1. The natural numbers, for example, are closed under multiplication: the product of any two natural numbers is also a natural number. But they are not closed under division: 1 divided by 3 is not a natural number.

2. \(P\) deductively implies \(Q\) when an argument with \(P\) as premise and \(Q\) as conclusion is deductively valid: if the premise is true then the conclusion must, as a matter of logical necessity, be true as well. Although “implies” in ordinary language sometimes means “suggests”, “insinuates”, or the like, “imply” and “implies” are used throughout this entry (and the relevant literature) to mean valid deductive entailment. Closure principles involving inductive inference are rarely discussed in the literature.

3. “[T]he idea that no version of [closure] is true strikes me, and many other philosophers, as one of the least plausible ideas to come down the philosophical pike in recent years” (Feldman 1995, 487). “[I]f a philosopher advances a view that forces us to reject closure, that should be taken as a reductio of that philosopher’s view” (Fumerton 1995, 131).

4. “[Timothy] Williamson has an insightful take on the root of epistemic closure intuitions, namely, the idea that ‘deduction is a way of extending one’s knowledge’” (Hawthorne 2013, fn. 6, quoting Williamson 2000, 117; see also Pritchard 2016, 13).

5. If, instead, we maintain that competently deducing \(Q\) from \(P\) itself requires that you maintain your recognition that \(P\) implies \(Q\) throughout the deduction then, again, we might as well just characterize closure as concerning your state at the time when the competent deduction is complete.

6. SPC is a true closure principle: a proposition that satisfies the relation “believed because it is implied by \(P\)”, where \(P\) is a member of the set of known propositions, is a known proposition. Since the antecedent and consequent of the dynamic version concern what you know at different times, it doesn’t express a condition on the set of known propositions at a given time, and so is not, strictly speaking, a closure principle.

7. If you did only know that \(P\) implies \(Q\) by testimony, then it would function for you as a premise: you would infer \(Q\) from \(P\) and \((P\) implies \(Q)\). But suppose you also only know that \(P\) and \((P\) implies \(Q)\) imply \(Q\) by testimony. Then you would infer \(Q\) from \(P, (P\) implies \(Q)\), and \(((P\) and \((P\) implies \(Q))\) imply \(Q)\). But suppose you only know that \(P\), \((P\) implies \(Q)\), and \(((P\) and \((P\) implies \(Q))\) imply \(Q)\) imply \(Q\) by testimony…. We can’t model your relationship to \(P\)’s implying \(Q\) as just another premise that you know on pain of your never being able to detach the conclusion. See Lasonen 2008, 8 for a closely related argument. A classic illustration of the detachment problem is Lewis Carroll 1895.

8. Another condition that is sometimes imposed on closure is that you don’t have a defeater suggesting that \(P\) doesn’t imply \(Q\). You might, for example, actually have the requisite accurate understanding of the inferential relation between \(P\) and \(Q\), but also have testimony from a highly reputable logician, uncharacteristically mistaken in this one instance, that this particular inference is invalid. It’s not clear, however, that such misleading defeaters undermine your knowledge of \(Q\); they might, instead, undermine your knowing, or your being justified in believing or claiming, that you know \(Q\). As a result, this condition is not imposed here.

9. Attempts to finesse the closure principle in response to counterexamples that—even closure advocates concede—need accommodation have sometimes delivered versions of closure that are baroque enough as to remind one of similarly unwieldy post-Gettier analyses of knowledge (see, for example, definition (9) of justification closure in Simpson 2021, 12352).

10. Nozick also claimed that knowledge must satisfy an adherence condition: were \(P\) true you would believe it. He called the combined conditions “tracking”. Unlike sensitivity (or, as Nozick called it, variation), the adherence condition is rarely endorsed. An exception is Roush (2005), who offers probabilistic versions of both sensitivity and adherence. Roush also endorses a version of closure: you know propositions that you infer from propositions that you know (Roush 2005) or, later, that you track (Roush 2012) even if you don’t track the inferred proposition. It’s an open question, however, whether the later version really counts as closure-preserving, since it allows that you could know \(P\), and infer \(Q\) from \(P\), but not know \(Q\) because, although you know \(P\), you don’t track it.

11. In general, “were \(P\) true then \(Q\) would be true” is standardly understood to require that \(Q\) is true in the \(P\)-worlds nearest to the actual world (although there can be \(P\)-worlds further out in which \(Q\) is false.) This widely endorsed interpretation of subjunctive conditionals is due to Stalnaker 1968 and Lewis 1973. Nozick’s interpretation was a bit more elaborate; see Nozick 1981, 681, fn. 8. Nozick was also somewhat noncommittal about the correct possible-worlds interpretation of sensitivity and adherence; his primary commitment was to the subjunctive conditionals themselves (Nozick 1981, 173–174). Williamson 2023 argues that a viable interpretation of both the sensitivity and safety conditionals (see §2.6) actually preserves closure.

12. See section §4 of the entry on skepticism for an overview of this argument.

13. Roush 2010 argues that it’s not as easy to extend the skeptical hypothesis to other ordinary claims as it might seem.

14. However, as we saw in §1.1, that is not a viable version of closure. And SPC’s antecedent requires, in addition to knowing \(H\), that you believe \(\neg BIV\) because it’s implied by \(H\). But it’s very implausible that ordinary people believe \(\neg BIV\) because it’s implied by \(H\) (or by any other piece of ordinary knowledge). As a result, Warfield and David 2008 suggest that the closure principle can’t be utilized for the skeptic’s purposes. But the skeptic can respond that you couldn’t know \(\neg BIV\) by any means whatsoever, including by inference from \(H\), even if you knew \(H\). But SPC ensures that, whether or not you did infer \(\neg BIV\) from known \(H\), if you were to do so, you would know \(\neg BIV\). So you must not know \(H\). This does, however, highlight the skeptic’s obligations: they need to claim that, even if you knew \(H\), you couldn’t learn \(\neg BIV\) by inference from it—that is, transmission would fail (see §3 below)—and, moreover, that there is no other way to learn \(\neg BIV\) available to you. See Alspector-Kelly 2019, ch. 3.

15. Your reason, in Dretske’s sense, is whatever it is to which you respond by forming your belief. It’s not required that you conceive of it as a reason, or even that you are aware that it produces your belief (Dretske 1970, 13–15).

16. Dretske’s “official” view, in Dretske 1983, is expressed, not subjunctively, but probabilistically: \(S\) knows that \(P\) iff \(S\)’s belief that \(P\) is caused (or causally sustained) by a state which manifests the information that \(P\), where a state manifests that information when the probability of \(P\) given that state is 1. Nevertheless, Dretske has demonstrated no clear resistance to the subjunctive formulation of his view. (The relationship between the two formulations, however, deserves exploration.)

17. An unexplored question is whether they deliver different answers in other cases.

18. Despite the fact that discussion of skepticism has been dominated by wholesale hypotheses, there are reasons to think that piecemeal hypotheses constitute the greater threat; see Smith 2016b.

19. See also Lawlor 2013 and 2023’s contextualized relevant alternatives account, as well as Horn 2018. But see Thomasson 2014, according to whose “easy ontology” we can resolve seemingly heavyweight ontological issues by inference from ordinary propositions.

20. If, however, you believe that it’s a barn, not by inference from “it’s a red barn”, but because it looks like a barn, then your belief is not basis-sensitive: it would look like a barn if it weren’t because it would be a non-red fake barn. But “it’s a red barn” would still be basis-sensitive. Whether or not this combination is unintuitive, however, it’s not a violation of SPC, whose antecedent requires that you believe “it’s a barn” by inference from “it’s a red barn”.

21. A possible response is that you only know that it’s a red barn by its appearance if you know, by its appearance, that it’s red and, by its appearance, that it’s a barn. But the latter is false (see note 20). In general, perhaps knowledge of a conjunction (it’s red and a barn) requires knowledge of, and so sensitivity to, each of its conjuncts. See Becker 2012. See also Baumann 2012 and Murphy and Black 2012. The intuition that one doesn’t know in fake-barn style cases is also not as widely affirmed as it is with respect to more traditional Gettier cases.

22. The objection—or, at least, the appellation “abominable”—originates in DeRose 1995. See also Veber 2013 for a variety of ways of pressing the objection.

23. “\(P\) but I don’t know \(P\)” is a pragmatic contradiction akin to the Moorean paradox “\(P\) but I don’t believe \(P\)”. Although both are infelicitous to assert, their conjuncts are consistent: \(P\) could, in fact, be true despite my not believing, or knowing, that it is.

24. \(H\) implies \(\neg BIV\), as does \(\neg BIV\). Since both disjuncts of \(H \vee \neg BIV\) imply \(\neg BIV\), so does the disjunction. And \(\neg BIV\) implies the disjunction because it implies the \(\neg BIV\) disjunct. So \(H \vee \neg BIV\) and \(\neg BIV\) imply each other. So they’re equivalent.

25. \(H\) implies both itself and \(\neg BIV\), and so implies both conjuncts of \(H \amp \neg BIV\). And the conjunction—in particular, the left conjunct—implies \(H\). So \(H\) and \(H \amp \neg BIV\) imply each other. So they’re equivalent.

26. This is because logically equivalent propositions are true (or false) in the same possible worlds.

27. See also Sharon and Spectre 2017a, who argue that evidential versions of AC and SC fail despite being equally intuitive. Yablo 2017 instead denies EC, as do Sherman and Harman 2011. See also Lawlor 2005.

28. See, for example, Vogel 2000’s “Omar’s new shoes” case. Sensitivity also has notorious problems with knowledge of necessary truths, inductive knowledge, and knowledge of the future. The essays in Luper-Foy 1987 include a variety of criticisms of Nozick, many of which would also apply to Dretske.

29. This is the simplest version of safety. A basis-relative version will be introduced in §2.9 below. Another version only requires that \(P\) is true in most of the nearby worlds in which you believe \(P\), although it must also be true in all very nearby such worlds (Pritchard 2009a, 2009b).

30. On the Lewis/Stalnaker possible-worlds interpretation of subjunctive conditionals, “were you to believe \(P\), \(P\) would be true” is trivially satisfied by a true belief, since the actual world is the nearest in which you believe \(P\), and in that world \(P\) is true. The typical possible-worlds interpretation of the safety conditional constitutes a departure from that account.

31. Views that endorse knowledge of the denials of skeptical hypotheses are sometimes called “neo-Moorean”.

32. This is especially so for the denial of piecemeal skeptical hypotheses like \(DM\) since, unlike wholesale hypotheses, it’s easy to imagine empirical evidence that would count against it.

33. Perhaps, for example, evidence is also required. But then a putative advantage of the safety account—that it can explain how you know \(\neg BIV\) despite not having evidence for it—no longer applies. And the safety theorist would have to come up with evidence for the denials of both wholesale and piecemeal skeptical hypotheses. Note also that your evidence for your having hands—its looking to you as though you have them—plays a crucial role in ensuring that your belief that you have hands is safe. But evidence can’t play that role for vacuously safe beliefs. So it’s unclear why a safety theorist would impose a blanket evidence requirement on knowledge.

34. The sensitivity theorist can offer a similar explanation: in the nearest world in which you win, you still believe that you lose (and on the same basis, namely, the probability of losing).

35. A variation of basis-safety is also designed to deal with necessarily true propositions. Such propositions are true in all possible worlds, and so in all nearby worlds wherein you believe them, no matter why you do so; necessarily true propositions are vacuously basis-safe. So your belief in necessarily true proposition \(T\) is basis-safe even if you believe it because your horoscope says so. But there’s presumably a nearby world in which your horoscope says instead that necessary falsehood \(F\), relevantly similar to \(T\), is true. So revise basis-safety to require that there be no nearby world in which you believe a relevantly similar proposition to \(T\) (including \(T\) itself) on the same basis as you do in the actual world and in which that proposition is false. Your belief in \(T\), on the revision, is unsafe (Pritchard 2009b).

36. See Wright 1985, 2000, 2002, 2003, 2004, 2008, 2011, 2012, 2014 and 2023, and Davies 1998, 2000 and 2003. There is now a burgeoning literature on warrant transmission, including Alspector-Kelly 2015, Brown 2004, Chandler 2010, Ebert 2005, McKinsey 2003, McLaughlin 2000 and 2003, Moretti 2012, Okasha 2004, Pryor 2004 and 2012, Silins 2005, Smith 2009, Zalabardo 2014, and many others. See also the entry on transmission of justification and warrant.

37. Knowledge overdetermination presupposes belief overdetermination (see §1.1): since knowing \(P\) requires that you believe \(P\) on a suitable basis, knowing \(P\) in multiple ways requires that you believe \(P\) on multiple bases.

38. This is in line with the use of “warrant” in Plantinga 1993a and 1993b as the difference between mere true belief and knowledge. See, however, note 48 below on another use of “warrant”.

39. If \(DM\) implies \(LZ\), then \(DM\) is logically equivalent to \((DM \amp LZ). DM\) and \((DM \amp LZ)\) are, therefore, equiprobable. \(p(DM\mid LZ) = p(DM \amp LZ)/p(LZ)\), so \(p(DM\mid LZ)\) also equals \(p(DM)/p(LZ)\). Assuming that \(0 \lt p(LZ) \lt 1\), \(p(DM)/p(LZ) \gt p(DM)\). So \(p(DM\mid LZ) \gt p(DM)\). Since \(p(DM) = 1 - p(\neg DM)\), \(p(DM\mid LZ) = 1 - p(\neg DM\mid LZ)\). So \(p(\neg DM\mid LZ) \lt p(\neg DM)\).

40. Sharon and Spectre 2017a wield this point in a general argument against closure. Although \(LZ\) is evidence for \(Z\), it isn’t evidence for \(\neg DM\). So evidence closure is false: that \(P\) implies \(Q\) doesn’t ensure that evidence for \(P\) is evidence for \(Q\). Sharon and Spectre utilize this in a number of arguments for the openness of knowledge itself. Yablo 2017 and Comesaña 2017 critique those arguments; Sharon and Spectre 2017b respond to those critiques.

41. \(BE\) need not be required in order for \(LZ\) to deliver a warrant for Z; this needn’t be a frontloading view (see §3.2 below). It could be that \(LZ\) by itself warrants \(Z\) while \(BE\) warrants \(\neg DM\).

42. It’s less clear how background evidence could confer the requisite high prior probability on the denial of wholesale skeptical hypotheses such as \(BIV\), however, since those hypotheses incorporate all putative background evidence by design. \(BIV\) (suitably elaborated), for example, implies that you have all of the experiences, \(BE\), that you actually have, so that you will appear to have the same background evidence that you take yourself to have on the basis of that experience. So \(p(\neg BIV\mid BE) \lt p(\neg BIV)\). It seems that \(\neg BIV\) would have to be sufficiently probable on a priori grounds. But see note 54 and §3.3.1 below.

43. The term “transmission” is, unfortunately, misleading in that it suggests that the warrant for the premise is somehow transferred to the conclusion, so that the former also warrants the latter. This is, in fact, antithetical to the concept of transmission according to which the warrant for the conclusion is acquired by inferring it from the premise, since that inference is otiose if the premise’s warrant already warrants the conclusion.

44. In response, one might offer an entirely different closure principle: if you know \(P\) on the basis of evidence \(E\) and, perhaps, background evidence \(BE, P\) implies \(Q\), and you also believe \(Q\) on the basis of \(E \amp BE\), then you know \(Q\). (In Dretske cases \(Q\) would be known solely on the basis of \(BE\) and despite \(E\).) Notably, this principle doesn’t require that you are aware that \(P\) implies \(Q\) or that you believe \(Q\) because it is so implied, and so doesn’t express any intuition to the effect that inference expands knowledge. Whether such a closure principle is viable, intuitively or theoretically, is an unexplored question.

45. Frontloading is also called “conservatism” in the literature (opposing the “dogmatism” discussed in §3.4 below). The term “conservatism” is, however, sometimes directly associated with the views of Crispin Wright, which are somewhat more specific.

46. This is the reasoning of Wright’s “disjunctive template” (Wright 2000). It’s also encouraged by underdetermination worries: \(Z\) and \(\neg DM\) appear to constitute competing hypotheses that both accommodate the evidence \(LZ\), so that further grounds are required in order to favor the former hypothesis over the latter. (However, responding to underdetermination, prima facie, only requires favoring one hypothesis over the other; it doesn’t clearly also require knowing that the less favored hypothesis is false.)

47. This is, at least roughly, the reasoning of Wright’s “revised template” (Wright 2011, 2012; but see note 48). On this reasoning, you also need a warrant for “it’s not a zebra disguised to look like a zebra”, since that’s another way in which the condition—that it’s not disguised—can be violated. (A likely story: the “mule” that the zoo-keepers painted to look like a zebra is, in fact, a zebra with a skin condition that removed its stripes so that, before being painted, it looked just like a mule. It was sold to the unsuspecting zoo by unscrupulous animal traffickers as a mule because nobody would want to buy a diseased zebra. As a result, the animal in the paddock is a zebra cleverly disguised to look just like a zebra.) In general, this account requires antecedent knowledge, not just of skeptical hypotheses, but also of what might be called their “Gettier variants”: although you’re only dreaming that you have hands, you do in fact have hands; although the report that the Broncos won yesterday is an accidentally posted report of last month’s game, they won that game too; and so on. These hypotheses are not inconsistent with the initial proposition \(P\) (you have hands, the Broncos won), and so their denial doesn’t follow from \(P\); but they are inconsistent with your knowing \(P\) in the way that you purport to know it.

48. Despite the fact that Wright is the best-known advocate of the frontloading strategy for closure preservation, the application of his view to the knowledge closure debate is problematic in at least three ways. First, although he is concerned with the transmission of “warrant”, his use of that term clearly isn’t equivalent to “ways of knowing” as we have used it here, but represents something more akin to (or even weaker than) justification: “to possess a warrant for \(P\) is to be in a state wherein it is, all things considered, epistemically appropriate to believe [or trust] \(P\).” (Wright 2008, 6). Second, in Wright 2011 and 2012 he refers, not to failures of transmission of warrant, but of claims to warrant. He recognizes that this could accommodate a certain rapprochement with his dogmatist opponent: transmission succeeds for warrant but not for claims to warrant (Wright 2012). Third, in his most recent work Wright is explicit: both dynamic and static knowledge closure principles fail (Wright 2023, 186). In order to maintain the relevance of the Wrightean approach to the knowledge closure debate, the discussion in the text prescinds from these concerns.

49. Coliva (2014 and 2015) also offers an account of transmission failure that doesn’t preserve closure: although one does need to reasonably assume \(Q\) in the relevant cases, one need not know (or have a warrant for) \(Q\). For similar views see Di Bello 2014 and Sherman and Harman 2011.

50. The basing requirement avoids cases wherein you have a warrant for \(P\) and believe it, but believe it on the basis of, for example, wishful thinking. You presumably don’t then know \(P\). Having a warrant for \(P\) vs. knowing \(P\) parallels the standard distinction between having a justification for believing \(P\)—propositional justification—and one’s belief in \(P\)’s being justified—doxastic justification.

51. This is not, however, a true closure principle, since the antecedent references propositions you know and the second disjunct of the consequent only references propositions for which you have a warrant.

52. We’ve already discussed a possible third source, that \(S\)’s warrant for \(P\) itself suffices to warrant \(Q\), in §3.1.

53. The externalist views of evidence are disjunctivism and “\(E = K\)”; see §3.4 below.

54. An alternative attempt to wield the characteristics of your background experience against skeptical hypotheses is that of the abductivist, according to which the “real-world” hypothesis provides a better explanation for those characteristics than does, for example, the \(BIV\) hypothesis—better enough, it would have to be claimed, to deliver knowledge of \(\neg BIV\). See Vogel 1990b, the exchange between Vogel and Fumerton in Steup, Turri, and Sosa 2013, Beebe 2009, McCain 2019, and Carter 2024.

55. See §2.4 above. This is an objection that DeRose (1995), a contextualist, raises against closure denial.

56. The same reasoning applies to pragmatic encroachment views, AKA interest-relative or sensitive moderate invariantism (Hawthorne 2004, Stanley 2008, Fantl and McGrath 2009). Those views emphasize variation in the standards for knowing with the knower’s practical circumstances. But they also need to countenance such variation in virtue of salience to the knowing subject of the skeptical hypothesis in order to accommodate many Dretske cases, since often nothing of practical significance hangs on those hypotheses’ being true. (There will typically be no practical implications for the typical zoo-goer whether \(Z\) or \(DM\), for example.) So, contemplation of such hypotheses places the subject in a high-standards situation in which they know neither \(P\) nor \(Q\); the abominable conjunction is false. That’s compatible with their knowing \(P\) but not \(Q\) in low-standards contexts—and so in which the abominable conjunction is true—wherein \(Q\), and so the conjunction, isn’t contemplated.

57. As per note 48, Wright means by “warrant” an all-things considered license to accept, not ways of knowing; he doesn’t suggest that such a warrant delivers knowledge. But we’re now considering the view as a way of preserving knowledge closure vis-a-vis wholesale skeptical hypotheses, whether or not that is Wright’s intent. See also Jope 2023.

58. Pritchard (2016, 2018, and 2023) suggests that, precisely because we don’t believe cornerstones (or hinges), neither SPWC nor any other closure principle applies to them, since the antecedent of all such principles requires that you end up believing \(Q\). Since the antecedent isn’t satisfied, the conditional is trivially true, and closure preserved. Wright responds that this amounts to “creative accounting”: we don’t acquire a warrant for cornerstone \(Q\) propositions by inference from ordinary known \(P\) propositions just because we, conveniently, don’t count as believing those \(Q\) propositions; closure “holds—except when it doesn’t” (Wright 2023, 185). See also Jope 2021 and Zhang 2021.

59. Similar positions include phenomenal conservativism (Huemer 2001) and moderate foundationalism (Alston 1976a and 1976b).

60. This isn’t inevitable; it’s possible to be a dogmatist, disjunctivist, or \(E = K\) advocate without endorsing transmission and, so, without endorsing closure (see, for example, Lawlor 2023). It isn’t entirely clear, in fact, that Williamson—the primary advocate of \(E = K\)—is a transmissivist (although he certainly advocates closure), because it’s not clear whether he thinks our knowledge of \(\neg BIV\) originates in our inferring it from \(H\) (or similar ordinary claims). On the one hand, he endorses the intuition that inference always expands knowledge (see note 4 above). On the other, he advocates a version of safety and, as we saw in §2.7, \(Q\) propositions in Dretske cases are inevitably vacuously safe, and so safe whether or not they are inferred from anything.

61. The bootstrapping problem was originally presented by Vogel 2000 as a problem for reliabilism, and subsequently by Cohen 2002 and 2005 as a problem for “basic knowledge”, being putative knowledge acquired from source \(K\) without prior knowledge that \(K\) is reliable. But suppose that you do know beforehand that your vision is reliable. You can then know that card is red because it appears red, and so know the conjunction; and similarly for all the other cards. That again appears to provide substantial inductive evidence that \(R\). You did know that to start with (we’re assuming); but that doesn’t prevent your acquiring a second warrant for \(R\). And it still seems absurd to suggest that you do so.

62. White 2006 presents these three concerns as problems for dogmatism. But they are really problems for the combination of dogmatism (or disjunctivism or \(E = K)\) and transmissivism; indeed, they are, arguably, more directly problems for the latter than the former. See Pryor 2013 and Kung 2010 for responses to White.

63. This is sometimes called the dogmatism problem, but it should not be confused with the dogmatist position discussed above.

64. Klein 2004 suggests that you only need to rule out skeptical hypotheses when you have some evidence in their favor. Since you can have no evidence for \(BIV\), and there is no evidence for \(DM\), we need to know neither \(\neg BIV\) nor \(\neg DM\) in order to learn \(H\) or \(Z\). Transmission then succeeds from the latter to the former. But frontloading is needed for lottery propositions, since we do have some non-zero statistical evidence for them: a lottery ticket will win, cars are stolen, and so on. (In fact, a number of zoos have been caught painting, not donkeys, but mules to look like zebras—e.g., in Armenia, China, Egypt, and Gaza.)

65. Strictly speaking, the universal generalization is only equivalent to the conjunction given that the items referenced in the conjuncts exhaust the domain of quantification, which we can assume here.

66. This is a variation of the paradox of the preface (Makinson 1965).

67. Such defeat might, in fact, be realized because it’s reasonable for you to assume that you’ve made a mistake somewhere even if there’s no actual risk of your having done so.

68. If your belief is actually false, then it is false in the nearest possible world to the actual, namely, the actual world; and it is false in a world nearby to the actual, namely, the actual world. So only true beliefs can be sensitive and safe. Sutton 2007’s and Williamson 2025’s identification of justification with knowledge is an exception to the claim that justification is fallible, knowledge being factive. See also Littlejohn 2012.

69. One might think, however, that normic support for “my car’s not stolen” on your evidence requires, not that your car’s being stolen itself would call for explanation, but that its being stolen despite your evidence to the contrary would do so. In lottery case B, your winning wouldn’t itself call for explanation, as Smith recognizes (Smith 2010, 23). Nevertheless, your winning despite the mismatch between the numbers on your ticket and those on the screen would call for explanation, whereas such an explanation isn’t called for when your only evidence is that losing is likely given the odds, as in case A. Similarly, whether or not your car’s being stolen itself calls for explanation, that it was stolen despite the rarity of car thefts doesn’t do so. If, however, it was stolen despite your seeing what looks for all the world like your car on closed-circuit TV, that would call for explanation: the thief, say, had replaced your car with a car-façade when you weren’t paying attention. Given that evidence, your belief that it isn’t stolen is normatively supported, and so justified. So, given only that car thefts are rare, your belief that it isn’t stolen isn’t normatively supported, and so not justified, after all, although you are justified in believing that it’s in 3b; SPJC fails. See Alspector-Kelly 2019, §§8.5.1–8.5.2, for discussion of the distinction between explaining \(\neg P\) itself and explaining \(\neg P\) despite one’s evidence (or basis) for \(P\).

70. Many of these are “knowledge-first” accounts of justification, which appeal to knowledge in characterizing justification rather than vice versa. (Knowledge-first epistemology was initiated primarily by Williamson 2000.) They include Bird 2007, Ichikawa 2014, Smithies 2012, Reynolds 2013, Rosenkranz 2018, Kelp 2016, Simion 2019, and Silva 2017. See McGlynn 2014b for critique of some knowledge-first accounts of justification. Smith’s view isn’t a knowledge-first account, since it doesn’t characterize justification in terms of knowledge. But it is related in that Smith sees justification and knowledge as “normatively coincident”: one can’t aim at being justified without simultaneously aiming at knowledge (Smith 2014 and 2016a, ch. 1).