Johannes Clauberg

First published Wed Oct 9, 2024

Johannes Clauberg (1622–65) was a Reformed (Calvinist) professor at the University of Duisburg. He was among Descartes’ earliest advocates in Germany, whose apologetics, commentaries, and treatises did much to introduce Protestant German audiences to Cartesian philosophy. Clauberg won the admiration of the young Leibniz, who judged him to be clearer than Descartes himself. Spinoza was familiar with Clauberg through their mutual connection to the circle of Lodewijk Meyer (1629–81). Clauberg was also known to the French Cartesians, including Antoine Arnauld, Claude Clerselier, Géraud de Cordemoy, Louis de la Forge, and Nicolas Malebranche. Clauberg’s influence is present in Christian Wolff (1679–1754), who rated him as the best interpreter of Descartes.

In a brief but productive career, Clauberg wrote on all areas of theoretical philosophy, including logic, language, metaphysics, theology, physics, and the mind-body problem. He produced the first comprehensive commentary on Descartes’s Meditations, and wrote lengthy responses to Descartes’s early critics. Clauberg was also an early proponent of the use of the German language in academic philosophy, and a defender of libertas philosophandi in the universities. Although he did not publish any philosophical treatises in German, he began to lay the foundations of a German philosophical vocabulary by inserting German glosses of Latin phrases in his treatises. In the process of adapting Cartesianism for use in the university curriculum, Clauberg made significant contributions to the development of logic and metaphysics in early modern Germany.

1. Life and Works

Clauberg was born on 24 February 1622 in Solingen (now in North Rhine-Westphalia) to Calvinist parents of middle-class backgrounds. After spending two years at the gymnasium in Moers, he moved in 1639 to Bremen to complete his studies. The Bremen gymnasium enjoyed a particularly strong reputation in Northern European Reformed circles with an emphasis on classical and oriental languages, irenical theology, and humanist philosophy. The professors of philosophy, Balthasar Willius (1606–56) and Gérard de Neufville (1590–1648), would leave a lasting mark on Clauberg, especially with respect to their pupil’s lifelong appreciation of Aristotle and his profound interest in philosophy’s educational function (on de Neufville’s influence, see Collacciani 2020). From Bremen, Clauberg moved to the University of Groningen in 1644, which had recently become the focus of Descartes’s efforts to have his works cleared of theological censure. It was during his two years at Groningen that Clauberg probably encountered Descartes’s philosophy for the first time, no doubt under the tutelage of a fellow Bremen alumnus, Tobias Andreae (1604–76), professor of History and Greek and Descartes’s main contact at the university. In 1646 Clauberg left to travel to France and England, including a year spent at the Huguenot academy in Saumur. During his absence, Andreae oversaw the publication of the first edition of Clauberg’s ontology, Elementa philosophiae sive ontosophia (1647), a work Clauberg had written while still at the Bremen gymnasium (Verbeek 1999a).

Clauberg returned to the Netherlands in early 1648, and quickly became involved in the small but now established Dutch Cartesian circles. He was present in Amsterdam on 20 April 1648, where he either copied or helped to draft a report of Descartes’s conversation in Egmond four days earlier with Frans Burman, a theology student at Leiden. A copy of Clauberg’s manuscript of the “Conversation with Burman” was discovered in 1895 in Göttingen and published by Charles Adam, which secured Clauberg’s place in subsequent Cartesian studies (see Arndt 1982 for details of the editions of this text). After spending another year in Leiden attending lectures by Johannes de Raey (1622–1702), Clauberg embarked on his own professorial career, beginning in September 1649 at the famous Calvinist academy in Herborn. His two years there were less than satisfying, however, partly on account of the academy’s declared opposition to any approaches other than the Aristotelian and the Ramist. Around Christmas 1651 Clauberg left Herborn for Duisburg, initially to take up an appointment at the gymnasium, but within a few years to become the first rector of the town’s new university (see Hamid 2020 for details of the university’s founding).

Clauberg’s fourteen years in Duisburg were prolific. During this time he also became connected to the growing international network of Cartesians. Clauberg’s publication activity began with Defensio Cartesiana (1652), a vigorous defense of Cartesian method against the criticisms of the Leiden professor Jacobus Revius, author of Methodi Cartesianae consideratio theologica (1648), and his own former colleague at Herborn, Cyriacus Lentulus, author of Nova Renati Des Cartes sapientia (1651). Among Revius’s objections to Cartesian philosophy was that its doctrines were unsupported by a rigorous logical theory, since Descartes had openly rejected Aristotelian syllogistic but had not, by Revius’s lights, supplied an alternative. Partly in response to this concern about the completeness of Descartes’s system, Clauberg next published Logica vetus et nova (1654), which placed the methodological precepts of the Discourse on Method at the basis of a system of rules that could serve as an organon of science (Strazzoni 2013). The Logica was followed by another apologetic treatise, Initiatio philosophi sive dubitatio Cartesiana (1655), which defended one of the key theological obstacles to the acceptance of Descartes’s philosophy, namely the method of doubt. Clauberg’s remaining works were mainly systematic or exegetical in aim. De cognitione Dei et nostri (1656), a collection of disputations, dealt with theological topics, often from an explicitly Cartesian perspective. Paraphrasis in Renati Des Cartes meditationes de prima philosophiae (1658) was the first comprehensive commentary on the Meditations, written with the clear intent to make Cartesian philosophy “more suitable for use in the schools” (“Praefatio”, OO I.346). In 1660 Clauberg returned to systematic philosophy with a new edition of his ontology, Ontosophia nova, which now betrayed a clear influence of Cartesian metaphysics. In 1664 Clauberg published its third and final version, now titled Metaphysica de ente quae rectius ontosophia. This was accompanied by an ambitious Physica to serve as a comprehensive course in Cartesian natural philosophy, covering general physics, special physics, and psychology. The quadripartite Physica begins with a summary of theses in Physica contracta; next is a series of thirty-five disputations, Disputationes physicae, many of which are commentaries on key sections of Part II of Descartes’s Principles; this is followed by a part treating animate bodies, Theoria corporum viventium; natural philosophy is capped by an extended treatise on the mind-body problem, Corporis et animae in homine conjunctio.

The last decades of the seventeenth century witnessed a surge of interest in Clauberg in Central Europe. A number of texts appeared that were either pseudo-Claubergian or presented Claubergian theses as interventions in fresh controversies around Cartesianism, fuelled by the appearance of Spinoza’s writings. These included Johann Heinrich Schweizer’s Compendium physicae Aristotelico-Cartesianae in Zürich (1685), Paul Michael Rhegenius’s Johannis Claubergii specimen logicae Cartesianae and Johannis Claubergii Physica Contracta in Leipzig (1689), and Johannes Flender’s Phosphorus philosophicus in Amsterdam (1696), a commentary on Clauberg’s Logica contracta (for discussion of these texts, see Ragni 2024). An anonymous text titled after Clauberg’s 1655 Initiatio philosophi sive dubitatio Cartesiana appeared in Thuringia in 1687 (Strazzoni 2024). Also in the late 1680s, Clauberg got caught up in controversies around Cartesianism in Hesse-Kassel (Hamid 2023). Amid this revival of interest in Clauberg, his Opera omnia philosophica were published in Amsterdam in 1691 by Johann Theodor Schalbruch, with a biographical essay by one Heinrich Christian von Hennin. The Opera omnia included most but not all of Clauberg’s writings published in his lifetime, as well as some unpublished texts such as a collection of notes on Descartes’s Principles of Philosophy, and Clauberg’s correspondence with Tobias Andreae. Among the texts left out of Schalbruch’s edition is the curious Ars etymologica Teutonum (1663), an investigation into the origins of German words, specifically “philosophical” words such as “Vernunft” (“reason”), “suchen” (“to seek”), and “Ausspruch” (“sentence”) (see Gellera 2022 for an account).

Another minor essay, and the only one Clauberg published in German, is the Unterscheid zwischen der cartesianischer und der sonst in Schulen gebräuchlicher Philosophie (1657), which appears in Opera omnia in Latin as Differentia inter Cartesianam et alias in scholis usitatam philosophiam conscripta. This polemic on behalf of the superiority of Cartesianism over scholasticism lays bare a key motif running through Clauberg’s work, namely a belief in the fundamental harmony between Descartes and the ancient Aristotle. Alongside his advocacy of Descartes’s system, Clauberg is equally committed to its compatibility with Aristotle’s philosophy. Thus, after noting fifteen respects in which Cartesianism is preferable to scholasticism, Clauberg concludes Unterscheid by declaring that,

I have contrasted the Cartesian philosophy with the scholastic, but not with the Aristotelian in and of itself […] which in many basic respects agrees more with the Cartesian than with the school philosophy. (Unterscheid, §81)

Clauberg often advertised his work as novantiqua, and specifically as aiming to recover the true Aristotelian philosophy from centuries of scholastic misreadings. His project belongs to a wider phenomenon of Aristotelian revival in seventeenth-century German Protestantism, which emphasized a humanist interest in reading Aristotle and his ancient commentators in the original languages and, therewith, sought to undermine his entrenched association with Thomistic theology (Trevisani 1993; Hamid 2020).

2. Logic and Hermeneutics

Clauberg’s Logica vetus et nova (1654) is sometimes called the first “Cartesian” logic textbook. Like Antoine Arnauld and Pierre Nicole’s La logique ou l’art de penser, or the Port Royal Logic (1662), it was received by contemporaries as an introduction and supplement to Descartes’s philosophy. The Logica went through multiple editions and reprints, and a Dutch translation of its first part appeared in 1657. Spinoza owned a copy of Logica (as well as Defensio cartesiana). Arnauld and Nicole learned of Clauberg’s logic only once the Port Royal Logic had already gone to press, though they still managed to draw on it in Part III of their work. Clauberg also published a much shorter Logica contracta, which went through numerous reprintings well into the eighteenth century.

2.1 Aims and Structure of Logica vetus et nova

As with the Port Royal Logic, the Cartesian element of Clauberg’s Logica consists in a new semantic foundation of clear and distinct perceptions, and a new epistemological focus on the goal of avoiding error, rather than in an alternative to the theory of syllogism (Savini 2006; Coqui 2008). Indeed, not only does Clauberg gloss his logic as “aristotelico-cartesiana” (Init. phil. “Praefatio”, OO II.1124), he suggests that Descartes’s criticisms of logic were not directed at Aristotelian syllogistic itself but rather at how logic was taught in the schools of his time, which put undue emphasis on strategies for topical argumentation (Def. cart. X.2, OO II.973). For Clauberg, the general part of the Aristotelian organon, or the doctrine of terms, propositions, and inferences, constitutes logic in the strict sense. What Descartes contributes is the insight that logical formalisms cannot yield knowledge unless the mind is already in possession of clear and distinct perceptions. For the purpose of scientia, consequently, training the mind to proceed in a manner conducive to grasping veridical ideas and avoiding error becomes paramount. Descartes’s four rules in Part II of the Discourse on Method provide such training as well as the basis for the effective use of Aristotle’s rules of inference.

Accordingly, Clauberg embraces the humanist topos, rooted in Cicero’s Tusculan Disputations III.1, of logic as a medicine of the mind:

The diseases of the mind are errors, doubt and the other imperfections […] for which logic was invented as medicine. (Logica “Prolegomena”, I.11, OO II.770)

The first task of logic, accordingly, is to identify and remedy cognitive imperfections. Clauberg anticipates the objection that reason could not act as its own physician and liberate itself from its ailments. In response, he distinguishes “natural” from “artificial” logic and affirms that the mind’s native capacity for judgment and inference is the foundation of any formal logical art, and also the source of any truth that artificial logic might yield. That is, before learning logical formalisms, the mind is already equipped with the capacity for concept formation, judgment, and inference. Yet, Clauberg defends the necessity of formal logic by advancing a standard Aristotelian view, that art perfects nature: while natural logic is indeed ontologically prior to the artificial, “it is not absolutely sufficient, if it is not aided, corrected, perfected by art” (Logica “Prolegomena”, V.98, OO II.778). Formal logic, or Aristotelian syllogistic, thus serves as a necessary instrument by which reason is able to amend its errors. Accordingly, the medicina mentis conception of logic turns out to be compatible with another view of logic as the “art of using reason correctly” (ars ratione recte utendi), or the “art which directs and guides the human mind in the cognition of things” (Log. contr. §1, OO II.913).

This view of logic yields four distinct aims, which in turn ground a quadripartite division of Logica. Of these, the first two divisions constitute what Clauberg calls the “genetic” part, and the latter two the “analytic” part of logic. The basis of this twofold distinction is that in the former the intellect examines its own thoughts, whereas in the latter it examines the thoughts of others. The further divisions within the genetic and analytic halves rest on a separate distinction, with clear Stoic and Augustinian precedent, between internal and external discourse (sermo internus/externus). The four parts of Logica have the following titles:

  1. “Teaching the correct manner of forming one’s thoughts in perception, judgment, and memory” (genetic, internal)
  2. “How to explain one’s thoughts to others in accordance with reason” (genetic, external)
  3. “Concerning the search for the true meaning of the obscure phrase” (analytic, external)
  4. “Where concepts, definitions, divisions, the order of thoughts, judgments, propositions, questions, proofs, and arguments of people are weighed on the scales of right reason” (analytic, internal)

2.2 Logic

The first aim, corresponding to Part I, is the removal of errors and prejudices acquired since childhood. Here, the standard of clear and distinct perception together with Descartes’s methodological precepts for training attention and judgment furnish the basis for the effective use of syllogisms in ridding the mind of false beliefs and validating true ones. Put differently, Part I of Logica is concerned with the cultivation of good mental habits aided by explicit rules of inquiry, which are then supplemented by formal techniques for the evaluation of judgments. The theory of syllogism is not discarded but is subordinated to Descartes’s epistemological strictures that cast intellectual intuition rather than the form of reasoning as the criterion of truth. Crucially, Clauberg regards this part as constituting logic in the strict sense, and the remaining parts as its extension (Logica “Prolegomena”, VI.104, OO II.779; “Proemium” to 1654 ed.). As he puts it, the aim of correctly forming one’s own thoughts would remain in force even

if there were only one person living on the face of the earth, or several among whom there was no society, [and] there were no one to manifest his thoughts to others. (Logica “Prolegomena”, VI.107, OO II.779)

The extensions of logic deal with pedagogical and hermeneutical aims, and effectively replace the dialectical parts of earlier logic textbooks. First among these auxiliaries is the “external” half of logica genetica, which aims at the economical and accurate expression of one’s well-formed thoughts. It reflects Clauberg’s abiding interest in pedagogy and with reforming the arts curriculum, for which end he finds Descartes’s pared-down ontology and rejection of dialectical disputation especially promising (Efal-Lautenschläger 2023). Clauberg emphasizes that this part of logic should not be confused with grammar and rhetoric. These latter disciplines deal with the conventional rules of linguistic expressions and with their ornament for the purposes of persuasion. By contrast, the external part of genetic logic aims only “to explain concepts to others in a way adapted to the first part”. Thus, whereas the first part deals, for instance, with the nature and use of universals, with definition, division, and the rules of syllogistic inference, the second part teaches how to communicate thoughts in a way that clearly exemplifies logical structure, so that “another could also know what we know” (Logica “Prolegomena”, VI.113, OO II.780). Clauberg concludes this part by underscoring the dangers of excessive focus on the common art of disputation, which his new logic intends to replace in the trivium: an immoderate use of topical dialectics in teaching makes men “audacious without modesty”, “arrogant”, and produces individuals disposed to “nitpicking and quarreling for the rest of their lives” (Logica II.xvi.116, OO II.839).

2.3 Hermeneutics

The third and fourth parts of logic constitute the “analytic”, or logic as it concerns the thoughts of others, and deal with two interrelated aims of learning. The first is to examine carefully the meanings and significations contained in a text in order to avoid misunderstanding the intentions of a speaker or writer. The second is to assess the duly established spoken or written text for truth and falsity (Logica “Prolegomena”, V.103, OO II.779). In these parts, Clauberg rigorously articulates a distinction between the true intended meaning of a text and truth as such, which has striking echoes in Meyer’s and Spinoza’s Biblical hermeneutics (Lagrée 2002; Verbeek 2005). The third part of Logica ranks, alongside Johann Conrad Dannhauer’s (1603–66) Idea boni interpretis et malitiosi calumniatoris (1630), among the seminal early modern expositions of a theory of text interpretation (Detel 2011; Del Prete 2015).

Clauberg develops his theory of hermeneutics from a causal model of texts. For Clauberg, words and sentences are not merely signs of concepts and judgments, but rather effects whose efficient causes are their author’s thoughts. And, just as agential efficient causes require various sine quibus non conditions for their exercise, texts also depend on factors such as the time and place of their composition, the norms of style and usage influencing their authors, and the expectations of their audiences (Logica III.iii.12, OO II.846). Interpreting any text thus requires grasping the manifold causes and necessary conditions involved in its production. Most important of all, however, is understanding authorial intention, as the principal efficient cause of a text. In this regard, Clauberg formulates an overarching principle of charity:

One must prefer the meaning which does not involve any absurdity, and reject the one which seems not to be appropriate, with regard to what it deals with, or does less honor to the author. (Logica III.xiii.86, OO II.862)

For Clauberg, a good interpreter chooses the more benign among multiple available interpretations, considers all reasons that support it, accepts several meanings if they appear equally likely, refrains from condemning a text without good reason, and does not punish minor errors by blanket refutations. He casts this principle as an extension of Christian charity, as an expression of the “laws of humanity”, which enjoin goodwill toward fellow human beings. Clauberg has high hopes that his general hermeneutics might be of service in his “perverse century” of religious polemics:

In this perverse century, as there are many who know very well how to twist words into a strange meaning, misconstruing what great writers have presented well, it is up to analytic hermeneutics to separate not only the interpreter’s idea from the temperament of the calumniator so that the logician can recognize what is true interpretation, what is calumny, who is a good interpreter, [and] who is a calumniator and a malicious sycophant. (Logica “Prolegomena”, VI.124, OO II.782)

Clauberg’s motives in including a theory of hermeneutics in the logic curriculum are also more specific than effecting a general change in the literary culture of his time. Armed with his new conception of logic, he takes a position on an issue hotly contested in German academia since Luther and Melanchthon, namely of the limits of philosophy’s claims on the higher faculties, particularly on theology. One common view in support of the early Reformers’ doubts regarding the intrusion of philosophical theology in matters of faith is that philosophical logic is unsuited for theology. This is because theology should be treated as a matter of interpreting a divinely inspired text guided by the light of grace, rather than of demonstrating truths knowable by the natural light. A similar limitation on the claims of philosophical method extends to law and medicine, whose ultimate aim is to interpret particular circumstances rather than to discover general truths. By contrast, Clauberg makes an early intervention on behalf of philosophy’s special privilege in the early modern Fakultätenstreit in German universities. Already in the Prolegomena to Logica, Clauberg argues for the necessity of a science of hermeneutics for theologians and jurisconsults (VI.124, OO II.782). He repeats this position in Unterscheid, writing that philosophy, being concerned in general with the use of reason in the discovery of truth, should lay the ground for medicine, law, and all other disciplines (§3). Clauberg’s commitment to the universal scope of philosophy also underpins the central project of his oeuvre, ontology.

3. Ontology

Clauberg did not coin the term “ontology”, as was once believed (on the history of the term, see Devaux and Lamanna 2009). “Ontology” appears as a synonym for “metaphysics” as early as Jacob Lorhard’s Ogdoas scholastica (1606). It then appears in Rudolph Goclenius’s popular Lexicon philosophicum (1613), where it is glossed as “philosophia de ente seu transcendentibus”, and designates a mode of abstraction from matter that yields a doctrine of transcendental predicates, or those that apply indifferently to any being whatsoever, material or immaterial, created or uncreated. Goclenius does not develop such a doctrine, however, nor does he clearly indicate that a separate science of being qua being is needed. The first texts to recognize ontology as a distinct part of metaphysics, prior to the doctrines of the first being and of separable intellects, are Abraham Calov’s Metaphysica divina (1636) and Juan Caramuel de Lobkowitz’s Rationalis et realis philosophia (1642). Clauberg was aware of both authors and acknowledges them as forerunners in Elementa philosophiae sive ontosophia (1647; IV.89). But it was Clauberg’s presentation that was the source of the discipline that in the following century received its most elaborate treatment in Wolff’s Philosophia prima sive ontologia (1730), and whose “proud name”, Kant later insisted, “must give way to the modest one of a mere analytic of the pure understanding” (1781/1787: A247/B303).

3.1 Ontology and Metaphysics

In each of the three editions of his ontology (1647, 1660, 1664), Clauberg begins by explaining the rationale for developing ontology separately from natural theology. In fact, in spite of his position that philosophical methods apply to theology, a concern to disentangle metaphysics and theology doctrinally is a consistent theme in his work, and explains part of his attraction toward Cartesianism (e.g., Unterscheid, §§71–3). In the Prolegomena to Metaphysica de ente, he writes:

Just as the science which deals with God is called theosophy or theology, so that [science] which is not about this or that being, marked by a special name or distinguished from others by a certain property, but concerns being in general, can not inappropriately be called ontosophy or ontology. (§4, OO I.281)

In the lengthier Prolegomena to the 1647 version of ontology, Clauberg elaborates on the need for a science of what the human intellect can know concerning God and creatures in common. His discussion begins with the Aristotelian dictum, that “sciences are divided according to the nature of things” (Scientiae secantur ut Res). Since “whatever is in the nature of things is either God or something which derives its origin from God”, two domains of real being result—the divine and the created—to which correspond two kinds of knowledge. Moreover, Clauberg argues that, on account of their close conceptual link, the two sciences entail a third, which perfects our knowledge of both divine and creaturely matters. For, despite the infinite distance separating them, “God and creatures have a likeness and affinity with one another, insofar as they are related as cause and effect [causa et causatum]”. Consequently, on the one hand, a perfect understanding of created beings requires tracing their origin to God as their first cause and ultimate end. On the other, given the essentially perception-dependent character of human cognition, knowledge of God must originate from an inquiry into created nature. Thus, Clauberg concludes that,

although nothing is prior to or higher than God, yet there is something so common in our intellect that it may in some way comprehend God together with other things. (Elem. phil. “Prolegomena”, §§1–4)

Having identified that which is “common in our intellect” as its subject matter, the central notion of Clauberg’s ontology is, accordingly, the “intelligible” or “thinkable” (Intelligibile seu Cogitabile) (Elem. phil. I.1–3) (see Savini 2011: 23–70, for a detailed account of the genesis of Clauberg’s ontology in Elementa; see also Marrone 2024).

Between the 1647 and the later editions, Clauberg’s ontology undergoes a crucial shift in Descartes’s direction (Carraud 1999; Collacciani 2020). Briefly, this shift consists in placing the Cartesian doctrine of the thinking self in service of the doctrine of being qua being, as the primitive source of the common notions that supply the content of ontology. In other words, Clauberg’s aim in Ontosophia nova, as the 1660 edition is titled, is nothing less than to reconcile the account of transcendental attributes with Descartes’s doctrine of substance. In keeping with this shift, Clauberg abandons his earlier standpoint, that knowledge of God and what it contributes to the perfection of knowledge of nature is necessarily mediated by reflection on perceived reality, in favor of the Cartesian position that knowledge of one’s own existence as a thinking thing constitutes epistemic bedrock (Goudriaan 1999). Consequently, the intelligibles that make up the subject matter of ontology are now treated as generated in mere thinking.

3.2 Three Senses of Being

The second and third editions of Clauberg’s ontology begin by making explicit the equivalence of being insofar as it is being and being qua intelligibile (Met. ente I.1–4, OO I.283). Clauberg’s account of ens proceeds in three stages, moving from its widest to its narrowest sense. In the widest sense, “being is whatever in any way can be thought or said” (Ens est quicquid quovis modo est, cogitari ac dici potest; Alles was nur gedacht und gesagt werden kan) (Met. ente II.6, OO I.283). Any being that can be made into an object of thought is to that extent something intelligible or thinkable. In this broadest sense, the domain of being effectively extends to the bounds of discursivity, and encompasses even non-being or the non-intelligible (Non ens sive Non intelligibile) insofar as it can be an object of language or thought. Non ens has the status of a being of reason (ens rationis), but is not strictly speaking outside the realm of being, because it is within the bounds of discourse (Met. ente II.9, OO I.284). Clauberg’s ontology thus begins not so much with the concept of being as such, but rather with thinkable or conceptualizable being. In the broadest sense, the content of being as esse objectivum is exhausted by the possible contents of thought (Leinsle 1988: 99–104; Carraud 1999; Bardout 1999).

Narrowing the range of ens, in the second sense Clauberg characterizes being as what can be conceived to exist in reality, as esse reale or esse positivum. This stage results from dividing being qua intelligibile into something (aliquid) and nothing (nihil). Aliquid signifies “what does not involve any repugnance in our thinking”, in virtue of excluding contradictions, such as “four-sided circle” or “leaden gold-coin” (Met. ente III.18, OO I.285). To esse reale or aliquid thus corresponds the domain of possible existence, whether in the mind or in the material world. He sets down as an axiom that, “for reality it is sufficient that something could be, although in fact it does not exist”, for which he glosses “could be” (esse possit) as “does not imply a contradiction” (non implicet contradictionem) (Met. ente III.21, OO I.285). The division of intelligible being into something and nothing thus introduces the principle of non-contradiction as the first formal principle of ontology. Whereas ens in its widest signification as esse objectivum picks out the bounds of discourse, aliquid or esse reale marks the domain of truth-aptness, or of contents that could be evaluated for truth or falsity. Crucially, for Clauberg, the conceptual gap between esse objectivum and esse reale, or between merely intelligible and possibly existent being, is what permits positing Descartes’s cogito as a prior, non-formal principle of being. For, the first division of being into something and nothing presupposes the activity of a mind (mens cogitans) reflecting on its own thought contents (Met. ente III.26, note “p”, OO I.286).

In the third and narrowest sense, being signifies real being (Res or Ens reale), that is, substances. Res/ens reale picks out the category of substance as distinguished from its modes, for instance, as a cap has a certain shape, or a mind its power of understanding (Met. ente IV.42, OO I.290). It is in this sense of being that Clauberg in 1660/1664 makes another notable shift toward Descartes. He defines substance in a manner that he takes to be common to Aristotle and Descartes: substance is “whatever exists in such a way that it does not need a subject in which to exist”. Among items that depend on substance, Clauberg eschews the language of accidents for modes, and distinguishes the “accidental and separable” modes of things (modi rerum) from their “essential and inseparable” attributes, which he also calls, following Descartes, modes of thinking (modi cogitandi) (Met. ente IV.44, OO I.290). The third sense of being is properly reached by making a distinction between aliquid and res as between an attribute and a substance, or between what has reality in another (in alio) and what has reality in and through itself (in se & per se) (Met. ente III.41, OO I.289).

3.3 Substance and Attribute

Clauberg explains the relation between substance, attribute, and mode in terms of dependence. Modes depend on attributes, and attributes depend on substances. Certain modes presuppose certain attributes, as motions and shapes presuppose extension, and imaginings and desirings presuppose thought. Modes and attributes share the feature of being dependent insofar as they have reality in virtue of inhering in substances. But they are not distinguished from substance in the same way. Substance is properly opposed to mode, for only the latter denotes concrete states that occur in the former—or more accurately, in finite or mutable substance (Met. ente IV.45, OO I.290). By contrast, Clauberg regards the distinction between attribute and substance as strictly conceptual. That is, attributes are not general properties inhering in substances of which modes are particular instances—Clauberg marks that contrast by distinguishing two species of modes, immediate and mediate, such as the property of motion as such in a horse and its determinate speed at a given moment (Met. ente IV.46, OO I.290). Instead, an attribute is a universal aspect under which a simple substance can be thought. Attributes depend on substances insofar as what is simple in itself is considered in diverse ways, as, for instance, body may be considered as an existing thing or an enduring thing or an extended thing. To call attributes modi cogitandi is to call them ways of thinking about a substance, rather than distinct ways a substance is or might be (Met. ente IV.44, OO I.290).

In the list of attributes, Clauberg includes not only Descartes’s common attributes of existence, duration, and unity but also the catalogue of transcendentalia as accepted in the Scotistic tradition. Attributes thus include both the absolute ones such as unity, truth, and goodness and the disjunctive transcendentals, or those which divide being without remainder, such as cause/caused, prior/posterior, whole/part, simple/complex, subject/adjunct, and sign/signified. He follows Descartes, however, in maintaining that every substance has one attribute through which its nature becomes most intelligible, or clearly and distinctly perceived (Met. ente IV.47, OO I.291). To identify these primary attributes, he conceives ens reale with reference to those features which are “maximally opposed and contrary” and at the same time positively intelligible, or can be grasped through a positive concept. The salient examples of these are extension in bodies and intellect and will in minds,

seeing that neither intellect and will can be ascribed to length, breadth, and depth, nor length, breadth, and depth to intellect and will. (Met. ente IV.48, OO I.291)

The notion of a primary attribute further underpins Clauberg’s account of essence.

Clauberg’s theory of attributes drives a key shift in his doctrine of essence between the 1647 edition and the two later ones. The definition of essence in all three editions is the same: essence is “that whole through which a thing both is, and is what it is” (totum illud, per quod res & est, & est id quod est) (Elem. phil. II.47; Met. ente V.60, OO I.293). But, whereas in 1647, Clauberg takes essence to denote the first real attribute (attributum reale primum), which constitutes a substance as a certain kind of thing, in the later editions essence becomes, as modus cogitandi, the root and fundament (radix et fundamentum) of the conceivability of a substance and of what is and is not possible in it (Met. ente V.56, OO I.292; see Leinsle 1988: 102–03). To be sure, Clauberg includes in his account of essence much of what is common in scholastic accounts: essence is what is presupposed in any actuality of a substance; it is quiddity, or what answers to the definition of a thing; essence does not permit of greater or lesser, is indivisible, immutable, and is what belongs to a substance necessarily (Met. ente V.61–6, OO I.293–5). But he turns in Descartes’s direction in two crucial respects. First, he locates his later doctrine of essence at the level of thought about substances. Essences, like attributes generally, are strictly conceptual structures that make truth-apt representation of substance possible. Second, Clauberg’s doctrine of essence now entails a rejection of the hylomorphic theory of substance. This is because Clauberg takes primary attributes to ground the completeness of a substance. For, while every attribute of a substance belongs to it essentially, the primary attribute is that through which a substance is conceived as a subsistent thing capable of a certain class of modes and not others. Thus, to conceive a substance through the attribute of extension is to conceive it as possessing conditions of unity, perfection, or causality in geometrical but not mentalistic terms. Furthermore, to conceive something under a primary attribute is to conceive it as capable of existence through God’s creative power alone, without requiring unification with any other substance. Clauberg thus arrives at the Cartesian view of substance as a complete, simple subject, independent of all other beings except God.

At the heart of Clauberg’s ontology is his theory of attributes, which furnishes an account of substances and their properties insofar as they are conceivable and, therefore, metaphysically possible. Like Descartes, for Clauberg, the conceivability of something consists in its clear and distinct perception by the mind; its possibility, meanwhile, rests in an adequate power to produce it. As he puts the relation between conceivability and possibility:

we gather that something is possible, that is, it can be produced by some cause, at least by God, from the fact that it can be clearly and distinctly perceived as such by our mind. (Met. ente VI.88, OO I.298)

Clauberg’s ontology articulates the fundamental notions that compose real possibilities, or candidates for existence. Existence itself, meanwhile, is one of the non-primary attributes of any actualized real being, trivially defined as the attribute “by which a being is in act, or, by which it has an essence constituted in act in the world” (Met. ente VI.78, OO I.296). Clauberg thus lays the ground for a formula that would be commonly used in the early modern German tradition, that “existence is the complement of possibility” (“Erfüllung des Möglichen ist eben dasjenige, was wir Würcklichkeit nennen”/“Existentiam definio per complementum possibilitatis”; Wolff, German Metaphysics §14; and Ontologia §174).

A further legacy of Clauberg’s ontology is its tenuous separation from logic. While he succeeded in promoting ontology as general metaphysics, and in particular as a secular form of first philosophy distinct from and prior to theology in the system of sciences, its separation from logic remained less clear. A tension between logic and ontology, which Kant powerfully exploited in the Critique of Pure Reason, lies at the heart of Clauberg’s doctrine of being, specifically in the sense of aliquid or esse reale. For the space of real possibility, on Clauberg’s account, turns out to be coextensive with merely logical possibility, defined by the principle of non-contradiction. The domain of real being is thus in principle fully articulable by syllogistic reasoning informed by the catalogue of ontological concepts. Despite Clauberg’s insistence on a sharp divide between ontology and logic—that the former deals with reality as such and the latter serves as its instrument—the line between logical and ontological principles would get increasingly blurry in the German metaphysical tradition leading up to Wolff.

4. Physics

Whereas Clauberg’s ontology features the insertion of selected Cartesian doctrines in a broadly neo-scholastic framework, the general part of his physics appears more readily as an attempt to render Descartes in Aristotelian language. It shares the spirit of earlier programs to update Aristotelian natural philosophy. His teacher Johannes de Raey, in Clavis philosophiae naturalis (1654), had already touted Descartes’s physics as the completion of Aristotelian philosophy (Strazzoni 2011). Clauberg himself suggests the affinity of his project with one of the most influential programs to renovate Aristotelian natural philosophy in the preceding century, Julius Caesar Scaliger’s so-called “Aristotelian corpuscularianism” (e.g., Disp. phys. XIX.1, XX.8; on Scaliger’s natural philosophy, see Lüthy 2001). In contrast to Clauberg’s ontology, however, the impact of his physics was indirect and limited. From a historical standpoint, its main interest lies in its being, as de Buzon (2017: 100) puts it, “a good indicator, positively or negatively, of the metaphysical situation of physical concepts in Cartesianism”.

Two themes in Clauberg’s Disputationes physicae exemplify his contribution in drawing to the surface certain tensions in Descartes’s physics. The first has to do with the nature of corporeal substance. At its heart lies an ambiguity in Descartes’s texts concerning the number and identity of corporeal substance: whether it refers only to res extensa considered universally, or whether individual extended bodies separately qualify as substances. Clauberg’s response to this and closely related issues, such as whether individual bodies are true subjects of corporeal properties, illustrate his strategy of retooling scholastic terminology to fit Cartesian physics. A second theme concerns Clauberg’s account of how Cartesian laws of nature qualify as causes of motion.

4.1 Corporeal Substance

Clauberg is unequivocal in his embrace of Descartes’s concept of material substance as res extensa: “To be a body is to be an extended thing” (Disp. phys. III, OO I.56). The question of the individuation of corporeal substance arises with the consideration of what it is that God conserves in existence: matter as such or particular material things (i.e., bodies). Here, Clauberg begins by deploying a distinction between primary and secondary matter (materia prima/secunda): the former refers to extension “simpliciter and universally considered”, and the latter to “something extended in this or that way, having this or that form”. Primary matter or res extensa is the totality of extension in the universe, the quantity of which does not change; secondary matter denotes a certain quantity of matter formed or arranged in some definite manner, which can be increased or decreased, and which always occurs in a collection of other, variously arranged packets of matter (Disp. phys. IV.15–7, OO I.58). Clauberg’s question then becomes whether primary matter—res extensa as such—or secondary matter—this or that extended body—is the ultimate subject of predication, and hence corporeal substance in the strict sense. It gives rise to the further question, whether corporeal properties of figure, place, or motion belong to matter considered universally or to this or that body.

Clauberg grants that, since the essence of any individual body consists in extension, corporeal properties inhere in it, and so, in a certain respect, it counts as a subject of corporeal predicates. But he recognizes the deeper problem stemming from Descartes’s view, that an individual body is nothing but universal extension arranged in some definite form. In other words, although we talk about a table as having a certain shape or volume, it cannot be the ultimate subject of these properties, but rather those properties inhere in res extensa as such, a certain quantity of which now exists table-wise. Affirming the substantial priority and unity of res extensa, Clauberg writes that,

extension, in which divisibility, figure, place, and the other corporeal properties exist [is] the adequate subject by which all things in a body are sustained. (Disp. phys. VI.17, OO I.65)

In a strict sense, for Clauberg, the material universe constitutes a single corporeal substance variously formed in this or that region (for a detailed account, see Mercer 1999).

What, then, explains the relation between primary matter, or res extensa, and secondary matter, the individual bodies that express determinate shapes, positions, and motions? For Clauberg, the various arrangements of extension do not result from any active principles in bodies. He emphatically rejects the doctrine of substantial forms as being unintelligible and explanatorily idle (Disp. phys. XII, OO I.79–84). By form, he writes, can be meant nothing more than, for example, the shape, size, and bulk of a key that makes it suited to turn certain locks, or similar properties of a pen that make it suitable for writing. “Besides this”, he writes,

in what way substantial forms are needed or in what way, if they existed, they would contribute, cannot even be understood. (Disp. phys. XII.38, OO I.83)

To be a body is to be essentially extended, and extension is passive or inert. How extension comes to be formed in definite ways is explained, instead, by laws of nature.

4.2 Laws and Causes

Clauberg’s account of laws is the second major theme through which he exposes a key tension in Cartesian natural philosophy. Like many readers of Descartes, Clauberg is struck by his claim that “rules or laws of nature […] are the secondary and particular causes” of bodily motions (Principles II.37, AT VIIIA.62). How could laws be causes, given that causes are supposed to be substances endowed with powers to produce certain effects? Laws at best seem to describe the characteristic patterns of activity of natural substances, but not to denote causal powers. In what sense, then, do Descartes’s laws of nature count as causes? In Clauberg’s treatment, the main contenders for the role of the causes of bodily motion are the divine will and a suitably modified notion of corporeal powers. His commentary on Principles II.36–44 in Disputationes XVIII–XXII perspicuously draws out the tension between the occasionalist and realist alternatives that has long divided readers of Descartes.

Clauberg’s discussion of the causes of motion begins with two pairs of distinctions. The first is between “the universal and primary cause that produces all motions that are in the totality of corporeal things”, or God; and “the particular and secondary cause from which proceed various and diverse motions in each part of the world” (Disp. phys. XVIII.5, OO I.97). Then, on the traditional distinction between divine and secondary causes, Clauberg overlays two distinct meanings of “cause”, as substance or thing, and as a law that governs the action of a substance:

By a particular cause we may nominally understand either some thing [rem] which produces motion, or a rule or law and reason [regulam sive legem ac rationem] according to which motion is produced. (Disp. phys. XVIII.6, OO I.97)

In the first sense, primary and secondary causes are distinguished in terms of their proper effects: God’s action results in “the universal movement of the whole world”, whereas creaturely effects are restricted to “some movement in a part of the world” (Disp. phys. XVIII.7, OO I.97). This distinction in scope has implications for the specificity of any observable change. While every motion depends on God having imparted motion to res extensa, from particular causes we understand the various kinds of corporeal motion, such as ascending, descending, flowing, rotating, or projectile, that are produced in this or that part of matter. Clauberg illustrates the second sense of cause, as rule or law, meanwhile, by appeal to political and theological metaphors. Thus, the universal cause may be likened to a king, and the particular causes to the laws by which he governs his subjects; or, God’s universal causality may be contrasted with the Word of God as the particular cause by which God rules over his creation.

The distinction between cause as res and lex is only relevant when dealing with secondary causes. God as primary cause qualifies in the fullest sense both as substance, who produces matter by his power, and also as the source of the law by which it operates. By contrast, the two senses of secondary cause—as the source of distinct kinds of motion, and as law—do not appear to have equal significance. For Clauberg, the particular causes of fluid or projectile motions belong to special branches of physics in which the various properties of bodies that result in characteristic patterns of motion are to be described. In physica generalis, however, the relevant sense of particular cause is the one akin to laws in politics or to the Word of God in theology, as the means for the primary agent’s governance of nature (Disp. phys. XVIII.8, OO I.98). This picture, along with Clauberg’s view that God’s conservation of nature entails its continual creation, suggests an occasionalist cosmology, insofar as God appears to be the only genuine agent of change (Cog. Dei XXIX, OO II.645–6; see Weier 1981).

But Clauberg’s further discussion of laws and causes complicates the issue. In the same disputation, he also makes clear that God’s primary causality endows bodies with two features: the power of moving (virtutem movendi) and motion itself (motum ipsum):

From this supreme perfection and power of God, it follows that God not only bestows the power of moving on all things, and conserves and applies it; but also gives motion to things, and conserves and applies it. (Disp. phys. XVIII.12, OO I.98)

And in Disputatio XIX, he indicates that not only rational agents but also material things are causes in the sense of res:

For just as God imposed moral laws on things endowed with reason, which act well by observing them but sin by transgressing them; so he willed that all natural things should always be moved and rested in a certain order, by certain laws, which laws those things themselves, as necessary causes, cannot fail to observe. (Disp. phys. XIX.1, OO I.103)

It seems that God’s causal activity generates not only matter and a conserved quantity of motion, but also motive powers in things, even if corporeal substances are devoid of reason and, therefore, incapable of violating natural laws. What might ground such powers in bodies? It cannot be the essence of matter, which is to be strictly passive quantity. Yet, Clauberg is committed to the claim that, given that motion exists in bodies, there must be in them a power of moving.

The following four disputations—which treat Descartes’s law of inertial motion, the explanation of projectile motion, the law of rectilinear and centrifugal motion, and the law of collisions—suggest the outlines of a realist account. Briefly, Clauberg suggests that God’s creation of matter subject to necessary laws confers upon it natural tendencies, for example, to remain in the same state, to move in a straight path, and to move or be moved by other bodies. The tendencies of bodies as stated in Cartesian laws are necessary relational properties, whose relata are God’s will on the one hand, and the direction and quantity of motion present in any finite volume on the other. Such tendencies are certainly not powers in the sense in which an Aristotelian natural philosopher would understand the term; they are not qualitative powers to actualize matter, such as the power of heating that makes fire hot and disposes it to burn paper. Yet, for Clauberg, the directional tendencies of bodies are nevertheless causal inasmuch as they endow them with features by which they determine changes of state in other bodies. They are necessary, moreover, inasmuch as they are partly grounded in God’s immutable will to conserve matter and its total quantity of motion (see Hamid 2024). Ultimately, for Clauberg, the attribution of causal powers, hence activity, to bodies is required by a proper understanding of God as primary cause:

Just as God is the author of all truth, whence the common ideas and theorems of eternal truth depend […] so he is the author of all order in Nature, whence the Laws of Nature proceed. About which, if anyone continues to dispute, let us say that, indeed, God (naturing nature [naturam naturantem]) should properly speaking act, but Nature (natured [naturatam]) should act according to them. For natural things act only when acted upon, and move when they are moved. (Disp. phys. XIX.11, OO I.106)

In light of subsequent German natural philosophy, Clauberg’s physics appears as a source of fruitful tensions. The examples of Johann Christoph Sturm and Leibniz exemplify two directions in which the Cartesian problems of corporeal form and causation, as adumbrated by Clauberg, lead. On the one hand, Sturm’s occasionalist strategy involves a rigorous development of the notion of passive form, already suggested in Clauberg, as sine quibus non causes. That is, Sturm strictly restricts efficient causality in matter to divine power but posits passive forms as bearers of corporeal properties that serve to individuate bodies (see Sangiacomo 2020). On the other, Leibniz shares the Claubergian view that God’s primary causality requires that certain features be inscribed in creaturely natures, which equip them to carry out divine commands. But in rejecting the occasionalist solution, Leibniz goes beyond Clauberg by rehabilitating active natures, which he variously terms entelechies, substantial forms, or monads. Briefly, whereas Sturm responds to the instability in the Claubergian-Cartesian account of corporeal natures by introducing passive forms, Leibniz turns in the other direction and places active principles at the center of his account of substance. In the background to the Sturm-Leibniz debate at the close of the seventeenth century, we may discern Clauberg’s reintroduction of the form/matter distinction and the primary/secondary matter distinction into mechanistic physics.

5. The Mind-Body Problem

The final part of Clauberg’s Physica is the Corporis et animae in homine conjunctio, one of the first treatises dedicated to the problems of mind-body union and interaction arising from Descartes’s theory of substance. More so than in general physics, it is in this context that Clauberg has been read as an occasionalist (Bouillier 1868: 298; Windelband 1878: 300; Balz 1951; Viola 1975; Weier 1981). The occasionalist interpretation has come under pressure in recent times, with scholars noting that Clauberg affirms unambiguously only the negative thesis of occasionalism—that mind and body do not interact—but not its distinctive positive theses—that finite substances are causally inert and that God is the only efficacious cause (Spruit 1999: 79; Bardout 2002: 135–8; Nadler 2011c: 122n). Accordingly, some commentators have qualified Clauberg’s occasionalism as being limited to the body’s communication with the mind, but allowing the possibility of the mind influencing the body’s direction of motion (Schmaltz 2017: 176–81; Favaretti Camposampiero 2018: 200–02). Others have proposed anti-occasionalist readings, both two-way interactionist accounts of the mind-body relation (Platt 2020: 137–65) and parallelist ones on which true causation occurs within the mental and bodily realms but not across the mind-body divide (Hamid 2022).

5.1 Occasionalism

The principal grounds for attributing occasionalism about the mind-body relation to Clauberg have to do, first, with his clear denial that mind and body could be naturally united, and second, with certain passages where he uses the Stoic and Galenic terms “occasio” and “causa procatarctica” to describe the relation between mental and bodily modes. In Conjunctio he rules out, on the basis of the heterogeneous natures of mind and body, the possibility both of their substantial unity and of their causal interaction. To underscore the special character of the mind-body relation, he writes that,

there cannot be found in the universe two things conjoined that are more dissimilar and more generically different than body and soul. (Conj. IV, OO I.211)

Denying that they are related as cause and effect, and that one is required for the perfection or existence of the other, he concludes that their union can only be ascribed to divine wisdom (Conj. IV.14–5, OO I.212). Thus, Clauberg unequivocally affirms the negative thesis of occasionalism about the mind-body relation, that their radically distinct natures preclude any natural ground of their union as well as of any genuine causation between them.

Second, in an oft-discussed text, Clauberg describes bodily motions as,

merely procatarctic causes that give occasion [occasionem dant] to the mind as the principal cause, which indeed always has that power in itself, to produce such and such an idea, at this particular moment, and to bring into act its power of thinking. (Conj. XVI.10, OO I.221)

The picture suggested here seems to fit occasional causation, according to which

one thing or state of affairs brings about an effect by inducing (but not through efficient causation […]) another thing to exercise its own efficient causal power. (Nadler 2011b: 33)

That is, A occasions B to cause e, where e is an effect of B’s efficient causality. Adopting this model, Clauberg might be read as holding that bodily states are occasional causes of mental states by inducing the mind to produce effects through its own efficient causality. Such a picture is also suggested by certain passages where Clauberg calls the mind a moral rather than physical cause, and likens the mind-body relation to that between a charioteer and a horse: the charioteer directs the motion of the horse, even as the motion is produced by the animal itself (Conj. XVI.5–6, OO I.221).

Against these reasons in favor of an occasionalist reading of Clauberg, scholars have pointed to the absence in his texts of a clear denial of causality to created substances, or of any general arguments against secondary causation. That is, his denial of mind-body union or interaction does not rest on the sorts of global arguments on which Malebranche or La Forge, for instance, rest their occasionalist views, such as the unintelligibility of necessary connections between finite things, or the impossibility of the transfer of properties from one substance to another. In light of this circumstance, Bardout (2002: 138) cautions against being misled by Clauberg’s use of phrases such as “give occasion” and “procatarctic cause”, for such expressions are in principle reconcilable with the efficacy of secondary causes.

5.2 Interactionism

Accordingly, some commentators have sought to clarify Clauberg’s positive account of the mind-body problem by turning to his general theory of causation. Platt (2020: 137–65) attributes to Clauberg a full-blown interactionist account of the mind-body relation. His argument rests on the claim that Clauberg revised his theory of efficient causation between the first and the later editions of his ontology. Whereas in the first edition, he defined cause narrowly in terms of production, in the 1660s he expanded his concept of efficient causation in order to account for mind-body interaction. Specifically, according to Platt, Clauberg came to recognize mere dependence-relations as a special type of efficient causation, and “cause” in general as synonymous with “principle”. With this capacious view of efficient causation as dependence, Clauberg could represent the regular covariation of mental and bodily states, amply confirmed by experience, as causal while denying that mind and body produce each other’s states by action.

The key objection to Platt’s view concerns his reading of Clauberg’s account of cause in Metaphysica de ente. There, Clauberg defines “cause” as “a principle that gives being to another thing different from itself” (Causa vero proprie dici videtur principium, quod alteri rei essentiam largitur a sua diversam; Met. ente XIII.225, OO I.321). Cause is a species of principle, which he defines as “that from which something has its origin, or on which something in any manner depends” (Met. ente XIII.221, OO I.320). For Clauberg, principle is the genus of dependence relations under which he recognizes several species, including principles of knowing (cognoscendi), principles of order (ordinis), and principles of being (essendi). Cause turns out to be a subspecies of principium essendi, whose specific difference is that it grounds a dependence relation by giving being (essentiam largitur) to another thing. It thus appears that, across all editions of his ontology, Clauberg defines causation in terms of production, and does not collapse the category of cause into principle.

In light of this textual difficulty, a different anti-occasionalist reading of Clauberg, due to Hamid (2022), takes at face value his denial that mind and body are related as cause and effect, and argues that he conceives their relation of conjunction as one of signification rather than of causation. On this view, Clauberg conceives mind and body as true efficient causes in their respective domains, which by their own powers (together with God’s primary causality) produce two distinct series of effects. Their coordinated effects, however, are not related causally but instead have the status of mutually referring signs, whose meanings are arbitrarily established by God’s will. On this account, mental and bodily states are only related semiotically. Crucially, this semiotic relation is due to neither real interaction between finite substances nor God’s causal intervention to produce one on the occasion of the other, but instead amounts to a special divine institution.

5.3 The Conjunction of Mind and Body

Common to recent discussions of Clauberg’s account of the mind-body problem is their attention to the special character of the relation he calls “conjunction”. In a key passage, he stresses that relations of causation and conjunction are subject to different criteria, and that the former is not needed in order to understand the mind-body relation:

To establish the relation between these things [i.e., mind and body], it is not at all necessary for one to be the cause or the effect of the other. It suffices if one brings about something, or changes something in the other, such that the two substances mutually refer to each other in their actions and passions. (Conj. IX.10, OO I.215)

Here, Clauberg indicates that, unlike a causal relation, conjunction can be established merely by reference. Whereas causal relations require production, reference may obtain merely in virtue of conventional marks standing in for certain arbitrary meanings. Causation is certainly what grounds mental and bodily states, insofar as mind and body count as true causes in their own domains. Yet, Clauberg insists that the conjunction of mental and bodily modes is not conceivable through their respective causal powers. Consequently, he suggests that no deeper account of the mind-body relation is possible apart from a description of the mutual reference of covarying mental and bodily states. He continues by noting that, for all we know, the mind-body relation consists only in an external “commerce and reciprocity” (commercio et reciprocatione) of their actions and passions, not in “similitude and agreement” (similitudine et convenientia) of their powers (Conj. IX.11, OO I.215). And he reminds the reader that, by contrast, a real union of mind and body would require causal production, or that

something should come from this to that, or from that to this, that is, that one should give something to the other, or it should receive something from the other. (Conj. IX.13, OO I.215)

Their mere conjunction, however, requires only the mutual reference of their actions.

In fact, Clauberg takes the union of mind and body, which constitutes the human being, to consist in nothing more than such a conjunction of mental and bodily modes. In Theoria corporum viventium, he rejects the Aristotelian formula of man as a rational animal, instead defining “homo” simply as “a thing composed from a finite mind and an organic body” (Corp. viv. XXIV.588–9, OO I.187). The human being is neither a hylomorphic unity nor a distinct, simple nature, but a composite of two complete, separate substances. The unity of mind and body is thus only an external one, consisting in the correlation of their modes (Conj. IV.14, OO I.212). Accordingly, his favored metaphors for mind-body union invoke contingent cooperation, such as teaching (docens), federation (foedere), and friendship (amicitia), rather than essential unity (Conj. VIII.4, OO I.214; IX.17, OO I.216; Corp. viv., XXVI.613, OO I.188).

Concerning the origin of the mind-body union, then, Clauberg cautions against seeking a causal account:

it is not appropriate to ask why such-and-such thoughts of the soul follow such-and-such motions of the body, or to seek how the motions of the animal spirits depend on the will. No natural necessity or affinity will be found inherent in these acts. (Conj. XIV.8, OO I.219)

Nothing in mental and corporeal natures explains the correlations of their states, which seem to be arbitrary: why, for instance, certain patterns of brain motions following a stubbed toe are regularly accompanied by pain sensations and the desire to withdraw the foot. For Clauberg, all we are in a position to say is that,

through his wisdom and freedom, God has willed that these acts of such different kinds be united in a human being, such that the one refers to the other, without there being any similitude between them. (Conj. XIV.9, OO I.219)

God’s will has made it the case that certain mental actions refer to certain bodily actions, and vice versa. But no deeper explanation of this fact could be forthcoming.

As for the referential character of sensations, Clauberg regards it as analogous to signification relations in language (Conj. XV.2, OO I.220). He calls sensations material or instrumental signs (signa materialia/instrumentalia) as opposed to formal signs (signa formalia). A formal sign is “an image of a thing in the mind, or every sign which properly speaking represents” (Met. ente, XXI.336, OO I.337). A formal sign represents an object by denoting its essential features, as smoke represents fire in virtue of acquainting the perceiver with qualities that necessarily result from burning. A material sign, by contrast, has a merely indicative function, and serves as an external aid to thinking. Deploying the distinction in Conjunctio, Clauberg likens the significatory character of sensations to the way in which “ivy hanging [on the tavern door] announces that wine is for sale” (Conj., XXXVIII.14, OO I.243). Ivy on the tavern door does not naturally represent the availability of good wine, and yet reliably informs customers in virtue of a social convention. Analogously, pain sensations do not represent the bodily causes of pain, and yet reliably indicate a certain kind of bodily state. Indeed, for Clauberg, we may be confident that the meanings of sensations, being divinely instituted, are more stable than socially instituted meanings. But whatever special reasons may have led God to decree that certain brain patterns should signify pain and others should signify hunger remain inexplicable. From the human standpoint, understanding the mind-body union becomes a matter of describing the covariations of sensations and bodily states, not of discovering causality.

Bibliography

Clauberg’s Works

Verbeek (1999a: 187–94) contains a comprehensive list of Clauberg’s works and their publication details (with some errors, corrected in the list below). Clauberg’s Opera omnia has been reprinted by Georg Olms as:

  • Opera omnia philosophica, 2 vols., Hildesheim: Georg Olms, 1968. [OO, cited by volume and page number]

Logica vetus et nova (1654) is the only work of Clauberg’s that exists in a complete modern translation:

  • Logique ancienne et nouvelle, Jacqueline Lagrée and Guillaume Coqui (eds. and trans.), Paris: Vrin, 2007.

Additionally, selections from various texts, including Logica vetus et nova, Corporis et animae in homine conjunctio, and De cognitione Dei et nostri exist in English, Italian, and German; for bibliographical details, see Ragni (2019a: 735–6). In the entry above, references are to the Opera omnia edition, with the exception of Elementa philosophiae, which is not included in OO; Unterscheid, which appears in OO in a posthumously translated Latin version; and the “Prolegomena” and “Proemium” to Logica. All translations are my own.

Below is a non-exhaustive list of Clauberg’s works published in his lifetime:

  • 1647, Elementa philosophiae sive ontosophia, Groningen: Johann Nicolai. [Elem. phil., by part and paragraph; and “Prolegomena”, by paragraph]
  • 1652, Defensio Cartesiana adversus Jac. Revium Theologum Leidensen, et Cyriacum Lentulum, professorem Herbornensem, Amsterdam: Elzevier. [Def. cart., by chapter and paragraph]
  • 1654, Logica vetus et nova quadripartita, Amsterdam: Elzevier. [Logica, by part, chapter, and paragraph; the “Prolegomena” from the 2nd edition, not included in OO, is cited by chapter and paragraph; the “Proemium”, likewise excluded from OO, is from the 1st edition]
  • 1655, Initiatio philosophi sive dubitatio Cartesiana ad metaphysicam certitudinem viam aperiens, Leiden and Duisburg: A. Wyngaerden. [Init. phil., by chapter and paragraph]
  • 1656, De cognitione Dei et nostri, quatenus naturali rationis lumine, secundum veram philosophiam, potest comparari, exercitationes centum, Duisburg: A. Wijngaarden. [Cog. Dei, by disputation and paragraph]
  • 1657, Unterscheid zwischen der cartesianischer und der sonst in Schulen gebräuchlicher Philosophie, Duisburg: A. Wyngarten. [Unterscheid, by paragraph]
  • 1658, Paraphrasis in Renati Des Cartes meditationes de prima philosophia. In quibus Dei existentia, et Animae humanae a Corpore distinctio demonstrantur, Duisburg: A. Wyngaerden.
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Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Acknowledgments

The author would like to thank Adi Efal-Lautenschläger and Devin Curry for helpful comments on an earlier draft of this entry.

Copyright © 2024 by
Nabeel Hamid <nabeel.hamid@concordia.ca>

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