Animal Consciousness

First published Sat Dec 23, 1995; substantive revision Tue Jan 13, 2026

Is there something it’s like to be an octopus, a bee, a snail? For much of the twentieth century, research into animal cognition tended to avoid questions of consciousness, following the lead of human neuroscience, where such questions were also marginalized (see the entries on animal cognition, methods in comparative cognition). However, the growing profile of consciousness science since 2000 has brought the topic of consciousness back into the scientific mainstream (see the entry on the neuroscience of consciousness), and this has led to resurgent interest in studying conscious experience in other animals.

There is now an emerging interdisciplinary field of “animal consciousness research” or “animal sentience research” bringing together researchers from neuroscience, comparative psychology, animal welfare and veterinary science, evolutionary biology, and philosophy. This mix of disciplines has generated lively and heated discussions, many occurring in the pages of the journal Animal Sentience, founded in 2016. Because of the inherent difficulties of studying conscious experience, the area is characterized by conceptual and methodological disagreement. Yet questions of animal consciousness have tremendous significance for animal ethics and animal welfare (see the entry on the moral status of animals and the grounds of moral status), leading many to conclude that they are too important to leave wholly unanswered, despite the high level of uncertainty. Consequently, animal consciousness has become an area of unusually vigorous collaboration between philosophers and scientists.

Our focus here will be on philosophical issues, but we have also included a supplement on evidence concerning animal consciousness that aims to provide an entry point to the empirical literature.

1. Animal Consciousness and Philosophy

Why does animal consciousness matter? While the questions are intrinsically fascinating, they also connect to a wide range of other issues in the philosophy of science and medicine, the philosophy of mind, psychology and psychiatry, the philosophy of religion, and ethics.

Human exceptionalism: Philosophy often begins with questions about the place of humans in nature. One way humans have attempted to locate themselves is through comparison with other animals. In Biblical cosmology, all animals are said to have arisen through divine creation, but only humans are said to have been created in the likeness of God (Lewis, 2009, Ch. 9). An evolutionary perspective casts doubt on all this, recasting the human species as one tip of one branch of the tree of life, enjoying no particular special status. Some have wanted to argue: perhaps consciousness is what sets humans apart from the rest of nature. Yet empirical evidence has made this view increasingly untenable.

The nature of consciousness: The viability of philosophical and scientific theories of consciousness is sometimes assessed in part by asking whether the theory has plausible implications for other animals (see the entries on consciousness, the neuroscience of consciousness). For example, some “higher-order thought” theories have been criticized for apparently ruling out consciousness in any animal without the relevant ability for higher-order thought (see the entry on higher-order theories of consciousness). Theories of consciousness that aspire to generality need to take due account of the data from other animals, either by explaining how consciousness can be realized in different kinds of nervous system or else by arguing that the behaviors we see in animals can be achieved non-consciously.

Ethics: There is, on the face of it, a lot at stake morally in the question of which animals are conscious (see the entries on the moral status of animals and the grounds of moral status). Trillions of animals are slaughtered every year for food, research, and other human purposes. Before their deaths, many of these animals are subject to conditions that, if they are experienced by the animals in anything like the way a human would experience them, amount to cruelty. When the question of animal consciousness is under consideration, our guilt or innocence as a civilization for an enormous body of cruelty may hang in the balance.

The status of animal models in psychiatry and biomedical research: Large swathes of biomedical research use animals as models for humans. When what is being modeled is a conscious state, such as pain, fear, depression or anxiety, the validity of the model seems to hinge on the animal also possessing a version of that state. For example, a lot of research directly relevant to the treatment of human pain is conducted on rats and other animals. Sometimes those skeptical of attributing such states to animals are driven by a concern that, if we attribute complex states like anxiety or depression too liberally, we will end up overestimating the value of animal models for developing new treatments (Taschereau-Dumouchel et al. 2022).

Limits of scientific methodology and knowledge: The science of animal consciousness offers rich controversies about scientific methodology and its limits. Marian Stamp Dawkins, a prominent animal welfare scientist (Dawkins 1985, 1993, 2021), has written that “the mystery of consciousness remains. The explanatory gap is as wide as ever and all the wanting in the world will not take us across it” (Dawkins 2012, pp. 171–172). While language may allow humans to communicate their experience to others, this type of evidence, critics allege, is not available for other animals. Joseph LeDoux, another prominent critic, has described verbal report as the gold standard of evidence in the science of consciousness, and has warned against resting inferences on “nonverbal behavioral guesstimates” (LeDoux 2019, p. 323).

This skeptical attitude may initially seem hard to understand. It is a matter of common sense to many people that some animals have conscious experiences. If asked why they think their pets are conscious, people often point to similarities between their behavior and human behavior. For example, animals seem to express pleasure and displeasure and a variety of emotions, their behavior seems to be motivated by seeking food, comfort, social contact, and so on, and they seem aware of their surroundings and able to learn from experience.

Yet skeptics caution against overinterpreting similarities, especially at the level of behavior. Their goal, typically, is not to argue that animals lack consciousness, but to cast doubt on the quality of the evidence cited in support of consciousness attributions. They tend to emphasize that superficial observation of quite similar behaviors even in closely related species does not guarantee that the underlying mechanisms are the same (Povinelli & Giambrone 2000; Heyes 2008). Another key idea for skeptics is that we underestimate the extent to which our own behavior is controlled by unconscious circuitry. LeDoux has argued that much of what we call a “fear response”, both in ourselves and in other mammals, is in fact controlled by a “defensive survival circuit” entirely distinct from the mechanisms involved in conscious experience.

2. Concepts of Consciousness

The term “consciousness” is notoriously ambiguous and difficult to define. Sometimes, the word “conscious” is invoked merely as a way of saying that a creature is awake rather than asleep. On other occasions, the word is used to describe the ability of organisms to perceive, attend and respond to features of their environments, thus making them “aware of” or “conscious of” those features. Attributions of “consciousness” in these senses are relatively uncontroversial. Clearly, animals across a wide variety of taxonomic groups have sleep-wake cycles and can perceive, attend and respond to their surroundings.

In the science and philosophy of consciousness, two quite different senses of “consciousness” have been the main focus. One is “access consciousness”, a term coined by Ned Block to describe the availability of a mental representation for use in reasoning and the rational control of action (Block 1995). The distribution of access-consciousness in the animal kingdom will depend on the distribution of reasoning and rational action (Hurley and Nudds 2006). Speech is not a requirement, though it is an important source of evidence of access in humans.

Block contrasted “access consciousness” with phenomenal consciousness: the qualitative, subjective, experiential side of consciousness. The term “sentience” is also widely used in this context (Feigl 1958), though it sometimes also has a narrower meaning (see the list at the end of this section). Consciousness in the phenomenal sense is concerned with, in Thomas Nagel’s (1974) phrase, “what it’s like”. Nagel doubts our capacity to know, imagine, or describe in scientific, objective terms what it is like to be a bat, but he assumes that there is something it is like.

For many researchers working on animal consciousness, phenomenal consciousness is the sense of consciousness that matters most: the sense most relevant for ethics and welfare, the one that is most puzzling and mysterious, and the one that the emerging science of animal consciousness should aspire to investigate (Barron and Klein 2016; Tye 2016; Godfrey-Smith 2019; Ginsburg and Jablonka 2019). In other words, when investigating whether a group of animals are conscious, our goal should be to find out whether there is “something it’s like” to be those animals—whether they have a phenomenal perspective or “point of view” on the world and on their own bodies.

Importantly, the fact that we can draw a conceptual distinction between access and phenomenal consciousness does not imply that evidence of access cannot be evidence of phenomenal consciousness. Consider an analogy: we can conceptually distinguish “fever” from “influenza” and entertain the possibility of fever without influenza and of influenza without fever, but it does not follow that fever cannot be evidence of influenza. Similarly, there might well be an evidential connection between access-related properties and phenomenal consciousness due to a constitutive or causal relationship between them. In practice, empirical approaches to animal consciousness have posited evidential connections between phenomenal consciousness and various cognitive properties (Section 4.3).

Both access and phenomenal consciousness can be distinguished from self-consciousness, a subject’s awareness of itself as a being that persists through time (see the entries on self-consciousness, phenomenological approaches to self-consciousness). This is also a notoriously ambiguous term: there are multiple senses in which a subject can be “self-aware”. These include: keeping track of the effect one’s actions on the stream of sensory stimulation, thereby registering a self-other distinction implicitly; an awareness of one’s body as a physical object, or as the medium of one’s own perception and agency (bodily or agential self-awareness); awareness of one’s own mental states (mental or experiential self-awareness); awareness of oneself as perceived by others, or as a member of a social group (social self-awareness); and awareness of oneself as a persistent character in the narratives told by oneself and others (narrative self-awareness). The most basic forms of self-awareness are likely to be very widespread in the animal kingdom. By contrast, narrative forms are likely to be much rarer and may be uniquely human.

The rest of this article deals primarily with the attribution of phenomenal consciousness to animals, mentioning other senses of the word “consciousness” only where relevant.

When we attribute phenomenal consciousness to other animals, we are positing that there are phenomenological facts: facts about what it’s like to be them. Given the variation in sensory abilities and bodily forms of animals, their phenomenology must be hugely varied. A glaring unsolved problem is that there is no standard terminology for classifying the various possible forms of phenomenology that may exist beyond the human case. All can agree that generalizing everyday human terms may be problematic, but there are many views about which terms are most useful for generalizing across species and why. Terms that feature commonly in recent taxonomies include:

  • Sentience, often (though not always) defined as the ability to have affective (i.e. valenced) experiences such as pain or pleasure.
  • Emotion, with continuing debate over whether unconscious emotion is possible (e.g. Winkielman and Berridge 2004 vs. Solms 2019).
  • Autonoetic (“self-knowing”), noetic (“knowing”), and anoetic (“non-knowing”) consciousness (Tulving 2005; LeDoux 2022; Vandekerckhove and Panksepp 2011).
  • Mental time-travel, the ability to imagine or think about the past or future, including episodic memory and future planning, with continuing debate about whether this requires consciousness (Tulving 1985).
  • Self-awareness in various senses such as embodied/sensorimotor, social, temporal and narrative.
  • Intersubjectivity, empathy, and awareness of other minds (Aaltola 2013; Gärdenfors 2008; Gruen 2009, 2015).
  • Various grades of conscious agency, control and goal-directedness/teleology (or “teleonomy”) (Trestman 2018; Ginsburg and Jablonka 2019).

Some of these terms feature in other entries (see the entries on animal cognition, methods in comparative cognition). It is fair to say the emerging science of animal consciousness suffers at present from a lack of agreed taxonomies. Finding such frameworks must be a priority for the future.

What seems very unlikely, however, is that agreement will ever be reached around a single sliding scale, allowing some animals to be described as “more conscious” or “less conscious” than others. While the idea of such a scale is intelligible in theory (A. Lee 2023), a more realistic goal for animal consciousness research in practice is to profile different animals along various dimensions without attempting to aggregate these dimensions into an overall degree of consciousness (Birch et al. 2020b; Dung and Newen 2023).

3. Debating Continuity and Difference: Some Historical Landmarks

One encyclopedia entry cannot aim to survey the full history of debates about animal consciousness. In describing a few major landmarks, our aim is simply to convey why the topic has long been controversial in modern Western science and philosophy—and, at the same time, to give a sense of why many non-Western traditions have found the idea far less controversial.

Aristotle is often touted as a defender of human exceptionalism, but his views are not easy to classify in today’s categories. He asserted that only humans had “rational” souls, while the “sensitive” or “locomotive” souls shared by all animals endow them with instincts suited to their successful reproduction and survival. The “sensitive” soul seems much closer to the modern idea of phenomenal consciousness than the “rational” soul, suggesting that Aristotle was in fact willing to attribute a basic form of consciousness to other animals (Ginsburg and Jablonka 2019).

Medieval authors in the Muslim and Christian world, such as Ibn Sina and Peter Olivi, who developed sophisticated theories of human mental faculties, applied their theories to nonhuman animals, emphasizing continuity. However, it is fair to say that the assumption of an absolute metaphysical divide between humans and other animals tightly constrained thinking throughout this era (Adamson and Toivanen 2015 – see Other Internet Resources).

Descartes is often singled out as the greatest critic of animal consciousness in the modern Western tradition. His mechanistic philosophy introduced the idea of a reflex to explain the behavior of non-human animals, portraying animals as reflex-driven machines with no intellectual capacities. He recognized that other animals have sensations, but he took mechanistic explanation to be perfectly adequate for explaining sensation, with no role for thought (Cottingham 1978). It is not clear how Descartes’ categories map on modern terms like “phenomenal consciousness”, so we should be cautious about attributing to Descartes the view that there was nothing it’s like to be a non-human animal.

Although experimental investigation of physiology was common in Descartes’ time (and Descartes himself practiced and advocated vivisection) the experimental study of animal behavior was not. A few glimmers of experimental approaches to animal behavior can be seen in the late 18th century (e.g., Barrington 1773; White 1789/1813). Soon thereafter, Frédéric Cuvier worked from 1804 until his death in 1838 on sexual and social behavior in captive mammals. In the mid 19th century Alfred Russel Wallace (1867) argued for an experimental approach to animal behavior, and Douglas Spalding’s (1872) experiments on instinctual feeding behaviors in chicks were influential. Still, these authors made no attempt to draw inferences to consciousness from behavior. Indeed, Wallace famously regarded consciousness as inexplicable by evolution or natural selection (Kottler 1974).

Darwin, in both the Origin of Species (1859) and in the Descent of Man (1871), devoted considerable attention to animal behavior with the goal of demonstrating mental continuity among species. Darwin relied heavily on anecdotes provided by his correspondents, a project pursued after his death by his protégé George Romanes (1882). Yet Darwin also carried out experiments and made his own observations. In his final work he describes experiments on the flexibility of earthworm behavior in manipulating leaves, which he took to show considerable intelligence (Darwin 1881; see also Crist 2002).

T.H. Huxley (1874), an early champion of evolutionary theory remembered as “Darwin’s bulldog”, defended the idea that consciousness leaves no imprint whatsoever on behavior or cognition, writing: “in men, as in brutes, there is no proof that any state of consciousness is the cause of change in the motion of the matter of the organism.” This view has come to be known as “epiphenomenalism” (see the entry on epiphenomenalism). Huxley reported a series of experiments on a frog, showing very similar reflexive behavior even when its spinal cord had been severed, or large portions of its brain removed. He argued that without a brain, the frog could not be conscious, but since it could still do the same sort of things that it could do before, consciousness is superfluous to behavior (A. Klein 2019, Michel 2019).

In The Principles of Psychology (1890), William James offered an argument against epiphenomenalism that still stands up well. Conscious experience, he argued, has all the hallmarks of a complex, evolved adaptation. Think especially of the alignment between our pains and pleasures and our biological needs:

if pleasures and pains have no efficacy, one does not see (without some such a priori rational harmony as would be scouted by the ‘scientific’ champions of the automaton theory [i.e. epiphenomenalism]) why the most noxious acts, such as burning, might not give thrills of delight, and the most necessary ones, such as breathing, cause agony. (James 1890/1918, pp. 143–144).

James’s point is that this adaptive alignment is best explained by natural selection—but, to be selected, it must have effects.

James promoted the idea of differing intensities of conscious experience across the animal kingdom, an idea that was echoed by the British psychologist Conwy Lloyd Morgan in his 1894 textbook An Introduction to Comparative Psychology. Morgan had been very skeptical of the anecdotal approach favored by Darwin and Romanes, but he nonetheless came around to the Darwinian point of view about mental continuity. Morgan held that inference in psychology begins with introspective examination of one’s own mind. Inferences concerning other human minds rest on the principle that similar behavior in other people has similar psychological causes to my own. Inferences about other species then rest on the principle that behavior similar to human behavior will likewise have similar causes. Morgan called this the “double inductive” method, because it involved two inductive steps: from self to other human, and from human to other animal (Sober 2005). To counteract what he saw as the anthropomorphic bias inherent in the double inductive method, Morgan introduced a principle now known as Morgan’s canon:

in no case may we interpret an action as the outcome of the exercise of a higher psychical faculty, if it can be interpreted as the outcome of the exercise of one which stands lower in the psychological scale (Morgan 1894, p.53) (for discussion, see the entries on animal cognition, methods in comparative cognition).

The influence of Morgan across the Atlantic can be seen in Margaret Floy Washburn’s textbook The Animal Mind (1908). Washburn endorsed Morgan’s canon but, in contrast to many later commentators, read it as an imperative to avoid attributing complex conscious states where simpler ones will suffice, not as opposing the attribution of consciousness to a wide range of animals. She held that “no one can prove the absence of consciousness in even the simplest forms of living beings. It is therefore perfectly allowable to speculate as to what may be the nature of such consciousness, provided that the primitive organisms concerned possess it” (Washburn 1908, p. 37). The textbook includes a rich discussion of the possible experiences of single-celled protists, such as amoebae and paramecia, based on observations of their behavior by Herbert S. Jennings (1906).

The rise of behaviorism in American psychology in the early 20th century, beginning with Thorndike’s (1911) experiments on animals learning by trial and error to escape “puzzle boxes”, suggested a way forward for psychology that bypassed questions of consciousness. However, even Thorndike’s famous “law of effect” refers to the animal’s “satisfaction or discomfort” (1911, p.244). It was with the radical anti-mentalism of John B. Watson (1913, 1928) and later B. F. Skinner (1953), both of whom strongly rejected any attempts to explain animal behavior in terms of unobservable mental states, that American psychology became, to a large extent, the science of behavior alone.

Yet pure behaviorism faced challenges from an early stage. Edward C. Tolman (1932, 1948), studying rats in mazes, observed what he called “vicarious trial and error”: moments where the rats appeared to be pausing to mentally model the consequences of different choices. At the time, this interpretation flew in the face of the fundamental assumption of the behaviorist approach: that behavior was determined by stimulus and reinforcement contingencies. Tolman’s conclusion was that the anti-mentalism of pure behaviorism would be a fatal limitation, because “behavior as behavior is purposive and is cognitive. These purposes and cognitions are of its immediate descriptive warp and woof.” (Tolman 1932, p. 12) Modern neural recording techniques support the idea that rats really do simulate alternative courses of action (Redish 2016).

In Europe, ethological approaches provided a contrast with American-style behaviorism. Ethology emphasized the importance of integrating fieldwork with experimental science conducted on captive animals, reflecting the different styles of its two seminal figures, Konrad Lorenz and Niko Tinbergen (Burkhardt 2005). Lorenz and Tinbergen explicitly sought to distance ethology from the purposive, mentalistic, animal psychology of Bierens de Haan, while at the same time distancing themselves from the lack of sensitivity to ecological questions they detected in American psychology (Brigandt 2005). But despite the distance from behaviorism, questions of consciousness were still marginalized.

Jacob von Uexkull was a notable dissenter, arguing that a genuinely biological understanding of the mechanisms of perception and action must relate them to the whole animal as an integrated perceiving and acting subject. Von Uexkull coined the term Umwelt for the environment as it has meaning for a given animal. He held that an animal’s Umwelt has a complementary structure to its “inner world” (or “phenomenal-” or “self-world”). Biologists decipher the animal’s subjective world through the system of signs that constitute its Umwelt. Biology therefore requires treating animals not as decomposable machines, but as “subjects whose essential activity consists of perceiving and acting.” (von Uexkull 1934/1992, p. 320)

In the 1970s, Donald Griffin, who made his reputation taking careful physical measurements to prove that bats use echolocation, made a considerable splash with his plea for a return to questions about animal minds, especially animal consciousness. Griffin (1978) coined the term “cognitive ethology” to describe this program, which aimed to combine naturalistic observations of animal behavior with attempts to understand animal minds in the context of evolution. Griffin emphasized behavioral flexibility and versatility as the chief source of evidence for consciousness, which he defined as “the subjective state of feeling or thinking about objects and events” (Griffin & Speck 2004, p. 6). Although Griffin’s program was heavily criticized at the time (see Bekoff & Allen 1997), he played a crucial role in reintroducing discussions of consciousness to the science of animal behavior and cognition, paving the way for modern investigations of the distribution and evolutionary origins of consciousness.

The 2010s and 2020s have seen a visible resurgence of interest in the topic. What has driven this turn back towards questions deliberately put aside in the twentieth century? The rise of the science of human consciousness has clearly played an important role (see the entry on the neuroscience of consciousness). Since the 1990s, consciousness science has gradually established itself, premised in large part on its promise of clinical relevance to humans. At the same time, it has always been heavily reliant on animal research, especially research on the visual system of the Rhesus macaque (Macaca mulatta) (see the supplement). An assumption of consciousness in at least other primates has therefore become central to the field (see the entry on animal cognition, Section 3.3). Given this, we should not be surprised to find consciousness researchers starting to take an interest in a wider range of animals, partly with a view to finding new animal models.

At the same time, many have been drawn to the topic by a very different motive: a drive to assemble an evidence base to help people advocate for animals in legal and policy settings. In these contexts, the term “sentience” is usually used, and connotes a special emphasis on experiences with a positive or negative quality, such as pleasure and pain (see the entries on pleasure, pain). Respect for animals is now written into law in France, Peru, Quebec, Spain, Sweden, New Zealand and the United Kingdom, and recognition of animals as sentient beings also features in the European Union’s Lisbon Treaty (World Animal Protection 2023). When drawing up legislation concerning animal sentience, policy-makers need to decide the legislation’s scope: exactly which animals should be recognized as sentient beings? This has led to particular interest in animal taxa traditionally excluded from animal welfare laws, such as decapod crustaceans (Crump et al. 2022).

The two motivations sit uneasily together. Stevan Harnad, editor of the journal Animal Sentience, has been open about his own ethical motivations, and has a policy that the journal “will not publish studies in which animal subjects are harmed” (Harnad 2016). Meanwhile, many of the techniques generating most excitement in the neuroscience community are invasive. Animal consciousness research today is a very broad church—broad enough to contain people with background motivations in tension with each other.

The story we have told so far, from Aristotle to Harnad, is focused on the Western academy, in which the idea of animal consciousness has often been viewed with a level of skepticism many find surprising. To round out the picture, we need to highlight that many non-Western traditions approach the topic in a very different, far less skeptical way (Adamson and Edwards 2018).

Of special note here are Hinduism, Buddhism, Jainism and related Indian philosophical traditions that strongly emphasize mental continuity between humans and other animals. They also place high moral importance on the treatment of other animals, considering them to be fellow sentient beings with feelings, perceptions and interests. Traditionally, this is related to the idea of reincarnation or rebirth: to be sentient is to be a possible form into which one might be reborn, or in which one might have lived in a past life. Nonhuman animal rebirths are generally seen as less favorable than human ones, often being framed as a punishment or a trial. Vegetarianism is widespread in these communities, although not all Buddhist or Hindu traditions require it (see the entry on ethics in Indian Buddhism). In Buddhism, the concept of sentience is closely connected to that of life, leading to the idea, curious to Western ears, that plants are neither sentient nor alive (Carpenter and Adamson 2018 – see Other Internet Resources). Jainism, meanwhile, accepts a form of plant sentience (see the entry on Jaina philosophy). Some Jain monastics adopt a diet based on fruit and nuts, harvestable without lethal violence to plants. They also show great concern for insects and other small creatures that might be harmed by farming or in everyday life (Sen 2014).

Many indigenous knowledge systems from around the world place a great emphasis on nonhuman animal experience. In a paradigm labeled “animism”, humanity is seen as part of a broader social reality together with a diversity of other sentient beings, including individual animals, as well as the spirits of natural phenomena and places, plus ghosts or ancestral spirits of the deceased (Viveiros de Castro 1998). For example, the Navajo National Code states that “All creation, from Mother Earth and Father Sky to the animals, those who live in water, those who fly and plant life have their own laws, and have rights and freedom to exist.” (Navajo National Code). In the Navajo belief system, nonhuman animals are viewed as having individual personalities, emotional experience, intelligence, the ability to reason as constrained by their perceptions of the world, and cultural traditions of shared knowledge passed between generations of each of the Animal Peoples (Pavlik and Tsosie 2014, p. 42). Animism is related to a cosmological picture shared by many cultures in which humans and nonhuman animals at one point in time existed together as peoples not yet differentiated by the physical forms that now set them apart (Viveiros de Castro 1998; Reid et al., 1984, p 11). Not all indigenous cultures regard individual nonhuman animals as sentient. Alternatively, some attribute sentience to collective entities representing entire species or guilds (Viveiros de Castro 1998).

For cultures that place a great emphasis on hunting, knowledge of animal minds is often greatly valued. For example, in Dakota tradition, immersive field knowledge of the behavioral habits and subjective experience of animals is not only valued pragmatically (for securing material resources) but as an intellectual and spiritual end in itself (Eastman [Ohiyesa] 1904). In many hunting-oriented indigenous peoples across the Americas as well as the global Far North, great importance is placed on maintaining relationships of good standing with nonhuman animal populations. Norms of respect and consideration (for example, avoiding cruelty or wasteful slaughter) are considered both morally and practically important, in part because animals themselves are said to recognize this treatment and interact differently with humans who practice it (Eastman [Ohiyesa] 1904; Nadasdy 2007).

Various forms of reincarnation belief are traditional to indigenous peoples of North America and the far north (Mills and Slobodan 1994). As in other reincarnationist traditions, these beliefs are related to ethical views about the treatment of nonhuman animals. Many peoples share the broad belief that spirits of animals will only choose to reincarnate as the same species again if their way of life is allowed to flourish, leading to an imperative to treat them with respect (Mills 1994).

A philosophical view prevalent among indigenous cultures throughout the Americas is what Viveiros de Castro calls “Amerindian perspectivism”. On this view, the creatures we perceive as animals perceive themselves as humans, their bodily attributes as clothing and decorations, their burrows as houses or villages, and their habits and behavior as forms of culture. Their physical forms are “envelopes” or “masks”: mere outward appearances to other species (Viveiros de Castro 1998). On this view, other animals perceive themselves as persons and their own species as a people.

In wrapping up this brief overview, we should note some initial signs that Abrahamic faiths may be moving into closer alignment with the less anthropocentric pictures just considered. Strikingly, Pope Francis explicitly rejected “tyrannical anthropocentrism” and argued that nonhuman animals have the capacity for suffering, intrinsic autonomy, purpose and spiritual potency (an ability to relate to God), adding that humans therefore owe them moral obligations directly (Francis 2015).

Unsurprisingly, views of personhood, mental capacities, and moral status in nonhuman animals show vast diversity across the world’s cultures, and this section has barely scratched the surface of this diversity. Notably, though, the idea that a capacity for conscious experience is possessed by many animals, rather than being uniquely human, is very widespread. In a global and historical context, the Cartesian view starts to look like an aberration.

4. Methodological Challenges for the Science of Animal Consciousness

4.1 The Distribution Question and the Phenomenological Question

A distinction between two questions—first introduced in an earlier version of this article (Allen 2000)—has shaped the way researchers think about the aims of animal consciousness research:

  • The Distribution Question: Can we know which animals beside humans are conscious?
  • The Phenomenological Question: Can we know what, if anything, the experiences of animals are like?

In “What is it like to be a bat?” Thomas Nagel (1974) assumes that there is something that it is like to be a bat, focusing on what he argues is the scientifically intractable problem of knowing what the bat’s experiences are like. Many would find Nagel’s assumption reasonable: bats are, after all, our fellow mammals. But as we look further away from humans on the tree of life, attributions of conscious experience become more and more controversial.

In addressing both questions, we face an instance of the problem of other minds (see the entry on other minds). Even in the human case, there is room for disagreement about what exactly justifies our conviction that the people around us have conscious experiences like our own. It seems likely, though, that inference to the best explanation (also known in philosophy as “abduction”; see the entry on abduction) plays an important role. Other people constantly share their experiences verbally, engaging in rich discussions about subtle patterns of similarity and difference. They also display non-verbal markers, such as facial expressions. And there is, for the most part, a high level of congruence between the verbal reports and the non-verbal behaviors. This complex pattern of behavior is well explained by the hypothesis that the vast majority of humans have conscious experiences of broadly comparable kinds, with similar causes and effects. It is very poorly explained by the hypothesis that other people are philosophical zombies (see the entry on zombies) in the grip of a mysterious, all-encompassing mass delusion. Skepticism about consciousness in other humans is merely philosophical skepticism—no one proposes it as a serious basis for actions and policies in the real world.

By contrast, when people doubt whether fishes, octopuses or bees have conscious experiences, their skepticism is not merely philosophical. In other animals, linguistic evidence—clearly important in the human case—is absent. Although there have been attempts to teach human-like languages to members of other species, none has ever reached a level of conversational ability that would solve this problem adequately (Anderson 2004). Furthermore, except for some language-related work with parrots and dolphins, such approaches are generally limited to those animals most like ourselves, particularly the great apes. This will not help us with bees.

Because phenomenal consciousness is assumed to be private or subjective, it is sometimes said to be beyond the reach of objective scientific methods altogether (e.g., Nagel 1974). This claim might be taken in either of two ways. It is one thing to say that the Distribution Question is beyond the reach of scientific methods, and another thing to say the Phenomenological Question is out of reach. At best, the privacy of conscious experience supports a skeptical view only about the Phenomenological Question. To support a negative conclusion about the Distribution Question, one must also assume that consciousness has no explanatory connection to any behavior other than linguistic behavior. For if consciousness does explain some aspects of non-linguistic behavior, inference to the best explanation might, in principle at least, license inferences to its presence (Tye 2016; Andrews 2020).

Moreover, if particular conscious states have characteristic effects on behavior (as might be true of pain, for example), then the same strategy might be pursued to elucidate some features of the phenomenology of other animals. Admittedly, though, some aspects may remain out of reach because of our inability, as humans, to grasp what it would be like to experience them. This idea is particularly plausible when thinking about the phenomenology associated with sensory abilities we lack, such as echolocation.

Our focus in the rest of this section will be on recent attempts to gain traction on the Distribution Question.

4.2 Disagreements about the Function(s) of Consciousness

If there were agreement about the function of consciousness, that would provide a solid platform for animal consciousness research. We could test whether other animals have brain mechanisms that support the relevant function.

Unfortunately, contemporary consciousness science contains a wide range of views about the function of consciousness. To review the various hypotheses would be the work of another encyclopedia entry. To give an indicative selection, consciousness has recently been claimed to be implicated in forming subjectively justified beliefs (Lau 2022), “reducing the time scale over which preprogrammed behaviors can be altered” (Lacalli 2024); “neural credit and blame allocation” (Fitch 2022); supplying the agent with a sense of self (Marchetti 2022); acting “as a mental currency of sorts, which not only endows conscious mental states with intrinsic value but also makes it possible for conscious agents to compare vastly different experiences in a common subject-centred space” (Cleeremans and Tallon-Boudry 2022); and managing “a complex body with high degrees of freedom” (Veit 2023b).

There are recurring themes. Many find plausible the idea that consciousness is linked to valuation, decision-making, prioritization, learning, action control, formation of beliefs and intentions, or some combination of these. It plausibly sits close to the center of an animal’s mental life, doing important things. Beyond this, there is strikingly little agreement. Many of the proposals are compatible with each other, so it could be that consciousness performs most or even all of the functions speculatively credited to it. But there is no agreement about this either.

It is possible to doubt whether the question is well posed at all. Should we even be asking about the functions of consciousness in general, or should we instead expect different states of consciousness to serve different functions (Ludwig 2023; Shepherd and Bayne in press)? For example, it might be that the function of dreaming has little to do with the function of conscious wakefulness. If there is indeed variation in the function of conscious states, a way forward might be to characterize those particular states for which our grip on their function seems strongest and look for these states in other animals.

4.3 The Search for Markers and the Contested Role of Theory

Do we need a well-established theory of the nature and/or function of consciousness before we investigate whether other animals have it? If we do, the idea of a science of animal consciousness may be rather premature, given the disorienting level of disagreement about the nature and function of consciousness in the human case (see the entry on the neuroscience of consciousness).

But perhaps we do not. After all, in the early stages of the scientific investigation of any natural phenomenon, samples of the phenomenon must be tentatively identified using fallible markers (signs, symptoms) rather than complete theories. Early scientists initially identified gold by its outward characteristics (e.g. shininess, malleability) rather than by its atomic essence, knowledge of which had to await thorough investigation of many candidate examples—some of which turned out to be gold and some not. Perhaps we should study consciousness in roughly the same way we would study other natural kinds. Indeed, Tim Bayne, Nicholas Shea and collaborators have explicitly called for all consciousness science (including work on humans) to pursue an empirically-driven “natural kind approach” (Shea and Bayne 2010; Bayne et al. 2024; Shea 2012). Many animal consciousness researchers have had thoughts along similar lines (Allen 2000; Tye 2016; Andrews 2020).

The science of animal consciousness is still at a relatively early stage, where the key question is still: what are the most credible behavioral and neural markers of consciousness, and where are these markers to be found in the natural world? Identifying and studying clusters of such markers is only a first step, to be followed by investigating the underlying brain mechanisms responsible for producing those markers, leading ultimately to better, more secure theories. A marker of consciousness is unlikely to be sufficient for the presence of consciousness, any more than being shiny is sufficient for being gold. Indeed, even a large set of markers, taken together, is unlikely to be even jointly sufficient. But good markers raise the probability of consciousness being present, guiding future research to the most promising candidates and informing theory development.

Yet here we run into a problem: unlike in the case of gold, there is substantial disagreement even about the initial markers for conscious experience, at least once we set aside verbal report (Taylor 2023). People with different theoretical sympathies tend to gravitate towards very different sets of markers.

For example, people sympathetic to a global workspace theory of consciousness will take certain functional markers, especially forms of global ignition, cross-modal integration, working memory and attention, as promising markers (Dehaene 2014; Mashour et al. 2020; Shea and Heyes 2010). Meanwhile, those sympathetic to the integrated information theory will doubt the relevance of functional markers of any kind, instead emphasizing the structural markers their theory views as especially important (Albantakis et al. 2024; for details on all these theories, see the entry on the neuroscience of consciousness). This suggests that one cannot proceed in a fully theory-neutral manner. Even if one avoids explicitly committing to any particular theory, one’s preferred list of markers will betray implicit theoretical commitments.

4.4 Theory-Light Approaches

Widespread recognition of the above problem has led to the development of theory-light approaches, which do not seek to avoid theoretical commitment altogether but aim to reduce these commitments to the bare minimum necessary to organize a coherent program of empirical work (Birch 2022). The hope is that a sufficiently minimal commitment can be a “goldilocks” principle: common ground for a wide coalition of researchers, yet still contentful enough to provide a useful inclusion criterion when we draw up lists of markers.

As part of this broader trend, Jonathan Birch (one of the co-authors of the present entry) has proposed a program built around the facilitation hypothesis: the hypothesis that conscious perception of a stimulus facilitates, relative to unconscious perception, a cluster of cognitive abilities in relation to that stimulus (Birch 2022). Which cognitive abilities are the relevant ones? The evidential picture in the human case is changing rapidly, with new evidence constantly providing new information about the nature of the cognitive abilities conscious perception facilitates. The proposal is that, at any given time, the search for consciousness in non-human animals should be guided by the latest evidence from humans. The list of markers, then, requires constant revision as new evidence comes in. Yet the general idea that conscious perception stands in a facilitative relationship to a cluster of cognitive abilities is one that has steadily accumulated support across time, despite the waxing and waning fortunes of specific theories and our ever-evolving understanding of the precise nature of the facilitated abilities.

The facilitation hypothesis is one example of a minimal theoretical commitment that constrains lists of markers without overcommitting to a controversial theory. Simona Ginsburg and Eva Jablonka’s Unlimited Associative Learning (UAL) framework can be seen as another proposal in the same family, albeit less minimalist (Ginsburg and Jablonka 2007a, b, 2019). It postulates a link between consciousness and a specific package of cognitive abilities—“unlimited associative learning”—and not just a link between consciousness and a provisional, revisable cluster. Unlimited associative learning is a package of advanced associative learning abilities including: (i) the ability to learn about novel, compound stimuli (such as a new combination of a sound, a sight and an odor), (ii) the ability to forge long chains of associations in an open-ended way, (iii) the ability to learn associations between stimuli separated in time (trace conditioning), and (iv) the ability to flexibly revalue an outcome (e.g. revaluing a source of reward as a source of punishment). Naturally, to postulate that consciousness facilitates this specific set of cognitive abilities is more contentious (but also more contentful) than to postulate merely that it stands in a facilitative relationship to cognition.

Todd Feinberg and Jon Mallatt (2013, 2016, 2018, 2019, 2020) can also be situated within this broad “theory-light” trend. They propose that the search for markers be guided by two fundamental commitments:

(1) If an animal has neural pathways that carry mapped, point-by-point signals from the sensed environment, from different senses (e.g. vision, touch, hearing), and if these sensory maps converge in the brain, then that animal consciously experiences a unified, mapped, multisensory image of the environment; (2) If an animal shows complex operant learning, i.e. learning and remembering from experience to avoid harmful stimuli and to approach helpful stimuli, then that animal has the negative and positive feelings of affective consciousness. (Feinberg and Mallatt 2020, p. 7)

This is another attempt to find the common ground in contemporary consciousness science. As with the others, it seems unlikely that all theoretical camps would agree, but plausible that many would.

How do these three “theory-light” proposals (the facilitation hypothesis, UAL, and Feinberg and Mallatt’s framework) relate to each other? All three agree about the likely relevance of sophisticated forms of learning, while agreeing that the simplest forms of classical conditioning are not enough. Meanwhile, their differences help us see the trade-offs involved in trying to find common ground across diverse groups of researchers while, at the same time, trying to constrain the search for markers. The facilitation hypothesis is the “lightest” of the three, avoiding assumptions about the types of cognitive abilities that are facilitated by consciousness, instead demanding sensitivity to the rapidly changing human evidence. The other two add further theoretical commitments that constrain the list of relevant markers much more tightly—at the cost of creating a larger group of discontents.

4.5 Might the Questions Lack Determinate Answers?

In most debates about animal consciousness, it is tacitly assumed that there are determinate facts out there to uncover. That is, for a particular mental state of a particular animal (like that of a bat hunting insects through echolocation), there will be a fact of the matter as to whether there is (or is not) something it’s like to be in that state. Not everyone agrees this assumption is well founded.

One challenge comes from the thought that there might be borderline cases of phenomenal consciousness, just as there are borderline cases of being bald, tall or old (see the entry on vagueness). Perhaps some animals have only states in a gray area between “something it’s like” and “nothing it’s like”. Even the idea of a small borderline region runs up against an “intuition of sharpness” (Antony 2006, 2008): it seems counterintuitive to many that there could be indeterminacy not just in the content of a phenomenal state but in whether it is phenomenal at all (Tye 2021). Those who posit borderline cases usually grant that the idea is counterintuitive but see even more serious problems with a sharp, sudden “lights on” moment (Papineau 1993; Schwitzgebel 2023; Godfrey-Smith 2020a, b).

A bolder challenge comes from deflationary forms of materialism that imply radical indeterminacy: large classes of beings such that there is no determinate fact of the matter about whether there is, or is not, something it’s like to be them (Papineau 2002; G. Lee 2019; Carruthers 2018, 2019). One way to motivate the challenge begins from a certain picture of how the concept of phenomenal consciousness works. On this picture, we construct the concept by pointing introspectively to particular conscious experiences (e.g. the experience of a red sunset, or of the smell of rotten eggs) and deriving from these instances a concept of “that sort of state” (Carruthers 2019, pp. 156–157). For the deflationary materialist, this inward pointing is unlikely to succeed in picking out a single natural kind. It is much more likely to gesture indeterminately towards a family of kinds. When we turn to other animals, many will have some but not all of these kinds (or will have the same kinds to a lesser degree), and it will be indeterminate whether their perceptual states qualify as “that sort of state” (for responses, see Birch 2020; Black 2020).

A distinct challenge comes from “strong illusionists” who maintain (like earlier eliminative materialists; see the entry on eliminative materialism) that, even in the human case, the concept of phenomenal consciousness fails to refer to anything (Dennett 2017; Frankish 2016; Kammerer 2022). If this view is correct, then we are not phenomenally conscious and neither is any other animal. What happens to debates about animal consciousness, on this view? Dung (2022) has suggested the consequences are less revisionary than they initially seem to be. For we can still investigate the distribution of “quasi-phenomenal” properties, where a quasi-phenomenal property is one that we “typically misrepresent as phenomenal”. This seems likely to leave the debate largely unchanged, with existing theories and hypotheses about phenomenal consciousness now rebranded as theories and hypotheses about “quasi-phenomenal” consciousness.

4.6 Can Researchers Agree About Anything?

While many foundational issues for the science of animal consciousness are clearly unresolved, it would be wrong to infer that no points of wide agreement exist among researchers. In 2012, The Cambridge Declaration on Consciousness, signed by 22 neuroscientists, highlighted that “the weight of evidence indicates that humans are not unique in possessing the neurological substrates that generate consciousness. Nonhuman animals, including all mammals and birds, and many other creatures, including octopuses, also possess these neurological substrates.” In 2024, the New York Declaration on Animal Consciousness, declared “wide agreement” that there is “strong scientific support for attributions of conscious experience to other mammals and to birds” and “at least a realistic possibility of conscious experience in all vertebrates (including reptiles, amphibians, and fishes) and many invertebrates (including, at minimum, cephalopod mollusks, decapod crustaceans, and insects)”. Over 500 scientists and philosophers signed the New York Declaration in the weeks following its launch.

The claim of “strong scientific support” might be taken as implying that, at least for mammals and birds, it is time to shift from the Distribution Question to the Phenomenological Question, given that so many reasonable approaches to the topic agree that at least these animals are conscious. There has been a trend in this direction recently, with various researchers moving on from the question of whether mammals and birds are conscious at all and instead attempting to create taxonomies of specific states, forms, gradations, or dimensions of conscious experience. Kristin Andrews (2024) has even advocated shifting to the phenomenological question for all animals, not just mammals and birds, intentionally reviving the program advocated by Washburn in 1908 (see Section 3). Meanwhile, Hakwan Lau (2024) has argued that the New York Declaration exaggerates the level of support for attributing phenomenal consciousness to mammals and birds. These disagreements hinge on how we interpret specific empirical studies, some of which are discussed in the supplement.

5. Evolutionary Big Pictures

Although the science of animal consciousness has insecure, contested foundations, many authors feel the current evidence nonetheless constrains our big pictures enough to make painting them a worthwhile exercise. These pictures are inevitably somewhat speculative, but they can make contact with empirical evidence at many points. A rough distinction can be drawn between expansive big pictures, which entertain the idea of consciousness in fishes and at least some invertebrates, and narrow big pictures, which limit consciousness to just amniotes (mammals, birds, reptiles) or to an even narrower subset of animals.

For those offering expansive pictures, three lineages stand out as especially promising candidates for consciousness: the vertebrates (including amniotes, amphibians and fishes), the cephalopod mollusks, and the arthropods. These groups contain animals with large, complex, active bodies and brains capable of representing the spatial structure of the world around them (Trestman 2013a, Coombs and Trestman 2024). They display many traits suggested as plausible markers of consciousness. Feinberg and Mallatt (2016) argue in detail that precisely these three lineages satisfy their neuro-architectural and behavioral criteria. Godfrey-Smith (2016, 2020a), despite entertaining the idea of consciousness in a wider range of invertebrates, seems to agree that the evidence is strongest in these lineages, as does Veit (2023a).

What is a “complex active body”? One of the co-authors of the present article, Michael Trestman (2013a, 2018; Coombs and Trestman 2024), has proposed a collection of traits that jointly define this idea. These include: flexible, jointed appendages with multiple degrees of freedom and adaptations for high-speed locomotion or object manipulation, and true eyes and other distal senses. Trestman then proposes that control of a complex active body requires “basic cognitive embodiment”: a set of cognitive abilities that extract stable spatial information from unstable, dynamic sensorimotor information. He hypothesizes consciousness to be the evolved solution to the problems of basic cognitive embodiment. What allows consciousness to play this role? Its temporal structure: a short-term subjective past recursively constituted by a sequence of retained “moment-phases”, and a branching short-term subjective future composed of a tree-structure of predicted moment-phases (Husserl 1905/2019, 1907/1997; Trestman 2013b, 2018, 2023; Yoshimi 2016). This proposal shares Merker’s (2005) focus on the role of consciousness in real-time action control.

Meanwhile, Ginsburg and Jablonka’s (2019) “unlimited associative learning” (UAL) framework, already discussed in Section 4, has converged on the same lineages for different reasons. UAL, recall, is a package of advanced learning abilities, including the ability to learn about novel, compound stimuli, to form long, open-ended chains of associations through second-order conditioning, to learn associations across temporal gaps (trace conditioning), and to flexibly revalue stimuli and actions. Ginsburg and Jablonka argue that UAL is a “transition marker” for the evolution of phenomenal consciousness. In calling it a “transition marker”, they do not mean to imply that it could not, even in principle (or in AI), be achieved unconsciously. Rather, they mean that against the background of assumptions in play when thinking about the evolution of consciousness (e.g. that we are discussing biologically embodied animals with nervous systems), the presence of UAL, when found in an animal, is a compelling sign that it is conscious. Even this is controversial, of course (see the nine commentaries on Birch et al. 2020a). UAL is probably present, they argue, in cephalopod mollusks and arthropods as well as in vertebrates (2019, p. 238).

If any view in this general area is on the right lines, consciousness is likely to be an evolutionarily ancient adaptation of the vertebrates, the cephalopods and the arthropods, all of whom face the problems of controlling a complex active body and are plausibly capable of UAL. This leaves open the question of whether it evolved separately three times or just once, in the worm-like common ancestor of the three lineages (Godfrey-Smith 2016, 2020a).

While expansive pictures seem to be enjoying a surge in popularity, narrow pictures still have prominent defenders. LeDoux’s picture, premised on a higher-order theory of consciousness (see the entry on higher-order theories of consciousness), appears at first glance to portray consciousness as uniquely human: “Human consciousness depends on unparalleled cognitive processes that are entwined with language and culture, and is enabled by circuits with unique properties. The evolutionary past of human consciousness … is, in my view, shallow rather than deep” (LeDoux, 2019, p. 316). On closer inspection, though, LeDoux’s uniqueness claim is restricted to the most advanced form of consciousness in his taxonomy, “autonoetic” (self-knowing) consciousness. The simplest, “anoetic” form is plausibly present in other mammals (LeDoux et al. 2023). Meanwhile, Nicholas Humphrey (2022) speculatively links phenomenal consciousness to warm-bloodedness, arguing that it is probably the preserve of mammals and birds.

All these evolutionary big pictures have some value, but it is crucial that the study of animal consciousness is about more than just big pictures, given their substantially speculative nature. Focused experimental work on particular species also has an essential role. Our supplement aims to provide an entry point to the debates around some of the most important recent studies.

6. Looking to the future

The first archived version of this article, published in 1997, ended on a note of cautious optimism:

Philosophers have shown themselves rather more willing to theorize on the basis of what they thought animals could or could not do rather than on the basis of the available empirical evidence about animal behavior. The topic of animal consciousness is still taboo for many psychologists. But interdisciplinary work between philosophers and behavioral scientists is beginning to lay the groundwork for treating some questions about consciousness in a philosophically sophisticated yet empirically tractable way. (Allen 1997)

Three decades later, this “groundwork” amounts to an expansive literature and a vibrant emerging field, full of vigorous debate and attracting significant public attention. The “taboo” of the past has weakened.

Fields need stable institutions, however, and animal consciousness research at present still lacks a dedicated professional society or regular conference (comparable to, for example, the Association for the Scientific Study of Consciousness), let alone substantial dedicated funding streams. In large part, the field consists of synthesizing research done under other umbrellas (typically animal cognition, animal behavior), marshaling that evidence in service of abductive arguments for subjective experience. That work is essential, but new insights into these questions are most likely to come from sustained programs of experimental work overtly dedicated to investigating markers of consciousness.

We can only hope that the 2050 version of this article will be able to report that the old taboos have been smashed, and that animal consciousness research is a well-established and well-supported (not just “emerging”) field of interdisciplinary collaboration between science and philosophy.

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B. Other Important Works

The following works were cited in earlier versions of this entry. The list is not intended as a complete bibliography on the topic.

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Acknowledgments

Many thanks to Hannah Stockton for assistance in preparing the 2026 version of this entry. Many thanks to Ronak Shah for assistance in preparing the 2009 version.

Copyright © 2026 by
Michael Trestman <michael.a.trestman@gmail.com>
Jonathan Birch <j.birch2@lse.ac.uk>
Colin Allen <colinallen@ucsb.edu>

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