Martin Buber

First published Tue Apr 20, 2004; substantive revision Tue May 12, 2026

Biographers of Martin Buber (1878–1965) invariably wrestle with the problem that no single classification fully captures the range of his pursuits. Buber himself acknowledged that he was hard to classify when he wrote (in “Replies to My Critics” in Schilpp/Friedman 1967, 689), “… the problem is discussed many times whether I am a philosopher or a theologian or something else. The question is rightly raised; for, depending on the circumstances, I am to be confronted with the rules and laws of one or the other of these realms. I cannot, however, make any of the proposed answers my own.” Defying the conventional pressures of professionalization and academic specialization, Buber called himself an “atypical man,” and admitted an “aversion to the usual excessive typology.” Resisting “the usual excessive typology” hints at Buber’s defiance of the transcendental approach to social types associated with the sociology of Max Weber (1864–1920). (Cf. Landshut 1929, a book Buber praises in his 1938 inaugural lecture as professor of social philosophy at the Hebrew University in Jerusalem; see MBW I, 1057) Buber demands of his biographers to be mindful of the ineffability of the individual – the theme of Buber’s doctoral dissertation (Vienna 1904) – and to be respectful of the privacy and personal distance he carefully maintained throughout his life – despite the emphasis on encounter and dialogue he developed in his writings and performed in public. To get a sense of Buber’s range, it suffices to peruse the titles of the twentyone volumes of the Martin Buber Werkausgabe, edited by Paul Mendes-Flohr, Bernd Witte, and others, which appeared between 2001 and 2020 (see the Buber Werkausgabe website [Other Internet Resources]). What holds these works together is, of course, their elusive author, the ineffable individual Martin Buber, a man whose personal aura was as important to his immediate success as his literary stile and eloquent humanism were to his lasting reception.

Buber’s life-long engagement in the Zionist movement, his sustained engagement with Hasidic story-telling, his translation and writings on the Bible, and his numerous contributions to public and academic scholarship in social psychology, psychotherapy, education, philosophy, folklore, and religious studies engendered a rich and ongoing history of reception. His psycho-social approach to social philosophy proved influential among his doctoral students at the Hebrew University (Jerusalem), incl. Shmuel Eisenstadt (1923–2010) and Amitai Etzioni (1929–2923). His dialogic approach to adult education had an afterlife in modern Israel through the work of his student Ernst Simon (1900–1988), and his criticism of psychoanalysis resonated with the humanistic psychotherapy of Hans Trüb (1889–1949), Viktor von Weizsäcker (1886–1957), and Carl Rogers (1902–1987). His retellings of Hasidic lore – begun in close collaboration with Paula Winkler (see Pourshirazi 2008) – and his translation of the Hebrew Bible into German – initially in collaboration with Franz Rosenzweig (1886–1929) – remain classics of 20th-century Jewish modernism in the German language. His gathering of mystical attestations (Ekstatische Konfessionen, 1909) from around the globe established the field of comparative mysticism. Buber also pioneered interreligious encounters that set the bar for post-Holocaust Jewish-Christian dialogues (the website Im Geiste Martin Bubers und Franz Rosenzweigs … [Other Internet Resources]), and he is recalled for his sustained and vocal advocacy, within the Zionist movement and in the early years of Israeli statehood, on behalf of Jewish-Arab cooperation and the idea of binationalism in Israel-Palestine where he lived and taught from 1938 until his death in 1965.

Buber’s best-known work is the short philosophical essay I and Thou (1923), the basic tenets of which he was to modify, but never to abandon. In this work, Buber gives expression to a dual structure of human relations that permeates our daily lives and confronts us with a fundamental choice in every situation: to reduce what is before us to a mere “it” reflecting back on ourselves as equally reduced, or being open to an encounter of the other as a Thou, reflecting back on ourselves as equally elevated. In this view, we are beings that can enter into dialogic relations not just with human others but also with other animate beings, such as animals, or a tree, as well as with the Divine Thou. The duality of primal words (Urworte) I-Thou and I-it by which we relate to one another serves as the key to Buber’s mature thought on everything from his approach to biblical faith to his advocacy for Jewish-Arab binationalism in Palestine. I and Thou was first translated into English in 1937 by Ronald Gregor Smith and later again by Walter Kaufmann (1970). The German original was an instant classic and remains in print today. In the 1950s and 60s, when Buber first lectured across Europe and the US, the essay became popular in the English-speaking world as well where it met the spiritual needs articulated by public intellectuals and theologians such as Reinhold Niebuhr, H. Richard Niebuhr, and Will Herberg (see Gilpin in Shonkoff, 2018) and impressed the young Martin Luther King Jr. who cites it in his 1963 Letter from Birmingham Jail.

1. Biographical Background

The setting of Buber’s early childhood was the Austro-Hungarian Empire, a multiethnic conglomerate whose dissolution in 1918 effectively ended the millennial rule of Catholic princes in Europe. Buber was born into fiin-de-siècle Vienna, home of light opera and heavy neo-romantic music, French-style boulevard comedy and German social realism, sexual repression and deviance, political intrigue and vibrant journalism, a cultural cauldron aptly captured in Robert Musil’s The Man Without Qualities (Der Mann ohne Eigenschaften, 1930–1932). Jews and other national minorities were not afforded full freedom of residence and acquisition of property across the Empire until the “Basic Law on the General Rights of Nationals” of December 1862 (“December Constitution”). As a result of this liberalization, Jewish residence in Vienna increased from 6200 in 1860 to 147000 in 1900 (see the webpage on the Jewish Community of Vienna [Other Internet Resources]).

Buber’s parents, Carl Buber (1848–1935) and Elise née Wurhaft (1858-?), separated when Martin was four years old. Although his father remarried and had two daughters with his second wife, Buber basically grew up as an only child, brought up by his paternal grandparents, Solomon Buber (1827–1906) and Adele née Weiser (1830–1911), in Lemberg (now: Lviv/Ukraine) who were part of what one might call the landed Jewish aristocracy. Solomon, a “master of the old Haskala” (“[ein] … Meister der alten Haskala”; Buber 1906b, Dedication) who called himself “a Pole of the Mosaic persuasion” (Friedman [1981] p. 11), produced the first modern editions of rabbinic midrash literature yet was also greatly respected in the traditional Jewish community. His reputation opened the doors for Martin when he began to show interest in Zionism and Hasidic literature. The wealth of his grandparents was built on the Galician estate managed by Adele and enhanced by Solomon through mining, banking, and commerce. An inheritance he received after his grandfather’s passing and his father’s ongoing support provided Martin with financial security until the German occupation of Poland in 1939, when those estates were expropriated. Home-schooled and pampered by his grandmother, the young Buber was a bookish aesthete with few friends his age, whose major diversion was the play of the imagination. He easily absorbed local languages (Hebrew, Yiddish, Polish, German) and acquired others (Greek, Latin, French, Italian, English). German was the dominant language at home, while the language of instruction at the Franz Joseph Gymnasium was Polish. This multilingualism nourished Buber’s life-long interest in language.

Among the young Buber’s first publications are essays on, and translations into Polish of, the poetry of Arthur Schnitzler and Hugo von Hofmannsthal. These and other critical and philosophical works from the period 1891–1924 are now collected and annotated in MBW I (2001), with a widely ranging biographical introduction by Martin Treml. From early on, Buber’s literary voice was assertive and full of self-confidence even though, in substance, he was exploring ever new ways to bring East and West, Judaism and Humanism, national particularity and universal spirit into conversation. His deliberate and sometimes precious diction (especially problematic in his later Hebrew productions, which read like translations from the German) was nourished by the contrasts between the High German language (Schiller) his grandmother cultivated at home and the richly idiomatic Galician Jewish jargon he encountered on the street. Reentering the urban society of Vienna, Leipzig, Zürich, and Berlin as a student of psychology, art-history, and philosophy, Buber easily fit into a world brimming with novel approaches to life and society, literature and the arts, a world brimming with the utopian optimism of literary “avantgardes” that modeled novel modes of life, unconstrained by the bourgeois social norms of their parents and grandparents. This was a place where solutions to the burning social and political issues of city, nation, and empire were often expressed in grandly theatrical oratory (Karl Lueger) and in the aestheticizing rhetoric of self-inscenation (Theodor Herzl). As a gifted student, voracious for knowledge that mattered, aliented from the religious upbringing of his youth, and endowed with an etherial, almost otherworldly personality (Mauthner; Susman) he was ready to take his place in this fin-de-siécle bohemian cauldron. The crucial encounter of his young life was meeting Paula Winkler (1877–1958), a Munich-born lapsed Catholic avantgarde novelist (pen-name: Georg Munk) who was to become the backbone of his entire adult life: the mother of his children and educator of his grandchildren, the ardent supporter of his many causes, a broker of literary and artistic connections, a devoted collaborator in his writing and editing (to the detriment of her own), and the practical organizer of his life.

Martin and Paula cultivated personal and professional connections across multiple intellectual networks, artistic circles, and communitarian movements characteristic of the world of modernist German arts and letters in the first two decades of the 20th-century. They met in 1899 as students in Zurich at an event where Paula took the lead role in a student performance and Martin introduced the piece. They danced the night away and were, from then on, firmly committed to one another, though they initially kept their relationship a secret. Paula’s children by Martin (Rafael and Eva, born 1900 and 1901, respectively) were born out of wedlock and Paula cared for them by herself, bearing the stigma of single motherhood. The charade ended only when Martin introduced Paula to his father and grandmother. Paula converted and the couple was married in 1907, a year after Martin’s grandfather passed away without having been apprised of Martin’s growing family. (On Paula Buber see Sadeghi 2015, Baur 2023, Hadad et al 2026.) Martin and Paula’s youthful defiance of the social norms of their time was intentional. They participated in and contributed to a diffuse world of intellectual associations and artistic networks of a bohéme-adjacent subculture devoted to the “reform of life” (Lebensreform), a combination of the neo-Romanticism promoted by publisher Eugen Diederichs (see Lichtblau 1999) who published Buber’s Ekstatische Konfessionen (1909), the intentional community building and communitarian living of the “Neue Gemeinschaft” in Berlin (see Bruns in Faber and Holste 2000) where Buber first met the anarchist Gustav Landauer (1870–1919), and the utopian pacifism of the Forte-circle, initiated by Frederick van Eeden (1860–1932) and Erich Gutkind (1877–1965) in 1914, just before the outbreak of the Great War (see Holste in Faber and Holste 2000).

Buber first gained literary fame through his retellings of Hasidic stories that resonated with the avantgarde readership of modernistic fairy tales and the spiritualism inspired by Tolstoy and his disciples that found its expression, among others, in Rainer Maria Rilke’s Geschichten from lieben Gott (Stories of God, 1900) and his Stundenbuch (Book of Hours, 1905). The Tales of Rabbi Nachman (1906) and The Legend of the Baal Shem (1908) were the result of a close collaboration between Martin who produced rough translations from the Hebrew and Yiddish originals and Paula – who was by all accounts a talented story-teller. The final selection of the stories that made it into these first editions was decided by Wilhelm Oswalt, owner of the literary publishing house Rütten & Loening where Buber served as chief editor. The stories Paula had worked on found the widest resonance, but they were not all included in the early editions. Her co-authorship was first mentioned by Grete Schaeder (1903–1990) in the biographical introduction to her edition of Buber’s correspondence (Schaeder 1972). Another important contribution of Buber’s to the program of Rütten & Loening was Die Gesellschaft (see Wiehn 1991), which appeared between 1906 and 1912 and included forty short volumes with artful cover design, each dealing with a different psycho-social aspect of modern life and authored by a leading personality who – according to Buber’s programmatic statement – was not simply qualified as a subject specialist but able to give expression to the “psychical (seelischen) realities that arise from the cooperation of people.” Buber defined “sociology” as the “science of the forms of the interhuman” (“Die Soziologie ist die Wissenschaft von den Formen des Zwischenmenschlichen.” See Wiehn 1991, 192). Buber served as series editor only after he failed to recruit his former teacher Georg Simmel (1858–1918) to serve in this capacity (ibid. 187). Authors who wrote for the series included Simmel (“Religion”), Werner Sombart (“Das Proletariat”), Alexander Ular (“Die Politik”), Eduard Bernstein (“Der Streik”), Gustav Landauer (“Die Revolution”) and others. (For a full list of authors and titles see Wiehn 1991, 202). The series was widely noted but not uniformly praised by contemporary reviewers. Some found the monographs – and Buber’s approach to social phenomena – too refined. The Austrian political economist Otto Neurath (1882–1945), for example, speaks of Buber’s “strong tendency to deal with ‘higher problems,” speaking “too much of ‘facts of individuation,’ of the ‘problem of the interhuman’, of ‘rhythm, tempo, and intensity,” at the expense of “simplicity that unfortunately is also lacking in a few of the volumes of the series.” (Wiehn 1991, 199). In hindsight it appears that the series was something quite extraordinary. According to Wiehn, “in the six years of the publication of the series (…) there existed no comparable sociological program of publication by a sociologist and it is difficult to find something comparable even later on.” Historically speaking it represents “the most comprehensive description and analysis of Wilhelminian society in the German empire before the First World War.” (Wiehn 1991, 201)

In 1916, the second year of the war, Martin and Paula moved their family to Heppenheim/Bergstraße, a village in the Odenwald, located on the train line between Frankfurt, the seat of Buber’s employer (Rütten & Loening), and the university town of Heidelberg. The house had an ample garden where Paula was able to grow produce that she sent to friends in Berlin when fresh vegetables became scarce. After the war they were able to buy the house they had rented, though not before an extensive search for a suitable “house on the country-side.” The purchase was funded by the sale of one of father Carl Buber’s holdings. Also in 1916, Buber realized the plan, first hatched in 1903 with fellow members of the “democratic faction” of the Zionist Congress, to establish a high-brow Jewish journal that was to promote Jewish cultural autonomy. The original idea had foundered on lack of funding. Now it was established with the help of Salman Schocken (1877–1959), an innovative entrepreneur and art collector who came under Buber’s influence and later employed him in his publishing house, Schocken Verlag, Berlin. Buber served as editor of Der Jude until 1924 (Lappin 1997). The journal provided a venue for new voices, among them the critic and literary theorist Walter Benjamin (1892–1940), and competed (during the war) with Neue Jüdische Monatshefte, co-founded by a more conventionally assimilationist and pro-German editorial board that included the eminent philosopher Hermann Cohen (1842–1918), with whom Buber engaged in a public spat over Cohen’s signing of an anti-Zionist declaration (Barash 2015).

From 1923 until 1933, Buber taught at the newly founded University of Frankfurt (today: Johann Wolfgang Goethe-Universität), first as professor of Jewish philosophy and Jewish ethics, a position sponsored by the Frankfurt Jewish community, and later as honorary professor (Honorarprofessor) of religion, a position for which he was warmly recommended by the dean of the faculty, Classics scholar Walter Otto (1874–1958) (Schottroff 1990). At the same time, he taught at the Freies jüdisches Lehrhaus, an avantgarde Jewish adult education center initiated by Franz Rosenzweig that attracted many talented young intellectuals, including Leo Strauss (1899–1973, then a fellow of the Berlin Academy of Jewish Sciences/Akademie für die Wissenschaft des Judentums), Erich Fromm (1900–1980), Leo Löwenthal (1900–1993), Ernst Simon, and others. (See Weissberg 2021) It should be noted that most of the younger docents and their intellectual friends (incl. Gershom Scholem, 1897–1982), while grateful for Buber’s pioneering role in the Jewish “renaissance” movement (Biemann 2009), were also critical of what they referred to as “Buberism” (Bubertum). A running put-down for someone enthralled by Buber was that they were stuck in Buberty (“Bubertät”). The younger generation, sobered by the war, preferred the “neue Sachlichkeit” (“new objectivity”) of their time to Buber’s expressionist eloquence (cf. Plessner 1924).

From 1926 until 1930, Buber edited a new interreligious journal called – on Rosenzweig’s suggestion – Die Kreatur, a joint venture with the Protestant physician and Gestalt-psychologist Viktor von Weizsäcker (1886–1957), and the dissident Catholic theologian Joseph Wittig (1879–1949) (see Levy et al 2019). At the same time, Buber collaborated with Franz Rosenzweig on a new translation of the Hebrew scriptures. The project had been suggested to Buber by a young Protestant publisher by the name of Lambert Schneider (1900–1970). Instead of the proposed revision of Luther’s translation, Buber and Rosenzweig developed a whole new approach to translation reflected in the title of the project, Verdeutschung der Schrift. The aim was to have the text rendered in German but in such a way that the reader can intuit characteristics of the Hebrew text behind it. Buber carried on and completed the project by himself after Rosenzweig’s untimely death in December 1929. Buber’s grand-daughter, Judith Buber-Agassi, recalls that there was never a time when they hiked in the Dolomites on vacation that Buber would not carry with him proofs of his Bible translation that he would correct as they sat down to rest.

After relinquishing his position at the University of Frankfurt in 1933, a step he took to preempt his forced dismissal as a Jew, Buber coordinated the activities of the Mittelstelle für jüdische Erwachsenenbildung, an organization devoted to creating pedagogical spaces for Jewish teachers dismissed by the German government across Germany (Simon 1959). This initiative of the Reichsvertretung der deutschen Juden chaired by Leo Baeck (1873–1956) aimed to meet the urgent needs of educators and other professionals excluded from their professions, many of whom had no prior exposure to Jewish communal life and its needs. The teacher training was modeled on Rosenzweig’s Lehrhaus method and based on dialogue and mutual instruction. One of Buber’s assistants in the project was a young Abraham Joshua Heschel (1907–1972). The open form of adult education created islands of free speech at a time when the Nazis enforced ideological conformity across all German institutions and the media (Gleichschaltung; Bracher 1972). Buber suffered some restrictions on public speaking but was by and large free of harassment until his home was ransacked during the nation-wide pogrom of November 9–11, 1938. At that time, he and his family were staying in Jerusalem where he had received a call to the Hebrew University, Jerusalem, an institution he had helped to initiate in the early 1900s and that he had long served as member of its curatorium. The position he accepted, with hesitation, was in sociology and social philosophy.

Before Buber’s name was associated with the “dialogic principle” of I and Thou, he had established himself as a critic, a meticulous and versatile editor, a Nietzsche-inspired writer, a literary translator, and folklorist. He was a captivating speaker and he corresponded widely with the poets, artists, and scholars of his time. Yet, none of these pursuits captures the aura associated with his name. Husserl is known to have remarked, “Buber? But he is a legend!” For his fiftieth birthday, Paula Buber (née Winkler, 1877–1958), together with the neo-dealist philosopher Karl Joel (1864–1934), marshalled over fifty authors to contribute short pieces to a Festgabe (Aus unbekannten Schriften; on Paula Buber’s editorship see Baur 2023, 254) and one of Buber’s Prague Bar Kochba disciples, the later historian of nationalism Hans Kohn (1891–1971), published the first biography of Buber (see Maor 2018), in which he correlated Buber’s life with the great questions and movements of his age. Beginning in the late 1940’s, Buber received many international accolades, including the Peace Prize of the German Book Trade Association (Börsenverein des Deutschen Buchhandels), and he was a sought-after lecturer in Europe and the United States. Of slight built, with a long (perfumed) beard that made him resemble God, he knew how to perform what he taught (Habermas 2015). In private, he very much expected and received the deference of family, students, and domestics (Gordon 1988).

Buber’s scholarly and literary interests ranged from mysticism to sociology, the Bible, phenomenology of religion, philosophical anthropology, psychology and psychotherapy, education, political theory, art history, poetry, and theater. In his later philosophical lectures and publications, he wrestled with Heideggerian and Sartrean existentialism (Eclipse of God) and the problem of evil (Images of Good and Evil). But it is I and Thou (1923), above all, that cemented his fame. The book was translated into many languages, including twice into English. It offers a sustained meditation on the twofold “primordial words” I-It and I-Thou. The I-It is the root of all subject-object relations, the reduction of the other as it occurs to a shrunken and abstract self, one for which everything – and ultimately itself – is instrumental, isolated, and manipulable. In short, it stands for the scientistic Cartesian mathesis universalis, the methodological reduction of knowledge to phenomena produced (or structured) by the human mind (the Kantian subject) or mediated by a unitary/unifying (monistic) principle (e.g., the Hegelian spirit or Marxist economic theory). Against this soul-crushing reduction of the world (the Kantian “thing in itself,” or – in the language of Buber’s teacher Wilhelm Dilthey – “life”) Buber posits the I-Thou relation, which he regards as the root of what occurs “between” self and the other as Other, rather than an as an extension or projection of the self. In this relation, the emphasis is on the “between” of Self and Other. Self and Other are transcendent of one another. As Bloch puts it, the Thou or Other constitutes “an aporia” for the Self. One might say that the famous distinction between “society” (Gesellschaft) and “community” (Gemeinschaft), first introduced into sociology by F. Tönnies in 1887, is here turned into a philosophical anthropological principle of relationality, emphasizing “betweenness” and communication over the monological agency of the sovereign self. The I-Thou, which cannot be reduced to a concept but represents the actual experience (better: Erlebnis, i.e., encounter) to which it points, can manifest in different spheres. It occurs between human being and nature, namely, in moments of concrete encounter with natural things (e.g., “this tree”), though in this sphere, the relationship is “pre-dialogic” because (for Buber) it is not reciprocal. It occurs between human beings, involving reciprocity but not identity. This is in contrast to Schopenhauer’s – and the early Buber’s – invoking of the tat twam asi of the Upanishads. Finally, as an experience constitutive of faith, it occurs between human being and God, whereby “God” is not here defined by any particular religion. The fact that the divine other – though neither as a metaphysical principle nor as a traditional doctrine – appears on the horizon of the life of dialogue made Buber’s teaching rather unpalatable to the radically secular, anti-religious Zionist youths Buber attempted to reach once he moved to Palestine (see Wehr 2010, 201). Yet, with I and Thou, Buber had found his mature philosophical voice. His contribution to the philosophy of dialogue assured him the enthusiastic reception he received later on in Europe and the US, in the 1950s and early 60s, the age of a new counter culture. Buber lived long enough for his constructive philosophy of dialogue to find an eager reception among the young of that later generation who were as troubled by the social ills and political threats of their own time as the first readers of Buber’s work had been in the interwar period.

In his private life, the philosopher of the “I and Thou” allowed very few people to call him by his first name; the theorist of education suffered no disturbance of his rigorous schedule by children playing in his own home; the utopian politician alienated most representatives of the Zionist establishment; and the innovative academic lecturer faced major resistance when his appointment at Hebrew University was at stake. Some of the most dedicated students of this inspiring orator and writer found themselves irritated by the conflict between their master’s ideas and their own attempts at putting them into practice. To some extent Buber also remained the well-groomed, affectuated, prodigiously gifted, pampered Vienna-born boy, displaced in a land of horses and chemists, whose best company were the works of his own imagination and whose self-staging overtures to the outside world were always tainted by his enthusiasm for words and for the heightened tone of his own prodigious voice.

2. Philosophical Influences

Buber’s biographers (Kohn 1930; Wehr 1968; Schaeder 1972; Treml 2001; Wehr 2010; Bourél 2015; Mendes-Flohr 2019) largely follow their subject’s own published and private statements on his early exposure to philosophical ideas. We know that he gave his bar mitzvah speech on a poem by Friedrich Schiller (see MBW I, 93–98). But the speech was also conventionally pious. Buber tells us (in Autobiographical Fragments, 1972, 11–13) that “philosophy twice, in the form of two books, entrenched directly on (his) existence–in (his) fifteenth and in (his) seventeenth year.” His general philosophical education, he tells us, was based on thoroughly reading Plato in Greek (“my favorite language”). In contrast, the two books he mentions broke into his world like “catastrophic events.” The first of these books had a calming effect on a young mind wrestling with the problem of time that, however one imagined one’s existence within it (“time with a beginning and an end or a time without beginning or end”), confronted one with “absurdities” that could not be assuaged by taking recourse to “mathematical of physical formulae” (Buber 1972, 11). “Then a book came into my hand, Kant’s Prolegomena. In it was taught that space and time are ‘nothing more than formal conditions of our sensory faculty,’ are ‘not real properties that adhere to the things in themselves’ but ‘mere forms of our sensory perception.” It was “this philosophy,” Buber continues, that “exercised a great quieting effect on me. (…) Time was not a sentence hanging over me; it was mine, for it was ‘ours.’ (…) Kant’s present to me at that time was philosophical freedom.” The second book “transported” Buber “into a sublime intoxication” that took him “a long time (…) to escape (…) and attain to a certainty of the real” (ibid.) One might argue that the last and most personal of Buber’s mystical writings (Daniel, 1913) was still thoroughly inspired by the literary gesture of Nietzsche’s Zarathustra, the work that had caused such intoxication in the sixteen-year old. [Isaac Bashevis Singer, writing in Commentary Magazine, later disparaged Maurice Friedman’s American translation of Buber’s Daniel as “rootless mysticism” (Singer 1965).]

Between 1896 and 1899 Buber studied the history of art, German literature, philosophy, and psychology in Vienna, Leipzig (1897/98), Berlin (1898/99), and Zurich (1899). (MBW I 301–304 gives a list of the academic courses Buber registered for.) In Vienna he absorbed the oracular poetry of Stefan George (1868–1933), which influenced him greatly though he never became a disciple. In Leipzig and Berlin, he developed an interest in the ethnic psychology (Völkerpsychologie) of Wilhelm Wundt (1832–1920), the social philosophy of Georg Simmel, the psychology of Carl Stumpf (1848–1936), and the lebensphilosophisch approach to the humanities of Wilhelm Dilthey (1833–1911). In Leipzig he attended meetings of the Society for Ethical Culture (Gesellschaft für ethische Kultur), then dominated by the thought o Ferdinand Lasalle (1825–1864) and Ferdinand Tönnies (1855–1936), according to Max Scheler (1924) the Altmeister of the new discipline of the “sociology of knowledge.” In a letter to his biographer Maurice Friedman, Buber names “Simmel and Dilthey (as his) teachers. They strongly influenced my thinking in the years 1898–1904 but, to my knowledge, had no influence whatsoever on the philosophy of I and Thou” (cited by Treml in MBW I, 32). While Buber likely appropriated the language of Erlebnis from Dilthey (see Treml, ibid.), the extent to which Buber learned from and shared Dilthey’s fundamental philosophical and systematic concerns (e.g., the distinction between Erklären and Verstehen developed later by Karl-Otto Apel; see Apel 1979) is not clear and remains to be examined.

Buber retained many basic convictions he found in his early philosophical readings. In Kant he had found two answers to his concern with the nature of time and space. If time and space are pure forms of perception, then they pertain to things only as they appear to us (phenomena) and not to things-in-themselves (noumena). If our experience of others, especially of persons, is of objects of our experience, then we necessarily reduce them to the scope of our phenomenal knowledge, in other words, to what Buber later called the I-It relation. Yet Kant also indicated ways of meaningfully speaking of the noumenal, even though not in terms of theoretical reason. Practical reason – as expressed in “maxims of action,” categorical imperatives, or principles of duty we choose for their own sake and regardless of outcome – obliges us to consider persons as ends in themselves rather than means to an end. This suggests something like an absolute obligation. Teleological (aesthetic) judgment, as developed in Kant’s Third Critique, suggests the possibility of a meaningful grounding of teleological representation. Kant’s conceptions of ethics and aesthetics resonated with Buber’s notion that the phenomenon is always the gateway to the noumenon, just as the noumenal cannot be encountered other than in, and by way of, concrete phenomena. Thus Buber managed to meld Kantian metaphysical and ethical conceptions into a more immediate relation with things as they appear to us and as we represent them to ourselves. Buber succeeded in translating this theoretical dialectic of immediacy and distance, phenomenal encounter and reflexivity, into a style he cultivated in his writing but also in his manner of personal interactions. In Nietzschean terms, Buber sought not only to describe but to live the tension between a Dionysian primacy of life in its particularity, immediacy, and individuality and the Apollonian world of form, measure, and abstraction as inter-dependent forces. Both are constitutive of human experience in that they color our interactions with the other in nature, with other human beings, and with the divine. Buber thus developed his own distinctive voice in the emerging chorus of writers, thinkers, and artists of his time who rallied against the widely perceived “alienation” associated with bourgeois society. What the early Buber – torn between transcendent mysticism and fascination with the abundance of life manifest in its many social forms – lacked was a uniform or systematic point of view from which these disparate intuitions could be united, where his kaleidoscopic engagements could find integration, an idea large and flexible enough to satisfy his appetite for an ever changing world of experience and at the same time keep the divine in view as the orienting vanishing point. The answer to this question came to Buber at the time when his thought took a turn, as Mendes-Flohr was the first to argue, from social mysticism to a socially responsible, that is, to an ethical orientation, from an amoral solipsism of pure encounter to a morality constituted between self and other, i.e., in authentic, open, unprejudiced dialogue.

3. Philosophy of Dialogue: I and Thou

Martin Buber was already widely recognized as a literary author (Schriftsteller), essayist, public speaker, and editor among the early 20th-century Central European cultural avantgarde when he published Ich und Du (“I and Thou”), the work that established his global reputation as an original philosopher. This short, highly poetic book has been perceived as a contribution to the philosophy of dialogue (Theunissen 1965), to philosophical anthropology (Biemann 2025), to moral philosophy (Scott 2025), education (Simon 1965), psycho-therapy (Schulthess 2021), and communication studies (Siebers 2025). This variety of receptions attests to the sustained fertility and ongoing impact of Buber’s thought.

Though Buber was neither the first nor the only thinker to articulate the insight that there is no “I” without a “you,” or that being spoken to precedes all speaking, his writings on the dialogical principle (see MBWA 4, 2019) are among the best-known and most widely cited that make dialogue and its implications their foundation. The list of earlier and contemporary “dialogical thinkers” adduced by Buber-biographer Gerhard Wehr (Wehr 1968) includes Ferdinand Ebner (1882–1931), Hermann Cohen (1842–1918), Franz Rosenzweig (1886–1929), Hans Ehrenberg (1883–1958), and Eugen Rosenstock-Huessy (1888–1973). Their forerunners include Johann Georg Hamann (1730–1788), Friedrich-Heinrich Jacobi (1743–1819), Ludwig Feuerbach (1804–1872), and others. For Michael Theunissen (1965), Buber’s philosophy of dialogue offers a critical alternative to the existentialism of Heidegger and Sartre, insofar as the latter (along with Husserl) remain beholden to the egological structure of transcendental philosophy. For Jochanan Bloch (1977), every second-order attempt to translate Buber’s insights into concepts necessarily falls short of Buber’s intention and therefore distorts it. The “primal words” (I-thou, I-it) are still words, so Bloch in the conclusion to his book on the “aporia of the Thou;” but they can “lead us to the truth, as other words do. The truth announces itself in [these words], but it is not contained in them” (Bloch 310). Bloch’s approach is reminiscent of Buber’s own frequent demurral when asked to explain his philosophical doctrine in more conventional terms: “I have no doctrine. I only point to something. I point to a reality, I point something out about reality that has not been seen at all or not enough. I take him who listens to me by the hand and lead him to the window. I push the window open and point outside. I have no doctrine but I conduct a conversation.” [Ich habe keine Lehre. Ich zeige nur etwas. Ich zeige Wirklichkeit, ich zeige etwas an der Wirklichkeit, was nicht oder zu wenig gesehen worden ist. Ich nehme ihn, der mir zuhört, an der Hand und führe ihn zum Fenster. Ich stoße das Fenster auf und zeige hinaus. Ich habe keine Lehre, aber ich führe ein Gespräch.] (MBW I, 1114.)

Whereas the early Buber aimed for an aesthetic of unity, his later writings give voice to an ethically inflected dualism. Buber always opposed philosophical monism, which he identified with Bergson, and objected to “doctrines of immersion,” which he identified with Buddhism. Complicating the undifferentiated shape of mystical experience (as sought by the medievals, including Eckhart, as an annihilation of self), the profoundly dualistic world-view proffered in I and Thou references Cusa’s coincidentia oppositorum as an expression of human limits. Buber’s text reduces the relation between persons, animate objects, and deity to three expressive signifiers: “I”, “You”, and “It”. They are the elemental variables whose combination and re-combination structure all experience as relational. The individuated elements realize themselves in relations, forming patterns that burst into life, grow, vanish, and revive. Human inter-subjectivity affirms the polymorphous I-Thou encounter. Resting upon the claim that no isolated I exists apart from relationship to an other, dialogue or “encounter” transforms each figure into an ultimate and mysterious center of value whose presence eludes the concepts of instrumental language. The heteronomous revelation of a singular presence calls the subject into an open-ended relationship, a living pattern, that precedes all sense, logic, and proportion; whereas the I-It relationship, in its most degenerate stage, assumes the fixed form of objects that one can measure and manipulate. At the core of this model of existence is the notion of encounter as “revelation.” As understood by Buber, revelation is the revelation of “presence” (Gegenwart). In contrast to “object” (Gegenstand), the presence revealed by revelation as encounter occupies the space “in between” the subject and an other (a tree, a person, a work of art, God). This “in between” is either “mutual” (gegenseitig), or it remains pre-dialogic. Contrasting with the Kantian concept of experience (Erfahrung), the Dilthey-inspired emphasis on Erlebnis (encounter) in the sense of revelation of presence that precedes all conceptual fixation. Since encounter can also be silent, it retains an element of the mystical, unlike Rosenzweig’s “speech thinking” or the linguistic turn associated with the later Wittgenstein. Buber always insisted that the dialogic principle, i.e., the duality of primal words (Urworte) that he called the I-Thou and the I-It, was not an abstract conception but an ontological reality that he pointed to but that could not be properly represented in discursive prose.

I and Thou intentionally blurs the boundaries between philosophy and theology. While Buber seems to lack a fully worked-out epistemology and occasionally revels in paradoxes that border on mystical theology, it has been argued that Buber did indeed solve the inherent “difficulty of dialogics that it reflects on, and speaks of, a human reality about which, in his own words, one cannot think and speak in an appropriate manner” (Bloch [1983] p. 62). Debates about the strength and weakness of I and Thou as the foundation of a system hinge, in part, on whether Buber set out to develop a “philosophy of dialogue” when he wrote Ich und Du. It rather seems as if the occasion to write what eventually became a free-standing and fertile philosophical work started out as the prolegomena to a planned five-volume project that Buber eventually abandoned. Buber’s lectures at the Freies jüdisches Lehrhaus and his courses at University of Frankfurt, as well as letters to Rosenzweig show that, at the time of writing Ich und Du, he was preoccupied with a new approach to the phenomenology of religion (cf. Schottroff, Zank). In Buber’s cyclical conception of the history of religions, the revelation of presence mixes into and animates the living and lived forms of historical religion (institutions, texts, rituals, images, and ideas), becoming over time ossified and rigid and object-like, but structurally open to the force of renewal based on new forms of encounter as revelation. The history of religion as described by Buber in the closing words of I and Thou is a contracting, intensifying spiral figure that has redemption as its telos. It would be artificial, however, to separate Buber’s interest in religious phenomena from his interest in a general philosophical anthropology. Rather, Buber seems to have tried to find one in the other, or—put differently—to make religious belief and practice perspicacious in light of a general philosophical anthropology.

In the 1967 “Library of Living Philosophers” volume Paul Arthur Schilpp dedicated to Martin Buber, Buber emphasizes that he has nothing to teach, meaning that the dialogical principle he drew from his life experience and that he pursued in his writings as in his lived practice was not a doctrine at all. He simply took one by the hand, walked to the window, and pointed something out. This image is deceptively simple, and the demurral of having nothing to teach may just as well express an abiding resistance, on Buber’s part, to conventional forms of knowing, things a student might put down in a notebook and repeat in an examination. What he seems to be saying is, you need to look for yourself; all I can do is point you in a certain direction. The direction given is not introspective; we cannot discover the true self in ourselves. And it is not a mystical experience: we must not deny what is before our eyes and know the truth about Everything in an act of negation or self-effacement. The truth is neither in us, nor beyond us, but right before our eyes, provided we look out of the window. Why the window? What room are we in? Clearly, we are in Buber’s library, in a world of books and readings and inherited wisdom. We need to step not out the door but to the window, the open window no less, so that our world of learning may be confronted with what’s “out there.” Buber never wrote off the cuff, so we may take him by his word. The “dialogical principle” (dialogisches Prinzip), though seemingly a prompt to action, invites us to look and see something we had not noticed before, something we (and here it is a bookish “we” that we must think of) had not considered. Dialogue disrupts the thinker at his desk and forces him to get up because there is someone else around, and a world “out there.” Much like the simile of ascent and descent in the Platonic image of the Cave, Buber’s looking out of the window shifts our relation to the things as merely talked or thought about to a genuine relation toward how they present themselves to us. Echoing the Aristotelian version of the cave exit (cf. Blumenberg 1996), Buber does not lead us to seeing things as they “truly” are but to the things themselves (zu den Sachen selbst), an intention he shares with Husserl and phenomenology.

4. From Cultural Zionism to Binationalism

As a student in Leipzig, Buber approached Herzl with an invitation to address a Zionist group he was organizing. The famous Budapest-born and Vienna-based journalist and playwrite Theodor Herzl (1860–1904) instead invited Buber to edit the main paper of the Zionist journal, Die Welt. Buber accepted the position hoping to make the journal an organ of the Jewish cultural revival he sought through the promotion of modernist Jewish arts and letters. He soon realized that he could not achieve such a lofty goal under the supervision of the more pragmatic Herzl. Buber gave up the editorship and joined the “democratic faction,” an opposition group within the Zionist Congress that promoted the “cultural Zionism” of Asher Ginzburg (pen-name Achad Ha’am). The group included the Russian chemist Chaim Weizmann (1874–1952) who later succeeded Herzl, successfully extracted the long-sought charter for Jewish nation-building in Palestine from the British government (Balfour Declaration, 1917), and eventually served as the first president of the Jewish state. Buber’s Zionism developed in a different direction. He left the congress in 1903 to pursue his mission of a Jewish spiritual “renaissance” (Biemann 2009) independently through writing and lecturing, but returned to active participation in Zionist politics in 1921 when he attended the Twelfth Zionist Congress in Carlsbad as a delegate of the socialist Hashomer Hatzair (“the young guard”). On that occasion he vigorously advocated against making common cause with British colonialism and in favor of a constructive relationship between Zionism and the Arab majority population in Palestine (see MBW 21, 2019). Buber’s politics was informed by the anarchism of Gustav Landauer whose literary executor he became after his friend’s slaying on the streets of Munich (1919). Instead of cultivating Jewish nationhood in the spirit of the nineteenth-century Romanticism that had informed Buber’s early speeches on Judaism he now promoted a forward looking, antimessianic (Brody 2025) orientation of Jewish politics based on the model of the biblical book of Judges, a model he interpreted much as Spinoza had interpreted the covenantal moment at Sinai in chapter 16 of his Theological-Political Treatise (1670), namely, as an anarchic body politic grounded in radical human equality (see Buber 1932, Brody 2018). Having moved beyond his early rhetoric of Jewish cultural renewal, he took the position of a prophetic voice against Zionism as a typical colonial settler project. Buber joined Brit Shalom, a group founded in 1925 at the home of the German Zionist economist Arthur Ruppin (1876–1943) that included like-minded leaders, including the founder of the Jewish women’s organization Hadassah, Henrietta Szold (1860–1945) and the pacifist and founding president of Hebrew University, Judah L. Magnes (1877–1948). Brit Shalom argued for peaceful means of developing the Jewish yishuv in Palestine. Buber vigorously agitated on behalf of political and practical alternatives to British-supported economic development, settlement expansion, and centralized Jewish homeland building in Palestine that inevitably impressed the Arab population as hostile. In response to the Biltmore Conference of 1942, where the Zionist leadership openly called for Jewish statehood in Palestine, Buber and the IHUD (a group in Mandatory Palestine formed on the principles of Brit Shalom), called for a binational state in Palestine instead. After the establishment of the State of Israel (May 1948), Buber once again made himself part of a loyal opposition. He accepted the state as his own but joined forces with those who called for a swift reversal of Arab displacement (the Nakba) and a resolution to the Palestinian refugee problem. In later years, Buber advocated for the lifting of the military administration Israel had imposed on the Palestinian villagers of the Galilee. Buber strongly hoped to sway the majority. But he also believed that it was important to speak the moral truth as one saw it, no matter its immediate success. His advocacy for moral responsibility rather than political expediency made him few friends among the members of the Zionist establishment.

At the theoretical core of the Zionism advanced by Buber was a conception of Jewish identity that was determined neither by religion nor by nationality but constituted a unique hybrid. From early on, Buber rejected the pursuit of Jewish sovereign statehood in Palestine as inappropriate for two reasons. It contravened what he saw as the utopian goal of responsible politics, which was always from the ground up, with only minimal functions assigned to any central government, and it seemed unethical to him to seek majority rule over the existing Arab population. Buber expressed these views as early as 1916, in a public exchange of letters with the liberal philosopher Hermann Cohen. Cohen opposed Zionism as incommensurate with the mission of a religious minority tasked with maintaining the idea of messianism. Cohen represented the mainstream German Jewish position, which worked in defense of the integration of Jews into German society without relinquishing their rights as a religious community, and he saw the Messianic idea as a motor of social and political reform within society at large. In contrast, Buber embraced Zionism as the awakening and renewal of a transnational but essentially “Oriental” people, a Jewish community nourished by its connection with the ancient homeland and the character of the Hebrew language. For Cohen, this kind of romantic nationalism seemed dangerous, its dangers evident to anyone who saw the same romantic nationalism at work in the hyper-nationalism of the German conservative reaction. Buber shared with Cohen the criticism of hyper-nationalism as well as the awareness for the deficiencies of modern politics that reduced statecraft to state power and promoted the imperialist drive for domination and capitalist resource maximation. Buber later abandoned the characterization of the Jews as “Oriental” and adopted Cohen’s idea of a specific Jewish calling as distinct from the purely communitarian, demanding the pursuit of an exemplary collective.

5. Political Theology

Buber honed his political theology in response to the conflict between fascism and communism, the two main ideologies dominating mid-twentieth century Europe. His national-utopian thought shared traits with both of these extreme positions and made him, in fact, one of the few Jewish personages “acceptable” as a partner for debate with moderate National Socialists in the early 1930s, a proximity he himself vigorously dismissed as a misperception. His political position remained indissolubly linked to his philosophical-theological commitment to the life of dialogue developed in I and Thou. According to Buber, politics was the work by which a society shapes itself. He rejected any hardened ideological formations of “the collective” and thus objected to the solutions articulated on either political extreme. He understood these to recognize neither an I nor a Thou in social life. Buber particularly opposed the notion that the political sphere rested on the friend/enemy distinction, as theorized by the ultra-conservative jurist Carl Schmitt (1888–1985). Buber’s political ideal, acephalic and utopian as it was, was derived from his reconstruction of the ancient Israelite polity as reflected in the Book of Judges. It has been argued that his reading of Judges was inspired by the anarchism of Landauer and pays homage to him. (See Brody 2018.)

As presented by Buber in the 1930s, the primary governing trope of Jewish political theology—divine kingship (Königtum Gottes)—represents an answer to Schmitt, whose political theology allowed divine power to be absorbed by the human sovereign. Buber resisted this slippage, privileging instead the anti-monarchical strata of the Hebrew Bible. In his 1932 book on the Kingship of God, the biblical hero Gideon from chapter eight of the Book of Judges stands out as the leader who, beating back the Philistine enemy, declines any claim to hereditary kingship. What Buber reads as a genuine, unconditional “no” to political sovereignty rests on an unconditional “yes” affirming the absolute kingship of God. Against the theory staked out by Schmitt, the assertion that God alone is sovereign means that God’s authority is non-transferable to any human head or political institution. Whether he was aware of it or not, his conclusions closely resemble those of Spinoza who, in his Theological Political Treatise (1670), chapters 16–20, shows what happens when divine sovereignty is exchanged for human government. Buber preserves the notion of divine sovereignty over all forms of state apparatus and tyranny. He privileges simple, preliminary, primitive, and immediate forms of kingship in the personalist sense of the “west-Semitic” conception of the Malk, which Buber defines as “der mitgehende Gott.” (Königtum Gottes 1932, 65). Genuine “theocracy” is here not a form of government at all, but rather a striving against the political tide. The messianic ideal of divine kingship found in the Hebrew Bible is presented as a reliable image preserved by the collective memory of tradition. Buber maintained that once upon a time the Israelite deity YHWH was, in fact, the warrior-king of the people. But he also knew that he was unable to posit this for certain, and so proceeded to admit that the image reflects not a historical actuality that we can know, but only a historical possibility.

In Paths in Utopia (1947), Buber argued that “(t)he relationship between centralism and decentralization is a problem which…cannot be approached in principle, but…only with great spiritual tact, with the constant and tireless weighing and measuring of the right proportion between them.” As a “social pattern,” utopia involves a “drawing and re-drawing of lines of demarcation” (Paths in Utopia, 1996, 137). As an “experiment that did not fail,” the Jewish village communes in Palestine (i.e. the kvutza, kibbutz, and moshav) owed their success to the pragmatism with which their members approached the historical situation, to their inclination towards increased levels of federation, and to the degree to which they established a relationship to the society at large. Single units combine into a system or “series of units” without the centralization of state authority (ibid., 142–8). “Nowhere…in the history of the Socialist movement were men so deeply involved in the process of differentiation and yet so intent on preserving the principle of integration” (ibid., 145). They discovered “[t]he right proportion, tested anew every day according to changing conditions, between group-freedom and collective order” (ibid., 148). It is not difficult to recognize in this description of the modern agricultural collective an updated version of the biblical tribal past that Buber idealized in his work on the primitive Israelite polity in the age of the biblical judges.

6. Distance and Relation: Late Philosophical Anthropology

Buber’s philosophical oeuvre assumed a more occasionalist and essayistic form in the late 1930s and 1940s. In addition to the works cited above and works on religion, the Bible, and prophetic faith, his last major philosophical publication was The Eclipse of God (1951). What unites all of the late works as a group is the common emphasis on philosophical anthropology, the place of the individual person in the world vis-à-vis other human beings in human community. Whether reflecting on “man” (der Mensch), “the Jew,” or “the individual” (der Einzelne) always critical to Buber’s late thought is the tension between distance and relation, and the role of mediated images in dialogical, open-ended, non-fixed relation to the social and natural world. In this, Buber addressed, but never directly, the tension between “fact” and “value,” explored with more rigor in later nineteenth- and early twentieth-century German philosophy and in post-war Anglo-American analytic philosophy.

One of the signature pieces from this period is the essay on Kierkegaard, Die Frage an den Einzelnen (1936). Buber turns to Kierkegaard in order to force the question of solipsism. For Buber, the Danish philosopher stands for a modern alienation from the world. The question Buber asks is whether it is even possible to conceive of the human being as an individual or as a person in the singular (der Einzelne). According to Buber, Kierkegaard’s love of God excludes the love of neighbor, the fellow creature with whom we constitute “the world” in human terms. With his eye on the creation of Genesis, Buber describes the human being as a subject hovering over and embracing the creaturely world. In this model, there is no renunciation of objects and political life. At the same time, relation does not mean the giving oneself over to the crowd (cf. Heidegger’s man, i.e., the impersonal collectivity of the many). The embrace of creaturely existence remains vexing. Buber characterizes the human being in terms of “potentiality” within factual and finite limits, not in terms of the “radicality” he sees in Kierkegaard. That is to say, instead of positing a radical dichotomy between community and the single one, Buber argues that they are compatible with, and necessary for, one another.

This critique of the single one in relation to a larger social world belongs to the world-picture established by Buber in the essay “What is Man?” (1938). At stake for Buber was a knowledge of the human person as a whole, i.e., a complete understanding of human subjectivity. The methodological key to the essay is a philosophical anthropology. Buber assumed that only by entering into the act of self-reflection can the philosophical anthropologist become aware of human wholeness based on a structural distinction between epochs of human habitation and epochs of human homelessness. In the former, philosophical anthropology is cosmological, i.e. fundamentally related to the world and to human environments. In the latter, human subjectivity is conceived of as self-standing and independent. The conceptual tension is between being at home in a universe of things in contrast to what is presented as the collapse of a rounded and unified world vis-à-vis self-divided forms of consciousness. In order to preserve the imbrication of singular selfhood and the bonding of human personhood, Buber rejected the false choice between individualism and collectivism. As Buber always understood it, human wholeness lies in the meeting of the one with the other in a living fourfold relation to things, individual persons, the mystery of Being, and self. Every living relation is essential and contributes to human wholeness because human wholeness (“man’s unique essence”) is known or posited only in living out a set of relations.

If relationship constitutes the fundamental datum of human wholeness, it remains also true that relation was not understood by Buber independent of its conceptual antipode, namely “distance.” As developed in the essay “Distance and Relation” (1951), relation cannot take shape apart from or without the prior setting of things, persons, and spiritual beings at a distance. For Buber, this setting of things, persons, and beings at a distance is the only way to secure the form of otherness without which there can be no relation. For without the form of otherness there can be no confirmation of self insofar as the confirmation of the I is always mediated by the other who confirms me, both at a distance and in relation, or rather in the distance that is relation and the relation that is difference.

While Buber most famously understood the I-Thou relationship as one based on immediacy, he always steeped his thought in the power of mediating images and other plastic forms as the material stuff of inter-subjective relationship. In the essay “Man and his Image-Work,” Buber set out to understand something about the formation of images in relation to the world, the world encompassed by art, faith, love, and philosophy. Buber postulated three levels of world formation. The first two levels are the familiar Kantian concepts of a noumenal “x” world and a phenomenal sense-world of form, comprising the world as shaped by and in images and concepts. Buber’s conception of the third level, what he calls the world of perfect form, derives from the mystical tradition. This paradoxical level of world formation is expressed in terms of perfected form-relations. In art, faith, and philosophy, the human image-work emerges out of relational encounters between persons and an independent “world” that exists on its own, but is not imaginable.

The concern about “images” in relation to distance and dialogue surfaced again in Buber’s last major work, The Eclipse of God (1952). The so-called “eclipse of God” was Buber’s symbol for the spiritual crisis in postwar Western civilization. It designated a philosophical collapse as much as a moral one. Like Sartre and Heidegger, Buber directed his attention to concrete existence. But unlike his fellow “existentialists,” Buber was moved by the interaction between humans, individually and collectively, and an absolute reality that exceeds the human imagination. Against Sartre, Heidegger, and also Carl Jung, Buber rejected the picture of self-enclosed human subjects and self-enclosed human life-worlds beyond which there are no external, independent realities. Towards the end of his career as a writer and thinker, Buber sought to maintain the distinction and relation between the human subject and an external other in order to sustain an ontological source of ethical value in opposition to the false absolutes of a modern world that had fused the absolute with the political and historical products of the human spirit.

7. Humanistic Psychology and Psychotherapy

Buber approaches psychology, psychotherapy, and psychoanalysis from an extraneous position, namely, from the perspective of a social philosopher or philosophical anthropologist. He articulates his own “doctrine of the human” (die Lehre vom Menschen) as a Seelenlehre or “doctrine of the soul” rather than the technical term “psychology” (Psychologie), connoting scientific objectivity. Thus, his earliest lecture (1923) on psychology, held at the Zurich Psychological Club established by C.G. Jung (1875–1961), bears the title Von der Verseelung der Welt (“On the Ensoulment of the World”); a term resonating with the Philonic notion of an “ensouled logos” (logos empsuchos). Buber’s extension of the insights from I and Thou to psychological theory formation and the practice of psychotherapy is informed by his studies in the history of philosophy, and his social philosophical approach to the “self” or the individual makes problems raised within the clinical confines of individual psychology, such as “guilt feelings,” appear deficient and reductionist, seemingly failing to consider the whole person within their lived social reality (see “Schuld und Schuldgefühle” (1957) in MBW 10, 127–152), a criticism vigorously rejected by C.G. Jung. (See the exchange of letters between PhD student Robert C. Smith from Villanova, Jung, and Buber (1960) in MBW 10, 194ff). Jung didn’t read Buber, whereas Buber read Jung extensively. The two never corresponded directly. Jung nevertheless opined that Buber “was ignorant of psychiatric observation,” that he “lacked practical experience in depth psychology,” and that he therefore “doesn’t know anything about the autonomy of complexes” (MBW 10, 201; transl. MZ, emphasis in the original).

A second aspect of Buber’s critical interventions in the discourse on psychology, psychotherapy, and psychoanalysis concerns the relationship between therapist and analysand. In contrast to Freudian analysis, which aims to remove the therapist from view as much as possible but finds itself compelled to deal with the transfer of the analysand’s emotions onto the therapist, Buber considers the relationship between patient and physician as fundamentally dialogical, though not exactly reciprocal. The dialogical approach to therapy was further developed by Hans Trüb (1889–1949), initially a student of Jung and later a loyal follower and long-time friend of Buber. Among others, Trüb contributed two articles describing his experience as a therapist to Buber’s journal Die Kreatur, where psychologist Viktor von Weizsäcker was a co-editor.

Volume 10 of the Martin Buber Werkausgabe (MBW), edited by Buber’s grand-daughter Judith Buber-Agassi (1924–2018), gathers Buber’s writings on psychology and psychotherapy, starting with “the earliest attestation” (Buber-Agassi in MBW 10, p. 18) of Buber’s preoccupation with problems of psychotherapy, the 1923 lecture on Die Verseelung der Welt, and ending with a German translation of the public dialogue between Buber and psychologist Carl Rogers from April 18, 1957, as transcribed by Kenneth N. Cissna and Rob Anderson (see Cissna and Anderson 1997). Buber-Agassi speaks of Buber’s life-long interest in psychology, psychopathology, and psychotherapy without denying that he was not himself a psychotherapist. (See MBW 10, p. 11) She notes that, in 1897 and 1898, Buber studied psychology and clinical psychiatry in Vienna, Leipzig, and Berlin. In 1909, the Russian psychoanalyst Lou Andreas-Salomé (1861–1937) contributed a volume on “the erotic” to Buber’s series Die Gesellschaft, marking the beginning of a friendship between the author and her editor (MBW 10, p. 12). Buber was critical of Freud but appreciated C.G. Jung, and he occasionally lectured at the Eranos conferences convened by Jung (on Eranos as a circle of “scholars as lay priests” see von Reibnitz in Faber/Holste 2000, 425ff), though he was no longer invited after 1934. An important source for the study of Buber and psychology is his correspondence with Hans Trüb as well as with Buber-disciple Hermann Menachem Gerson (1908–1989), the Nietzschean poet-philosopher Rudolf Pannwitz (1881–1969), psychotherapist Ernst Michel (1889–1964), phenomenological psychologist Ludwig Binswanger (1881–1966), psychiatrist Leslie Farber (1912–1981), and others. In the United States, Buber lectured to the seminar of the School of Psychiatry in Washington (see Farber 1957) and gained attention through his public dialogue with Carl Rogers. Altogether, Buber held more than seventy lectures across the US. The most important of these were published as The Eclipse of God-Studies in the Relation between Religion and Philosophy (1952), which included a lecture on “Religion and Modern Thought,” first published in the journal Merkur (1952), which included an extensive discussion and critique of Jung’s psychological theory of religion. Buber takes Jung to task for reducing religion to something immanent, at the expense of divine transcendence. Jung responded to this criticism in an article on “Religion and Psychology,” published in the same journal, which also published a further response by Buber (see MBW 10, 86–89 and 266–274). The debate falters because Buber argues that Jung’s statements about the psychic origin of religious beliefs exceed the strict confines of empirical psychology, while Jung dismisses Buber and other critics beholden to traditional systems of thought as “naturally incapable of understanding” him correctly.

8. Criticism

Philosophical criticism of Buber tends to focus on three areas: [1] epistemological questions regarding the status of the I-Thou relationality and the status of the object-world delimited by the I-It relationality, [2] hermeneutical questions regarding Buber’s reading of Hasidic source material, and [3] doubts regarding the author’s rhetoric and style that touch upon the philosophy of language. All three lines of criticism have at their core the problem of the conflict between realism and idealism, world-affirmation and world-denial.

The nature of the world picture in Buber’s magnum opus has always been among the most contested aspects of Buber’s philosophy in the critical literature. I and Thou is considered to have inaugurated “a Copernican revolution in theology (…) against the scientific-realistic attitude” (Bloch 1983, 42), but it has also been criticized for its reduction of fundamental human relations to just two—the I-Thou and the I-It. Writing to Buber after the publication of I and Thou, Rosenzweig would not be the last critic to complain, “In your setting up the I-IT, you give the I-Thou a cripple for an opponent.” He continued to rebuke, “You make of creation a chaos, just good enough to provide construction material (Baumaterial) for the new building” (Franz Rosenzweig, Briefe und Tagebücher, 824–5). In Jewish philosophical circles, it has long been argued that Buber was unable to ward off the relativism, subjectivism, and antinomianism that are said to permeate non-realist epistemologies and ontologies. Building on Rosenzweig’s complaint against Buber’s epistemology, Steven Katz called for a “realism” that affirms the rich world of stable objects extended in time and space. It is still widely assumed by his critics in Jewish philosophy that in his critique of Jewish law and the I-It form of relationship Buber rejected the world of object-forms in toto.

Buber’s pneumatic way of reading and explicating religious literature gave him an air of prophetic authority. But there is more to Buber than oracular language. Buber shared with Ludwig Feuerbach and the young Karl Marx the intuition that theological language conveys insights that reveal less about God than about the human capacity for love for our fellow creatures. Buber uses theological tropes without calling attention to their theological character. He employs them to give voice to the human potential for partnership, sociality, mutuality, and change, not just in relation with our fellow humans but also with our fellow creatures. Buber’s diction suggests that it is possible for us to make the here and now the moment of being present to another and with one another. The emphasis is not on the I or on the Thou as such – to think those as isolated concepts or ideas immediately incarcerates them in the I-It relation – but on the “between.” That the Other is not at my beck and call, but must be awaited and encountered, is akin to reverence. Conversely, that I am not at the beck and call of the Other differentiates Buber’s I-Thou from Rosenzweig’s concept of revelation – which requires being commanded – as well as from Levinas’s notion of the “face,” which imposes an excessive demand on the self. The priority of Other before Self that we find in Rosenzweig and Levinas is alien to Buber. For Levinas, Buber remained caught in an aestheticizing attitude to the detriment of “ethics as first philosophy” (Anderson). For Rosenzweig, Buber failed to account for the demands of the Law as constitutive of the Jewish encounter with God.

Buber’s early versions of Hasidic tales were criticized by those who professionalized the study of Hasidism and Jewish mysticism more broadly, first and foremost by Gershom Scholem, who went on to become the uncontested doyen of modern Kabbalah scholarship. Among others, Scholem argued that Buber’s focus on the genre of folk-tales obscured the theoretical works within the corpus Hasidic literature, where the phenomenon of (gnostic) world denial was more pronounced than in the popular tales. Buber’s later collections of Hasidic tales in particular reflect a this-worldly ethos at odds with important tenets of Hasidic mysticism. Whereas Buber’s early, neo-romantic Hasidica assumed a more distant and even antagonistic relation to the world of time and space, critics, such as Scholem, Katz, and Schatz-Uffenheimer, focused their critique almost exclusively on the later body of work, in which a this-wordly cosmology was more sharply articulated, in line with Buber’s own renewed interest, starting in the mid to late 1920s, with quotidian forms of existence. More recent studies recognize that Buber increasingly moved from creative reinvention to a careful reconstruction of Hasidic tales. His body of work in this area remains unmatched. (See Shonkoff 2018a, 2025).

The analytic philosopher Steven T. Katz, author of an important essay about the particularism of mystical language, articulated a range of criticisms directed against Buber’s writings (Katz 1985). More recently, Katz revisited and mitigated some of these earlier criticisms that included the charge of antinomianism, the lack of an account for the enduring character of the I-Thou relation, and the misrepresentation of Hasidic thought (Katz in Zank 2006). What remains most objectionable in Buber is the tendency toward an aestheticization of reality and the problem of Buber’s often slippery poetic rhetoric. Walter Kaufmann, who produced a second English translation of I and Thou, articulated his displeasure with Buber most strongly. While he did not regard the lack of deep impact of Buber’s contributions to biblical studies, Hasidism, and Zionist politics as an indication of failure, Kaufmann considered I and Thou a shameful performance in both style and content. In style the book invoked “the oracular tone of false prophets” and it was “more affected than honest.” Writing in a state of “irresistible enthusiasm,” Buber lacked the critical distance needed to critique and revise his own formulations. His conception of the I-It was a “Manichean insult” while his conception of the I-Thou was “rashly romantic and ecstatic,” and Buber “mistook deep emotional stirrings for revelation.” (Kaufmann 1983, 28–33). The preponderance in Buber’s writings of rhetorical figures, such as “experience,” “realization,” “revelation,” “presence” and “encounter,” and his predilection for utopian political programs such as anarchism, socialism, and a binational solution to the intractable national conflict between Jews and Arabs in Palestine, are in line with a vagueness in his philosophical writing that often renders Buber’s thought suggestive, but elusive. Similar criticisms apply to Buber’s claim that language has the power to reveal divine presence or uncover Being.

Buber’s early avantgarde style sounded antiquated to the younger readers born around 1900 (Braiterman, 2007). While similarly inclined literary authors like Hermann Hesse praised Buber’s German renditions of Hasidic lore and his Bible translation later gained popular praise among German theologians, others, among them Franz Kafka, Theodor W. Adorno, and Siegfried Kracauer, spoke of Buber’s style disparagingly.

Buber’s practical political positions on Jewish-Arab cooperation, peaceful development of the yishuv, and morally responsible action after the founding of the Jewish state were criticized as unrealistic by the leadership of political Zionism and he was felt to be a thorn in the side of Ben Gurion’s “statist” (mamlakhtiut) approach. More recently, Arab and Muslim voices have joined the chorus of critics. In the view of Tel Aviv University political scientist Amal Jamal, if one measures Buber’s one-sided pronouncements, however capacious, on the “Arab question” by the standards of Buber’s I-thou rhetoric, it is clear that Buber failed to live up to his own standards. Palestinians are treated largely in a patronizing, orientalist fashion, depriving them of the relation between true equals and denying them any real political agency (Jamal 2025). Similarly, the anthropologist Khaled Furani laments the neglect of Islam in Buber’s writings (Furani 2025).

9. Honors and Legacy

Largely ignored by academic philosophers, Buber was already widely recognized and reviewed across the larger field of German letters before World War I. He rose to renewed prominence in Germany after World War II, where his Bible translation, collections of Hasidic stories, and writings on the philosophy of dialogue have remained in print ever since. Among the honors Buber received after 1945 were the Goethe Prize of the City of Hamburg (1951), the Friedenspreis des Deutschen Buchhandels (Frankfurt am Main, 1953), and the Erasmus Prize (Amsterdam, 1963). Significant students who considered their own work a continuation of Buber’s were Nahum Glatzer (Buber’s only doctoral student during his years at the university in Frankfurt, 1924–1933, later an influential teacher of Judaic Studies at Brandeis University), Akiba Ernst Simon (historian and theorist of education in Israel who first met Buber at the Freies jüdisches Lehrhaus in Frankfurt, and who returned from Palestine to work with Buber for the Mittelstelle für jüdische Erwachsenenbildung), and important Israeli scholars, such as Shmuel Eisenstadt, Amitai Etzioni, and Jochanan Bloch, who knew Buber in his later years when he taught seminars on social philosophy and education at the Hebrew University of Jerusalem. As for the United States, Buber’s American translator and biographer Maurice Friedman, a prolific author in his own right, almost single-handedly introduced Buber to post-war American religion scholars and the larger reading public. In addition to Friedman, Walter Kaufmann, the author of one of the first English-language studies of Nietzsche as well as books on religion and existentialism, helped to popularize Buber in the United States, despite the above-cited critique of Buber’s I and Thou. It was Kaufmann who first included Buber in the canon of religious existentialism in the 1950s and 1960s. In Jewish philosophy, Buber’s name has since been eclipsed by those of Franz Rosenzweig and Emmanuel Levinas.

Bibliography

Works Cited

Apel, Karl-Otto, 1979, Die Erklären:Verstehen-Kontroverse in transzendentalpragmatischer Sicht, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp.
Barash, Jeffrey Andrew, 2015, “Politics and Theology: The Debate on Zionism between Hermanm Cohen and Martin Buber” in Paul Mendes-Flohr (ed.), Dialogue as a Trans-Disciplinary Concept, 49–60.
Baur, Katharina, 2023, Das Kunstwerk Leben zu gestalten: Leben und Werk der Schriftstellerin Paula Buber (1877–1958), Augsburg: Universitätsbibliothek.
Biemann, Asher D., 2009, Inventing New Beginnings. On the Idea of Renaissance in Modern Judaism, Stanford/CA: Stanford University Press.
Biemann, Asher D., 2025, “Martin Buber and Philosophical Anthropology” in Paul Mendes-Flohr, Companion, 33–52.
Bloch, Jochanan, 1977, Die Aporie des Du. Probleme der Dialogik Martin Bubers, Heidelberg: Lambert Schneider.
Bloch, Jochanan/Gordon, Hayyim (ed.), 1983, Martin Buber. Bilanz seines Denkens, Freiburg i. B.
Bourél, Dominique, 2015, Martin Buber. Sentinelle de l’humanité, Paris: Éditions Albin Michel.
Bracher, Karl Dietrich, 1972, “Stages of Totalitarian ‘Integration’ (Gleichschaltung): The Consolidation of National Socialist Rule in 1933 and 1934” in Holborn, Hajo, Republic to Reich, New York: Vintage, 109–28.
Braiterman, Zachary, 2007, The Shape of Revelation: Aesthetics and Modern Jewish Thought, Stanford: Stanford University Press.
Brody, Samuel H., 2018, Martin Buber’s Theopolitics, Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
Brody, Samuel H., 2025, “Buber’s Concept of Theopolitics” in Mendes-Flohr, Companion, 299–308.
[Buber, Paula, ed.], 1928, Aus Unbekannten Schriften. Festgabe für Martin Buber zum 50. Geburtstag, Berlin: Lambert Schneider.
Faber, Richard, and Holste, Christine, 2000, Kreise, Gruppen, Bünde : zur Soziologie moderner Intellektuellenassoziation, Würzburg: Königshausen & Neumann.
Friedman, Maurice, 1981, Martin Buber’s Life and Work: The Early Years, 1878–1923, New York: Dutton.
Furani, Khaled, 2025, “Buber Meeting and Not-Meeting Islam” in Mendes-Flohr, Companion, 251–259.
Gordon, Haim, 1988, The Other Martin Buber: Recollections of his Contemporaries, Athens/OH: Ohio University Press.
Hadad, Yemima, Cohen-Skalli, Cedric, and Pinkas, Ronen, 2026, Women Write Buber, Leiden: Brill.
Habermas, Jürgen, 2015, “ A Philosophy of Dialogue” in Paul Mendes-Flohr (ed.), Dialogue as a Trans-disciplinary Concept, 7–20, [online at http://www.jstor.org/stable/j.ctvbj7kb3.4, accessed 1 Jan. 2026].
Jamal, Amal, 2025, “The Ethical View of the Palestinian Other” in Mendes-Flohr, Companion, 323–334.
Kaufmann, Walter, 1983, “Bubers Fehlschläge und sein Triumph” in Bloch 1983, 22ff.
Köhnke, K. C., 1991, The rise of neo-Kantianism : German academic philosophy between idealism and positivism. Cambridge University Press.
Landshut, Siegfried, 1929, Kritik der Soziologie. Freiheit und Gleichheit als Ursprungsproblem der Soziologie, Munich and Leipzig: Duncker & Humblot.
Lappin, Eleonore, 1997, “The Position of Martin Buber’s Monthly Der Jude Within the Zionist Movement” in Proceedings of the World Congress of Jewish Studies 1997/12, 33–44 (online at http://www.jstor.org/stable/23535805, accessed 1 Jan. 2026].
Levy, Amit, Pollock, Benjamin, Weidner, Daniel, Wiese Christian (ed.), 2019, “Die Kreatur – Lesarten einer Zeitschrift” in Naharaim vol. 13/1–2.
Lichtblau, Klaus, 1999, “Der Eugen Diederichs Verlag und die neuromantische Bewegung der Jahrhundertwende” in Ulbricht, Justus H., and Werner, Meike G., Romantik, Revolution und Reform. Der Eugen Diederichs Verlag im Epochenkontext 1900–1949, Göttingen: Wallstein, 60–77.
Maor, Zohar, 2018, “Kohn’s Buber, Buber’s Kohn: Hans Kohn’s Biography of Martin Buber Revisited” in LBI Year Book, vol. 63/1, 255–272.
Neville, Robert, 2013, Ultimates, Albany: SUNY Press.
Plessner, Helmuth, 1924, Grenzen der Gemeinschaft, Bonn: F. Cohen.
Pourshirazi, Katja, 2008, Martin Bubers literarisches Werk zum Chassidismus. Eine textlinguistische Analyse, Frankfurt/Main: Peter Lang.
Sadeghi, Nassrin Elisabeth, 2015, Paula Buber. Selbst- und Weiblichkeitsentwürfe im Werk der deutsch-jüdischen Autorin, Inaugural-Dissertation, Erlangen.
Schilpp, Paul Arthur, and Friedman, Maurice (ed.), 1967, The Philosophy of Martin Buber, LaSalle, Il.: Open Court, London: Cambridge University Press.
Schottroff, Willy, 1990, “Martin Buber an der Universität Frankfurt am Main (1923–1933)”, in Dieter Stoodt (ed.), Martin Buber – Erich Foerster – Paul; Tillich: Evangelische Theologie und Religionsphilosophie an der Universität Frankfurt a. M. 1914 bis 1933, Frankfurt: Peter Lang.
Schulthess, Peter, 2021, “Rezension von Hans Trüb (2020), Welt und Selbst. Bausteine einer modernen Psychotherapie”, Psychotherapie-Wissenschaft, 11(1): 74–75.
Scott, Sarah, 2025, “Martin Buber’s Ethics of Perception” in Mendes-Flohr, Companion, 97–111.
Shonkoff, Sam S. B., 2025, “Buber and Hasidism” in Mendes-Flohr, Companion, 271–286.
–––, 2018a, Sacramental Existence: Embodiment in Martin Buber’s Philosophical and Hasidic Writings, Ph.D. Dissertation, University of Chicago.
Siebers, Johan, 2025, “Martin Buber and the Philosophy of Communication” in Mendes-Flohr, Companion, 129–141.
Simon, Ernst, 1959, Aufbau im Untergang, Tübingen: Mohr.
Simon, Ernst, 1965, Brücken, Heidelberg: Lambert Schneider.
Singer, Isaac Bashevis, 1965, “Daniel: Dialogues on Realization, by Martin Buber” in Commentary Magazine, January 1965. Singer 1965 available online.
Theunissen, Michael, 1977, Der Andere. Studien zur Sozialontologie der Gegenwart, Second edition, Berlin: Walter de Gruyter.
Wehr, Gerhard, 1968, Martin Buber mit Selbstzeugnissen und Bilddokumenten, Reinbek bei Hamburg: Rowohlt.
Wehr, Gerhard, 2010, Martin Buber. Leben – Werk – Wirkung. Gütersloh: Gütersloher Verlagshaus.
Wiehn, Erhard R., 1992, “Zu Martin Bubers Sammlung ”Die Gesellschaft“. Ein fast vergessenes Stück Soziologiegeschichte” in Jahrbuch für Soziologiegeschichte 1991, Opladen: Leske + Budrich, 183–207.
Wurm, Carsten, 1994, 150 Jahre Rütten & Loening … Mehr als eine Verlagsgeschichte, Berlin: Rütten & Loening.
Zank, Michael, 2006, “Buber and Religionswissenschaft: The Case of His Studies on Biblical Faith” in New Perspectives on Martin Buber, Tübingen: Mohr Siebeck, pp. 61–82.

Bibliographies

Catanne, Moshe, 1961, A Bibliography of Martin Buber’s Works (1895–1957), Jerusalem: Bialik Institute.
Cohn, Margot, 1980, Martin Buber. A Bibliography of His Writings, 1897–1978. Compiled by Margot Cohn and Raphael Buber. Jerusalem: Magnes Press. This is the most authoritative bibliography compiled by Buber’s long-time secretary and his son.
Friedman, Maurice, 1963, “Bibliographie” in Paul Arthur Schilpp and Maurice Friedman (ed.), Martin Buber, Stuttgart: Kohlhammer.
Kohn, Hans, 1930, Martin Buber, Hellerau: J. Hegner. This biography includes a bibliography of Buber’s writings from 1897 to 1928. The second edition (1961) contains bibliographic updates by Robert Weltsch.
Moonan, Willard, 1981, Martin Buber and His Critics. An Annotated Bibliography of Writings in English Through 1978, New York & London: Garland. With a list of the abstracts, indices, and bibliographies consulted by the author, indices of translators and authors writing on Buber, and subject indices of writings by and about Buber.

Selected Early Works By Martin Buber

1906–1912, Die Gesellschaft. Sammlung sozial-psychologischer Monographien [Society. A Collection of Social-Psychological Monographs], Frankfurt am Main: Rütten & Loening. 40 volumes. The first volume (Werner Sombart, Das Proletariat) includes Buber’s introduction to the series.
1906b, Die Geschichten des Rabbi Nachman [The Tales of Rabbi Nachman], Frankfurt am Main: Rütten & Loening. Dedicated to “the memory of my grandfather, Salomon Buber, the last master of the old haskalah.” (“Meinem Großvater Salomon Buber dem letzten Meister der alten Haskala bringe ich dies Werk der Chassidut dar in Ehrfurcht und Liebe.”)
1908, Die Legende des Baal Schem [The Legend of the Baal Shem], Frankfurt: Rütten & Loening (second edition: 1916). On the founder of the Hasidic movement in early eighteenth-century Podolia/Volynia,
1911a, Chinesische Geister- und Liebesgeschichten [Chinese Ghost and Love Stories], Frankfurt: Rütten & Loening.
1911b, Drei Reden über das Judentum [Three Speeches on Judaism], Frankfurt: Rütten & Loening, 1911 (second, “complete” edition, 1923). Dedicated to “my wife.”
1913, Daniel: Gespräche von der Verwirklichung [Daniel, Dialogues on Realization], Leipzig: Insel-Verlag.
1916–24, Der Jude. Eine Monatsschrift [The Jew. A Monthly], Wien/Berlin: R. Löwith and Berlin: Jüdischer Verlag. Founded by Buber, who edited it during these years and wrote many contributions.
1918, Mein Weg zum Chassidismus. Erinnerungen [My Path to Hasidism. Recollections], Frankfurt: Rütten & Loening. Dedicated to “my beloved father.”
1919, Der heilige Weg. Ein Wort an die Juden und an die Völker [The Holy Path. A Word to the Jews and to the Gentiles], Frankfurt: Rütten & Loening. Dedicated to “my friend Gustav Landauer at his grave.”
1922, Der grosse Maggid und seine Nachfolge [The Great Maggid and his Succession], Frankfurt: Rütten & Loening.
1923, Ich und Du [I and Thou], Leipzig: Insel Verlag.
1924, Das verborgene Licht [The Hidden Light], Frankfurt: Rütten & Loening.
1925ff, Die Schrift. Zu verdeutschen unternommen von Martin Buber gemeinsam mit Franz Rosenzweig. Buber and Rosenzweig’s translation of the Hebrew Scriptures was published by Lambert Schneider first in his own publishing house in Berlin, between 1933 and 1939 under the heading of Schocken Verlag, Berlin, and again, after 1945, through the newly founded Lambert Schneider Verlag, Heidelberg.
1926–29, Die Kreatur [Creation], Berlin: Lambert Schneider. A quarterly edited by Buber with the Protestant psychologist Victor von Weizsäcker and the dissident Catholic theologian Joseph Wittig.

Collections and Editions of Writings and Letters

1953–62, Die Schrift. Verdeutscht von Martin Buber gemeinsam mit Franz Rosenzweig, improved and complete edition in four volumes, Cologne: J. Hegner.
1953a, Hinweise. Gesammelte Essays, Zurich: Manesse.
1962, Werke [abbr. MBW]. Erster Band: Schriften zur Philosophie, Munich and Heidelberg: Lambert Schneider.
1963a, Werke. Dritter Band: Schriften zum Chassidismus, Munich and Heidelberg: Lambert Schneider.
1963b, Der Jude und sein Judentum. Gesammelte Aufsätze und Reden, Cologne: J. Hegner.
1964, Werke. Zweiter Band: Schriften zur Bibel, Munich and Heidelberg: Lambert Schneider.
1965, Nachlese. Heidelberg: Lambert Schneider. English translation: 1967a.
1972–75, Briefwechsel aus sieben Jahrzehnten, edited by Grete Schaeder, Volume I: 1897–1918 (1972), Volume II: 1918–1938 (1973), Volume III: 1938–1965 (1975), Heidelberg: Lambert Schneider.
1996, The Letters of Martin Buber: A Life of Dialogue, edited by Nahum Glatzer and Paul Mendes-Flohr, Syracuse: Syracuse University Press.
2001–2020, Martin Buber Werkausgabe [abb. MBWA], edited by Paul Mendes-Flohr, Peter Schäfer, Bernd Witte and Martina Urban. Gütersloh: Gütersloher Verlagshaus; De Gryuter/Brill.

Buber in English

1937, I and Thou, transl. by Ronald Gregor Smith, Edinburgh: T. and T. Clark. 2^nd Edition New York: Scribners, 1958. 1^st Scribner Classics ed. New York, NY: Scribner, 2000, c1986
1952, Eclipse of God, New York: Harper and Bros. 2^nd Edition Westport, Conn.: Greenwood Press, 1977.
1957, Pointing the Way, transl. Maurice Friedman, New York: Harper, 1957, 2^nd Edition New York: Schocken, 1974.
1960, The Origin and Meaning of Hasidism, transl. M. Friedman, New York: Horizon Press.
1964, Daniel: Dialogues on Realization, New York, Holt, Rinehart and Winston.
1965, The Knowledge of Man, transl. Ronald Gregor Smith and Maurice Friedman, New York: Harper & Row. 2^nd Edition New York, 1966.
1966, The Way of Response: Martin Buber; Selections from his Writings, edited by N. N. Glatzer. New York: Schocken Books.
1967a, A Believing Humanism: My Testament, translation of Nachlese (Heidelberg 1965) by M. Friedman, New York: Simon and Schuster.
1967b, On Judaism, edited by Nahum Glatzer and transl. by Eva Jospe and others, New York: Schocken Books.
1968, On the Bible: Eighteen Studies, edited by Nahum Glatzer, New York: Schocken Books.
1970a, I and Thou, a new translation with a prologue “I and you” and notes by Walter Kaufmann, New York: Scribner’s Sons.
1970b, Mamre: Essays in Religion, translated by Greta Hort, Westport, Conn.: Greenwood Press.
1970c, Martin Buber and the Theater, Including Martin Buber’s “Mystery Play” Elijah, edited and translated with three introductory essays by Maurice Friedman, New York, Funk &Wagnalls.
1972, Encounter: Autobiographical Fragments. La Salle, Ill.: Open Court.
1973a, On Zion: the History of an Idea, with a new foreword by Nahum N. Glatzer, Translated from the German by Stanley Godman, New York: Schocken Books.
1973b, Meetings, edited with an introduction and bibliography by Maurice Friedman, La Salle, Ill.: Open Court Pub. Co. 3rd ed. London, New York: Routledge, 2002.
1983, A Land of Two Peoples: Martin Buber on Jews and Arabs, edited with commentary by Paul R. Mendes-Flohr, New York: Oxford University Press; 2^nd edition, Gloucester.MA: Peter Smith, 1994; 3rd edition, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2025, with Forewords by Paul Mendes-Flohr and Raef Zreik.
1985, Ecstatic Confessions, edited by Paul Mendes-Flohr, translated by Esther Cameron, San Francisco: Harper & Row.
1991a, Chinese Tales: Zhuangzi, Sayings and Parables and Chinese Ghost and Love stories, translated by Alex Page, with an introduction by Irene Eber, Atlantic Highlands, N.J.: Humanities Press International.
1991b, Tales of the Hasidim, foreword by Chaim Potok, New York: Schocken Books, distributed by Pantheon.
1992, On Intersubjectivity and Cultural Creativity, edited and with an introduction by S.N. Eisenstadt, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
1994, Scripture and Translation, Martin Buber and Franz Rosenzweig, translated by Lawrence Rosenwald with Everett Fox. Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
1996, Paths in Utopia, translated by R.F. Hull. Syracuse: Syracuse University Press.
1999a, The First Buber: Youthful Zionist Writings of Martin Buber, edited and translated from the German by Gilya G. Schmidt, Syracuse, N.Y.: Syracuse University Press.
1999b, Martin Buber on Psychology and Psychotherapy: Essays, Letters, and Dialogue, edited by Judith Buber Agassi, with a foreword by Paul Roazin, New York: Syracuse University Press.
1999c, Gog and Magog: A Novel, translated from the German by Ludwig Lewisohn, Syracuse, NY: Syracuse University Press.
2002a, The Legend of the Baal-Shem, translated by Maurice Friedman, London: Routledge.
2002b, Between Man and Man, translated by Ronald Gregor-Smith, with an introduction by Maurice Friedman, London, New York: Routledge.
2002c, The Way of Man: According to the Teaching of Hasidim, London: Routledge.
2002d, The Martin Buber Reader: Essential Writings, edited by Asher D. Biemann, New York: Palgrave Macmillan.
2002e, Ten Rungs: Collected Hasidic Sayings, translated by Olga Marx, London: Routledge.
2003, Two Types of Faith, translated by Norman P. Goldhawk with an afterword by David Flusser, Syracuse, N.Y.: Syracuse University Press.

Selected Edited Volumes on Martin Buber

Bloch, Jochanan/Gordon, Hayyim (ed.), 1983, Martin Buber. Bilanz seines Denkens, Freiburg i. B.: Herder.
Licharz, Werner/Schmidt, Heinz (ed.), 1989, Martin Buber (1878–1965). Internationales Symposium zum 20. Todestag. Two volumes (Series: Arnoldshainer Texte), Arnoldshain: Haag and Herchen.
Mendes-Flohr, Paul (ed.), Dialogue as a Trans-Disciplinary Concept: Martin Buber’s Philosophy of Dialogue and its Contemporary Reception, Berlin/Munich/Boston: De Gryuter.
Mendes-Flohr, Paul (ed.), 2025, A Companion to Martin Buber, Chicago and London: University of Chicago Press.
Schilpp, Paul Arthur/Friedman, Maurice (ed.), 1963, Martin Buber, (Series: Philosophen des 20. Jahrhunderts), Stuttgart, Kohlhammer. English edition: 1967, The Philosophy of Martin Buber. (Series: Library of Living Philosophers, vol. XII). Lasalle/Ill.: Open Court. Among the contributors to this volume are, aside from Buber himself, Max Brod, Emmanuel Lévinas, Emil Brunner, Emil Fackenheim, Marvin Fox, Nahum Glatzer, Mordecai Kaplan, Walter Kaufmann, Gabriel Marcel, Nathan Rotenstreich, Rivka Schatz-Uffenheimer, Ernst Simon, Jacob Taubes, C.F. von Weizsäcker, and Robert Weltsch.
Shonkoff, Sam Berrin (ed.), 2018, Martin Buber, His Intellectual and Scholarly Legacy. Leiden: Brill.
Zank, Michael (ed.), 2006, New Perspectives on Martin Buber, Tübingen: Mohr Siebeck. With essays by Joseph Agassi, Leora Batnitzky, Ilaria Bertone, Asher Biemann, Zachary Braiterman, Micha Brumlik, Judith Buber Agassi, Steven T. Katz, Paul Mendes-Flohr, Gesine Palmer, Andrea Poma, Yossef Schwartz, Jules Simon, Martina Urban, and Michael Zank

Secondary Literature

Abramovitch, Henry, 2015, “The Influence of Martin Buber’s Philosophy of Dialogue on Psychotherapy” in Mendes-Flohr (2015), 169–82.
Avnon, Dan, 1998, Martin Buber. The Hidden Dialogue, Lanham, Boulder, New York, Oxford: Rowman & Littlefield.
Babolin, A., 1965, Essere e Alteritá in Martin Buber, Padova: Gregoriana.
Balthasar, Hans Urs von, 1958, Einsame Zwiesprache. Martin Buber und das Christentum, Cologne: J. Hegner.
Berkovits, Eliezer, 1962, A Jewish Critique of the Philosophy of Martin Buber, New York: Yeshiva University.
Bloch, J., 1977, Die Aporie des Du, Heidelberg: Lambert Schneider.
Brody, Samuel H., 2018, Martin Buber’s Theopolitics, Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
Blumenfeld, Walter, 1951, La antropologia filosofica de Martin Buber y la filosofia antropologica; un essayo, Lima: Tipografia Santa Rosa.
Braiterman, Zachary, 2007, The Shape of Revelation: Aesthetics and Modern Jewish Thought, Stanford: Stanford University Press.
Casper, Bernhard, 1967, Das dialogische Denken: Franz Rosenzweig, Ferdinand Ebner, Martin Buber, Freiburg i. B., Basel, Wien: Herder.
Dujovne, L., 1966, Martin Buber; sus ideas religiosas, filosoficas y sociales, Buenos Aires: Bibliografica Omeba.
Friedman, Maurice, 1955, Martin Buber. The Life of Dialogue, Chicago: University of Chicago.
Friedman, Maurice, 1981, Martin Buber’s Life and Work. The early years. 1878–1923., New York: Dutton.
Horwitz, Rivka, 1978, Buber’s Way to I and Thou. An Historical Analysis, Heidelberg: Lambert Schneider.
Kavka, Martin, 2012, “Verification (Bewahrung) in Martin Buber” Journal of Jewish Thought and Philosophy 20 (1):71–98.
Katz, Steven, 1985, Post-Holocaust Dialogues, New York: New York University Press.
Kohn, Hans, 1930, Martin Buber, Hellerau: J. Hegner. Second edition: Cologne: Melzer, 1961. First biography of Buber, published on the occasion of his fiftieth birthday.
Koren, Israel, 2002, “Between Buber’s Daniel and His I and Thou: A New Examination” in Modern Judaism 22 (2002): 169–198.
Lang, Bernhard, 1964, Martin Buber und das dialogische Leben, Bern: H. Lang.
Mendes-Flohr, Paul, 1989, From Mysticism to Dialogue. Martin Buber’s Transformation of German Social Thought, Detroit: Wayne State University Press.
Mendes-Flohr, Paul, 2019, Martin Buber: A Life of Faith and Dissent, New Haven/Ct and London: Yale University Press.
Poma, Andrea, 1974, La filosofia dialogica di Martin Buber, Torino: Rosenberg and Sellier.
Schaeder, Grete, 1966, Martin Buber, Hebräischer Humanismus, Göttingen: Vandenhoek and Ruprecht. English: 1973, The Hebrew Humanism of Martin Buber, transl. by Noah J. Jacobs, Detroit: Wayne State University.
Simon, Ernst, 1959, Aufbau im Untergang, Tübingen: Mohr. English: 1956, “Jewish adult education in Nazi Germany as spiritual resistence” in Yearbook of the Leo Baeck Institute, London: Secker & Warburg, Nr. 1, pp. 68–105. On the Mittelstelle für jüdische Erwachsenenbildung, a centralized institution, run by Buber from 1933–38, in charge of reeducating Jewish teachers who had been forced out of the general school system under the Nazis.
Smith, M. K., 2000 [2009], “Martin Buber on education,” in The Encyclopaedia of Informal Education, [available online, retrieved: Dec 3, 2014].
Theunissen, Michael, 1964, “Bubers negative Ontologie des Zwischen” in Philosophisches Jarhbuch, Freiburg and Munich: Alber, pp. 319–330.
Theunissen, Michael, 1965, Der Andere. Studien zur Sozialontologie der Gegenwart, Berlin: De Gruyter. English: 1984, The Other: Studies in the Social ontology of Husserl, Heidegger, Sartre, and Buber, transl. by Christopher Macann, Cambridge: The MIT Press, 1984.
Wood, R., 1969, Martin Buber’s Ontology; An Analysis of “I and Thou”, Evanston, Illinois: Northwestern University Press.
Urban, Martina, 2008, Aesthetics of Renewal: Martin Buber’s Early Representation of Hasidism as Kulturkritik, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.

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Information on the Martin Buber Werkausgabe Published on behalf of Philosophische Fakultät der Heinrich Heine Universität Düsseldorf and Israel Academy of Sciences and Humanities, edited by Paul Mendes-Flohr and Bernd Witte.
Im Geiste Martin Bubers und Franz Rosenzweigs …, Deutscher Koordinierungsrat.
Buber Timeline, A brief biographic sketch maintained by the online project of the Museum for German History in Berlin.
About the Jewish Community of Vienna, Israelitische Kultusgemeinde Wien.

Acknowledgments

Zachary Braiterman is credited as a coauthor on this entry for his work with Michael Zank on Section 6.

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	How to cite this entry.
	Preview the PDF version of this entry at the Friends of the SEP Society.
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