinary course of nature affect or change the relevant portion of matter without altering its essential nature: “Miracles, such as I am discoursing of, do not destroy <or overthrow> the Essential Nature of Things, & so are not really & in strictness repugnant to it” (BOA, 263). His claim is that these are the kinds of miracles that most commonly occur in the Bible (ibid.). He goes on to argue that the mind–body and body–mind interactions in the Cartesian system would also count as miracles on this account; mere matter operating by mechanical laws cannot account for mind–body or body–mind interactions, and so these are not explainable by appeal to the usual course of nature. He refers to this kind of non-mechanical interaction as supranatural as opposed to contra-natural.

On the other hand, miracles that violate the laws of nature can alter the essential natures of things, after all, an omnipotent being could do anything, and so these kinds of Humean miracles cannot be ruled out. Boyle gives the creation of souls, the uniting of them to bodies, raising Lazarus from the dead, and the resurrection of Jesus as examples of this kind of miracle (BOA, 271). Nature alone cannot perform any part of these works, only an omnipotent being could do them. On this point, he is clear that unusual events do not speak for themselves; some alleged miracles are falsely believed to be so. Reason and philosophy are needed to sniff out the true miracles and distinguish them from the fakes (BOA, 281).

Boyle also believes that the Devil can perform miracles, so, in determining the aetiology of alleged miracles and the religion they support, reason and philosophy are our proper guides. We begin with natural theology (natural religion), i.e. what reason alone, unaided by revelation, can teach us about God, and then, examine what claims the miracle is said to confirm. If the alleged miracle does not conform to the philosophical truths of natural theology, we may safely judge them not to be divine in origin (BOA, 294). If an alleged miracle confirms, or is compatible with, the doctrines of natural theology, then the miracle is likely authentic, and the religion associated with that miracle should be embraced. In essence, reason and philosophy are truth-conducive tools to aid miracles in guiding the mind toward the true religion (BOA, 261–5).

Why does he prefer the argument from miracles for these epistemic purposes? He gives four reasons:

  1. Miracles are the proper testimony of the divinity of a religion; without which the divine origin cannot be established (BOA, 272)
  2. Christ and his Apostles insisted on the argument from miracles to establish the truth of Christianity (ibid.)
  3. Anybody can understand the argument from miracles; one need not be particularly well educated to assess its strength (BOA, 272–3)
  4. The argument from miracles is superior to all others because it not only proves the superiority of Christianity, but the truth of the fundamental Christian claims, i.e., that there is a God whose providence reaches to all humanity, and who through revelation has determined how he is to be worshiped (BOA, 273).

One of the oddities of (4) is that he claims that miracles prove that God exists, when elsewhere he argues that theistic proofs from putative miracles presuppose the existence of God. It seems that Boyle is occasionally ambivalent about the function of miracles. Generally, however, he regards them as being philosophically relevant only after we have a proof of God’s existence, something which natural theology will afford us (BP 5:106–7; BOA, 310–12).

From all of this we can see that Boyle clearly accepts miracles as an important epistemic arrow in the Christian quiver.

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