1. For an excellent review of differences across mechanism accounts, see Anderson (2014a, 2014b).

2.The issues surrounding this disagreement are complex and contested. In addition to the considerations described in the text above and in Section 4, Craver (personal correspondence) denies that he is committed to a “more details the better” claim, pointing out that in Craver (2006) and elsewhere he acknowledges that an “ideally complete” explanation will often be very unwieldy and that details are often (perhaps always) omitted from mechanistic explanations for legitimate pragmatic reasons. This raises questions that are beyond the scope of this entry about the notion of an “ideal” explanation and the connection of this to so-called “pragmatic” factors – in particular how we should think about an ideal that perhaps never should be realized for pragmatic reasons.

3. As Strevens notes, earlier versions of this idea can be found in Mackie (1974) and in other writers (Strevens 2008: 70).

4. Strevens also sometimes describes this in terms of a contrast between those upper-level generalizations (or the objects figuring in them) which are smoothly multiply realizable as opposed to those whose realizers are disjoint or discontinuous in an underlying space. This does not seem to be quite the same as the contiguous/non-contiguous contrast.

5. For a detailed discussion of how this works, see Strevens 2008: 102–109.

6. Or, put slightly differently, the kairetic theory is intended to explain how upper-level causal claims can be explanatory, given the causal relations postulated in fundamental physics and that upper-level causal claims do not explicitly invoke these.

7. Thanks to Michael Strevens for clarifying this point in correspondence.

8. For the record, the authors of this article do not endorse this “no causation in physics” claim.

9. Strevens suggests in correspondence a way of accommodating this apparent difficulty: the right way to think about the RG explanation of phase transitions is in terms of his ideas about frameworks. Roughly, his idea is that the heterogeneous details of the common physical basis for the application of the RGA (long range correlations, self-similarity at different scales) should be thought of as frameworked or blackboxed, with the explanation then proceeding by showing that certain universal behavior will be present, given the blackboxed specification. We lack the space to comment on this suggestion.

10. On the other hand, all of these organisms are carbon-based, have DNA-based genetic material, and so on. Strevens also seems to suggest that the explanatory credentials of the LV equations might be improved by more details about the particular populations to which they apply which help to explain why they apply to those populations. This is a plausible claim, but we are not clear how the kairetic theory motivates this judgment. After all, if the realizers of the LV equations violate causal contiguity, adding detail about the individual realizers does not seem to remove that violation.

11. Since Suzy’s throw would have shattered the bottle if Billy’s had not, this raises the worry that we can drop the premise that Billy throws from a derivation of the bottle shattering, keeping a premise describing Suzy’s throw and the causal entailment of the shattering will still go through. (At the level of fundamental physics Suzy’s unsuccessful throw will have some causal influence on the manner of shattering and thus will be included as input to the abstraction procedure.) Thus, without the assumption that the two throws are not causally contiguous, Suzy’s throw will be excluded as a cause.

12. Put differently, we think that Strevens is correct in thinking that explanations that appeal to generalizations with very disparate realizers but with no further explanation of how it comes about that these hold are incomplete. A satisfactory account of explanation should capture this judgment of incompleteness – i.e., the account should make it clear why we are right to be unsatisfied in the circumstances described above and what more needs to be added. (This point is also emphasized by Batterman in numerous publications – 2021 among others.) By no means all accounts of explanation do this. For example, a simple version of a unificationist account does not suggest that anything needs to be added to a generalization that unifies disparate unifiers.

13. See Woodward (2003: 209ff) for other possibilities. The interventionist framework regards many true singular claims as explanatory in virtue of answering w-questions, even though they do not take the form of (3.1–3.3).

14. For more on this, and the notion of how “invariant” (or insensitive) causal relationships are, see Woodward (2006, 2010, 2021).

15. Or at least this seems like a reasonable construal of Strevens’ views. Strevens is clear that the cohesiveness requirement needs to be satisfied by a fully satisfactory standalone explanation. It is less clear to us to what extent Strevens requires that a satisfactory explanation must, so to speak, itself reflect or represent that it meets the cohesiveness condition.

16. Perhaps, though, this just shows that the strawberry and Königsberg examples should not be grouped together and instead require different analyses.