Supplement to Animal Consciousness
Evidence Concerning Animal Consciousness
A. Vertebrates
Which animals possess consciousness? When and in which lineages did consciousness evolve? There is still much disagreement on these questions. The amount of evidence potentially relevant to the distribution and phenomenological questions is vast, and we cannot possibly summarize it in an introductory encyclopedia entry. We can, however, try to provide an entry point to debates about specific animal taxa by pointing the reader to a selection of the most talked-about lines of evidence. This appendix should be read in that spirit.
A.1 Mammals
The position that at least all (healthy, adult) mammals are conscious appears to be a point of wide agreement among researchers with an interest in animal consciousness, though to speak of “consensus” would be too strong.
Nonhuman primates, usually macaques, have been used for decades as animal models of human conscious states (see Crick and Koch 1990 for some early examples). In blindsight, injury to the primary visual cortex knocks out conscious vision in a region of a human patient’s visual field (the blind field, or scotoma), and yet the patient is still able to use information presented in that region to guide action in forced-choice tasks (Ajina and Bridge 2018). The mechanisms of blindsight have been intensively studied and, in this research program, studies of human patients have always proceeded side-by-side with studies of nonhuman primate “models” of blindsight (Cowey 2010; Humphrey 2022; Stoerig and Cowey 1997; Stoerig et al. 2002). Other ways of dissociating conscious and unconscious processing of a visual stimulus (e.g. backward masking, binocular rivalry, the attentional blink) have also been developed for use in both humans and macaques (Ben-Haim et al. 2021; Chinen et al. 2023; Logothetis and Shall 1990).
Techniques for dissociating conscious and unconscious vision have never been successfully translated to other mammals such as rodents. The visual system of rodents is very different from that of primates, being specialized for detecting motion in low-light conditions (Leinonen and Tanila 2018). However, rodents have long been the model system of choice for affective neuroscience. Over several decades, Jaak Panksepp made a sustained case for the existence of seven basic emotions in mammals, supported by specialized circuits in the midbrain (Panksepp 1998, 2005, 2011). He called them “SEEKING, FEAR, RAGE, CARE, LUST, PANIC and PLAY”, using capitals to signal that these putative natural kinds might not line up with the ordinary English words.
Panksepp’s position was that these emotions “require no readout by a higher cognitive apparatus” (Panksepp 2005, p. 64) to be consciously experienced. However, one does not need to endorse Panksepp’s view to see a strong case for mammalian consciousness, because much of the relevant “higher cognitive apparatus” is present in all mammals too, including the anterior cingulate cortex and the prelimbic cortex, areas often thought to be particularly important for affect in humans (see Preuss and Wise 2022 for helpful diagrams). This is what makes wide agreement possible: although there are many views out there about the neuronal correlates of consciousness, it seems only a small minority of current views (e.g. Rolls 2004, 2020) portray those specific parts of the prefrontal cortex distinctively enlarged in primates as indispensable for conscious experience.
Heated debate persists, meanwhile, concerning specific types of conscious experience, such as conscious episodic memory and conscious mental simulation of the future. Tulving (1985, 2005) and Suddendorf and Corballis (1997, 2007) argued that only humans can imagine, remember, or anticipate themselves in situations other than the present, what they call mental time travel (MTT). However, many mammals (and, for that matter, birds and fishes, as discussed below) exhibit behaviors such as food-caching, nest-building, tool use, or migration that seems at face value to suggest foresight. For example, tayras (a members of the weasel family found in Central and South America) hide unripe sapote and plantain fruits and recover them when ripe, fine-tuning their behavior to the maturation and ripening of each fruit (Soley and Alvorado-Diaz 2011). Similar cache-and-recovery have been found from a variety of other species (Roberts 2012).
Work on rats in mazes has also led to suggestive evidence of mental time-travel. Panoz-Brown et al. (2018) demonstrated that rats can learn to reliably choose the symbol that marked the nth-to-last (e.g. 2nd to last) arm of a maze they freely explored. They argue that this implies that the rats replay the sequence of sensory impressions experienced while exploring the maze in order to recover the order in which they encountered the symbols. Meanwhile, neural recording studies show that activity in hippocampal place cells “replays” routes the rat has traveled. Moreover, the activity also traces out other possible routes revealed by exploration, including ones the rat has not traveled (Gupta et al. 2012). Tolman (1938) argued that when faced with difficult choices, rats simulate possible forward runs in order to evaluate their options. The discovery of predictive hippocampal “theta sequences” involved in goal-directed navigation apparently supports this interpretation (Wikenheiser and Redish 2015, Redish 2016).
A.2 Birds
When looking beyond the mammals, a central question concerns the indispensability (or not) for conscious experience of the neocortex, the part of the mammalian brain traditionally linked to “higher” cognitive functions. If conscious experience requires a neocortex, it must be a distinctively mammalian adaptation. But if it can also be achieved in brains without a neocortex, its distribution in the natural world may be much wider.
The view that the neocortex is not necessary is implied by midbrain-centric theories of consciousness, such as Bjorn Merker’s, which link conscious experiences to mechanisms possessed by all vertebrates, not just mammals and birds (Merker 2007). But it is also defended by many who do see a crucial role for the neocortex in mammals, since the pallium in the avian brain appears to have converged on many of the same cognitive functions (Güntürkün and Bugnyar 2016), supporting impressive feats of learning, memory and puzzle-solving (Bobrowicz, et al. 2021; Boeckle et al. 2020).
In one remarkable study, crows were trained to report a stimulus (either a blue or red square) by moving their heads in or out of a beam of light (Nieder et al. 2020). This was not just a simple conditioned response: in order to distinguish the neural basis of perception from the basis of action preparation, the researchers trained the birds to wait for a second cue, which told them how to report what they had seen previously. The birds had to hold the stimulus in short-term memory between the two cues. The researchers identified a specific brain region, the nidopallium caudolaterale, that seemed to be supporting functionality akin to a global workspace: holding the memory of the stimulus for future use and making it available to guide action.
Granting that birds do have conscious experiences of some kind, what, if anything, can be tentatively inferred about avian phenomenology? Birds are well-known for their communication, song, and vocal mimicry abilities. Other than apes, parrots are the animals most able to communicate using parts of human language (Pepperberg 1999). The complexity and nuance of bird communication systems offer clues to their experience of the world, including of each other. Suzuki (2018, 2020) showed that alarm calls evoke mental “search images” of snakes. After hearing snake-specific alarm calls, the birds search along the ground, actively investigating ambiguously snake-looking models, whereas non-snake alarm calls evoke different search behavior (oriented toward aerial predators) and do not attract attention to the model snakes. The flexible, adaptive social usage of apparently referential communication seen in birds hints at the possibility of intersubjectivity (the capacity of one individual to infer or perceive the subjectivity of another) and perhaps even collective intentionality (the ability of multiple subjects to knowingly coordinate their attention on a common object; see the entry on collective intentionality).
Moreover, many bird species have demonstrated impressive feats of “episodic-like memory”, seeming to remember distant experiences (Clayton et al. 2001; Crystal 2009; Roberts 2012). For example, if scrub jays are prevented from recovering their caches for long enough, they will recover only nonperishable items (peanuts, in the study), ignoring their caches of otherwise preferred but perishable food (Clayton et al. 2003). Eurasian jays have been shown to remember information unrelated to a previous task: the color as well as the spatial location of a cup where food is cached, suggesting they have a sensory memory of the event, not just a memory of what happened, where and when (Davies et al. 2024).
A.3 Non-avian reptiles
The animals ordinarily called “reptiles” are, from a cladistic point of view, the “non-avian reptiles” (see the entry on phylogenetic inference). The work Nieder and colleagues have pioneered in the case of birds, translating methods as directly as possible from mammalian consciousness science, has not yet been done for these other reptiles. Yet we need to be careful here: the fact that the evidence is mainly behavioral, rather than neural, does not make it irrelevant to questions of consciousness. When there is some reason to think the behavior in question is facilitated by consciousness in our own case, observing this behavior can still be probability-raising.
The idea that non-avian reptiles are primitive creatures compared to the “higher vertebrates”, mammals and birds, became entrenched in neuroscience, psychology, and society more generally with the theory of the “triune brain” (MacLean, 1985). In this picture, the “reptilian brain” is related to unthinking, reflexive survival functions, whereas the neocortex supports emotion and more flexible thought, and the prefrontal cortex supports language, symbolism and “higher thought”. However, this theory is now generally rejected.
At minimum, non-avian reptiles learn by association and show behavioral and physiological signs of emotion, including apparent anxiety at being handled (Cabanac et al. 2009). Like mammals and birds, they benefit from environmental and social enrichment (Burghardt 2013), and exhibit a variety of play – or, as cautious researchers often prefer to put it, “play-like behaviors” (Burghardt 2015, Dinets 2015). Despite traditionally being classified as solitary, many reptile species exhibit positive social affiliations to particular individuals, including conspecifics and sometimes humans (Doody et al. 2021). A number of species of lizard and snake guard their eggs, and many crocodilians are well known to exhibit extended parental care of young after hatching (Carl and Darlington 2017).
Cabanac et al. (2009) argued that all amniotes (reptiles, birds, and mammals, but not amphibians) are capable of conscious emotional experience. Their arguments rests on a theory of consciousness as involving an “an abstract private model of reality”, allowing animals to simulate possible courses of action, using affective valence (pleasure or pain) as a “common currency” to evaluate and choose between actions based on expected consequences. Why think reptiles have such a model? Cabanac et al. point to motivational trade-off behavior, play-like behavior, navigational detouring (which requires an animal to pursue a series of non-rewarding intermediate goals in order to obtain an ultimate reward), apparent expressions of emotion and sensory pleasure, emotional fever (an increase in body temperature in response to, e.g. the stress of gentle handling), and taste-aversion learning. Miller (2025) surveys evidence of pain, stress, pleasure, active sleep, open-ended associative learning, complex social cognition, and forms of self-recognition in various reptiles.
Experimental work on social learning is even suggestive of intersubjectivity, the awareness of other subjects. Gutnick et al. (2020) showed that giant tortoises could more quickly learn an operant discrimination task (to approach and bite one of two colored toys to earn a reward) if they first watched conspecifics. Gaze following and behavioral response to the perceived gaze of conspecifics and humans has been observed in tortoises (Wilkinson et al. 2010) and in lizards (Simpson and Hara 2019). Meanwhile, the recent discovery of social hunting in boas (Dinets 2017) and sea kraits (Somaweera et al 2023) raises the possibility of intersubjectivity in snakes.
A.4 Amphibians
Cabanac argued that consciousness is shared by all amniotes: the clade that includes all descendants of the common ancestor of living mammals and reptiles. Unusually, he excluded amphibians, based on negative results in experiments looking for taste-aversion learning (Paradis and Cabanac 2004) and emotional fever, plus an absence of observations of play (Cabanac et al. 2009; Cabanac and Bernieri 2000; Cabanac and Cabanac 2000; Cabanac and Cabanac 2004).
It would perhaps be fairer to say that relevant evidence specifically concerning amphibians – one way or another – is surprisingly thin on the ground. Pathways for nociception (detection of noxious stimuli), anesthesia, and the processing of nociceptive information in the brain are now well described in some frogs (Guenette, Giroux, and Vachon 2013). Amphibians can learn to avoid noxious stimuli. They benefit from environmental enrichment (Burghardt 2013) and display reliable behavioral preferences for naturalistic environments (Ramos and Ortiz-Diez 2021) and even for affiliating with specific individuals (Lamb et al. 2022).
Poison dart frogs stand out among amphibians that have been studied for both the social and spatial complexity of their parental care behavior. Most species lay eggs in tiny pools in fallen leaves. Both parents care extensively for eggs and young, traveling back and forth between a water source and the egg cache to keep it hydrated, and then eventually transfer the tadpoles to larger pools. Field experiments, as well as experiments with frogs in water mazes show that they use mental map-like spatial memory (Liu et al. 2019). Poison dart frogs, uniquely among amphibians, have also been observed engaging in play-like behavior (Burghardt 2015).
This evidence is far from conclusive, but it should shake any confidence we might have had in Cabanac’s negative claim. Since so little evidence is specific to amphibians, the strongest case for a realistic possibility of conscious experience in amphibians comes from the evidence linking consciousness to quite basic elements of the vertebrate brain plan, a case we will now discuss in relation to fishes.
A.5 Fishes
Most vertebrates are fishes. Humans are tetrapods, descendents of a single lineage of fishes that left the sea. The fishes, then, might just as well be called the “non-tetrapod vertebrates”. Among fishes our closest relatives are the lobe-finned fishes, such as coelacanths. A large majority of living fishes are teleosts (ray-finned fishes), a spectacularly diverse group including salmon, tuna, bass, minnows, catfish, cichlids, seahorses, goldfish, zebra fish and more. The ray-finned and lobe-finned fishes together form the superclass Osteichthyes, sibling to the ‘cartilaginous fishes’ (Chondrichthyes), including sharks and rays.
A self-styled group of “organized skeptics” about fish pain have persistently argued that “fish lack a cerebral cortex or its homologue and hence cannot experience pain or fear” (Key 2015, paraphrasing Rose 2002; see also Diggles et al. 2024, though there are also skeptical voices outside this group, such as Michel 2019 and Mason and Lavery 2022). In support of this, they can point to the crucial role given to the cortex by some theories of consciousness, especially higher-order theories (see the entry on higher-order theories of consciousness). Yet there are other theories that link consciousness to midbrain areas possessed by all vertebrates (e.g. Damasio and Carvalho 2013; Merker 2005, 2007; Panksepp 1998, 2005, 2011; Fabbro et al. 2015). And while the global workspace theory might initially seem to support the special role of the cortex, one key architect of the theory, Stanislas Dehaene, has written that “I would not be surprised if we discovered that all mammals, and probably many species of birds and fish, show evidence of a convergent evolution to the same sort of conscious workspace” (Dehaene 2014, p. 246). Feinberg and Mallatt (2016), and Woodruff (2017) have advanced particularly detailed arguments that fish possess their favored neuroanatomical hallmarks of consciousness.
Many experimental studies have investigated pain markers: potential signatures of felt pain as opposed to mere nociceptive reflexes. No single study by itself can be considered decisive, but defenders of the idea of fish pain argue that the pattern of markers as a whole is well-explained by conscious experiences of pain. For example, fishes become stressed and actively seek to escape painful stimuli, and subsequently remember and avoid them (Sneddon et. al 2003, Sneddon 2015; Brown 2015, 2016; Braithwaite 2010). Trout, goldfish, and zebrafish have been shown to move in distinctively protective ways, and to rub or groom affected areas after injury, and for anesthesia to reduce these effects (Sneddon 2015). Pike can learn to avoid artificial lures for up to a year after a single instance of being hooked (Beukema 1970). Fishes display optimistic or pessimistic judgment bias in exploring a maze after a surprising reward or aversive event (being briefly caught in a net) (Espigares et al. 2022), which is interpreted to indicate a mood-like affective state.
Some fishes display suggestive evidence of positive emotions, including exploratory curiosity, preferences for environmental enrichment, and social affiliation with specific individuals (reviewed in Franks et al. 2018; Franks et al 2023). Examples of play-like behavior in fishes include: “needlefishes leaping over floating sticks and even a turtle… balancing of twigs and batting of balls in mormyrid fish species, stingrays batting around balls and competing for the opportunity to do so, and cichlid fish that repeatedly strike a self-righting thermometer.” (Burghardt 2015). Franks et al. (2018) discovered ‘heightened shoaling’ in zebrafish; a form of spontaneous and apparently self-reinforcing social behavior involving closely packed, high synchrony swimming and reduced aggression, which has many of the characteristics of play. Meanwhile, cleaner wrasse fish (Kohda et al. 2023) and manta rays (Ari and D’Agostino 2016) exhibit curious, variable, exploratory behavior towards mirrors, with the cleaner wrasse evidence in particular suggesting some form of self-recognition.
The “organized skeptics” remain unconvinced by this evidence, often attacking the research in a polemical manner (Key 2016; Diggles et al. 2024). At times, proponents of the idea of fish sentience have responded equally combatively, labeling their opponents “sentience deniers” (Sneddon et al. 2018). A middle-ground view is also possible: the evidence establishes a realistic possibility of conscious experience in all adult fishes (and indeed in all adult vertebrates), providing us with sufficient grounds to err on the side of caution, without thereby providing conclusive evidence or proof (e.g. Browning and Birch 2022).
B. Invertebrates
Most animals are invertebrates. The vertebrate lineage represents just one of approximately 34 known animal phyla. The biological differences between vertebrates and invertebrates have posed daunting challenges to scientists trying to understand invertebrate animals behavior and sensory world. Recognition of consciousness in these groups has lagged far behind that of vertebrates.
B.1 Cephalopod Mollusks (Including Octopuses, Squid and Cuttlefish)
Cephalopod mollusks (for short, cephalopods) such as squids, cuttlefish and octopuses are notoriously clever and sensitive animals, remarkable for their predatory abilities, flexible learning and problem solving (e.g. Godfrey-Smith 2016, Mather 2008, 2019).
These cognitive abilities very probably make use of sophisticated internal representations. When attempting to prey on hermit crabs adorned with anemones, octopuses alternately approach from different angles and vary their tactics, apparently probing for opportunities to attack with minimal stings (Mather 2019). This exemplifies matching a means to an end based on sequential experimentation and selection of the easiest, least energetically taxing, or most successful option, which has been proposed as a hallmark of purposive, or goal-driven behavior (Tolman 1932; Trestman 2010). Many species of octopus are central-place foragers, roaming an extensive hunting ground and returning to a particular refuge. They can head directly home from the new location after being displaced by an experimenter, and also appear to remember where in their territory they have recently hunted and avoid those areas, suggesting they have cognitive maps and working memory (Mather 2019). Reef squid observed over time by Jennifer Mather (2010, 2018) adapted their responses to approaches by potentially dangerous fishes. Adult squid appeared to make fine-grained judgements of the danger posed by fishes according to species, swimming speed, and size, with speed mattering more than size for some species, and the reverse for others. Juveniles didn’t make these distinctions, so it seems squid learned from experience to improve their predictions of how fish moved.
The extent to which this evidence shifts one’s degree of belief in octopus consciousness will depend on one’s background theoretical sympathies. But anyone should be able to accept that they provide relevant evidence in so far as the capacities they target (e.g. working memory, cognitive maps, goal-driven behavior, and UAL) are credibly linked to consciousness by at least some reasonable theoretical positions.
Much of the debate around consciousness in cephalopods (as with fishes) has centered on the question of pain. Octopuses have been treated as “honorary vertebrates” by the United Kingdom’s laws on animal experimentation since 1993, with all cephalopods protected by these laws in all European Union (EU) countries since 2010. These decisions now seem prescient, since the accumulation of evidence for traditional pain markers in cephalopods has only grown since 2010. A study by Robyn Crook (2021) presented octopuses with a free choice between two chambers. After their initial preferences were noted, some received a noxious stimulus (an injection of acetic acid in their arm) and were placed in their preferred chamber to experience its effects. These octopuses developed a lasting aversion for the chamber where the effects of injury were experienced, a pattern of behavior known as conditioned place avoidance. Meanwhile, a study on cuttlefish showed wound-directed grooming (brushing their arms over the injected site) to areas injected with acetic acid. This behavior stopped when a local anesthetic, lidocaine, was applied (Kuo et al. 2022).
One can doubt, of course, whether these behaviors are explained by conscious aversive experiences. But if we see evidence of this type as sufficient for erring on the side of caution regarding fishes, as many have advocated, then the case for erring on the side of caution regarding cephalopods seems at least as strong (Birch 2024).
What about particularly sophisticated forms of consciousness, such as conscious mental time travel? Cephalopods also appear able to anticipate the future to some extent. Cuttlefish eat less crab (a less preferred food) if shrimp are predictably available at night, but not if supply is unpredictable (Billard et al 2020). After being trained that a cue indicates they’ll get a live shrimp (favorite food) after a delay, cuttlefish can learn not to take a piece of dead shrimp (a less preferred but still readily taken reward), but only if the delay isn’t too long (Schnell et al. 2021). This seems to involve not just thinking about how to satisfy present desires in the future, but to anticipate the impact of present decisions on future motivational state (i.e. if they eat the crab they’ll be too full to enjoy the shrimp).
B.2 Decapod Crustaceans
Decapod crustaceans (for short, decapods) such as crabs, lobsters, and crayfish are among the largest and longest lived arthropods. They highlight the ethical risks of neglecting animal consciousness especially vividly, because they are often boiled alive by consumers and plainly do not die instantaneously. As the novelist David Foster Wallace once put it, “it takes a lot of intellectual gymnastics and behaviorist hairsplitting not to see struggling, thrashing, and lid-clattering as… pain-behavior” (Wallace 2004). Crump et al. (2022) reviewed neurological and behavioral evidence for pain in decapods and described the evidence for experienced pain as “substantial” in most major lineages, and “strong” in the true crabs (infraorder Brachyura).
Hermit crabs, and their behavior towards the gastropod shells they typically inhabit, have served as a model system for experiments exploring decapod cognition (Elwood 2019, 2022). The crabs need shells that offer protection from predators, but they must not be too heavy or awkwardly shaped to inhibit movement. Accordingly, crabs make quite fine-grained distinctions between different gastropod shells, and they can compare these to novel artificial “shells” such as bottle caps and lightbulb casings (Jagiello et al. 2024). They must find new shells as they grow, and are constantly under threat of being evicted by competitors, so their cognition has been under intense evolutionary pressure for evaluating shell quality. Moreover, conflicts over shells are a major feature of hermit crab life. During conflicts, crabs appear to make comparative judgements about the quality of their own shell in relation to others and about their fighting ability in comparison with their opponents. They also appear to be able to consider information about the size and shape of their body when predicting their ability to pass through a gap, hinting at a sophisticated form of bodily-spatial self-awareness (Elwood 2022).
Most relevantly for questions of pain, when experimentally given a small shock inside a shell, crabs will sometimes abandon the shell. Moreover, their willingness to abandon it appears to depend on its quality (Elwood and Appel 2009). Moreover, crabs that smelled the scent of a predator were less likely to abandon it, indicating the crabs could consider and balance, in anticipatory fashion, the risk of another shock against other risks (Elwood and Magee 2016). Even crabs that did not immediately abandon the shells in which they were shocked later showed an increased willingness to switch shells, suggesting they remembered the shock as aversive.
Many decapods are social. Spiny lobsters, for example, engage in unique single-file mass migrations (Herrnkind et al 1973) and exhibit tightly coordinated antipredator behavior (Lavalli and Herrnkind 2009). The eusocial shrimps of genus Synalpheus show coordinated colony defense and behavioral differentiation similar to that of social insects (Duffy, Morrison, and McDonald 2002). Crayfish, stomatopods (mantis-shrimp) and hermit crabs seem capable of recognizing other individuals and recalling previous interactions such as fights and mating events (Aquiloni and Tricarico 2015). Some crayfish are known to exhibit parenting behavior and kin recognition (Aquiloni and Gherardi 2008). Although these lines of evidence say little about consciousness by themselves, they challenge any hasty assumption that decapods, if conscious, must have very simple inner lives.
Wallace complained in 2004 that seafood vendors often distribute pseudoscientific misinformation about decapods. Twenty years after his article, one can still find industry websites falsely claiming, for example, that “neither insects nor lobsters have brains”. Live boiling is still widely practiced in the United States and elsewhere, but has been banned in New Zealand, Switzerland, Norway, and the UK. This is a paradigm case of how research into animal consciousness can and should prompt reflection about the ethics of how we treat animals (see the entry on the moral status of animals).
B.3 Insects
Insects are incredibly numerous and diverse. Does every fly, bee and ant have its own subjective experience of the world? Researchers have long disagreed about the likelihood of consciousness in insects. The view of insects as “reflex machines” has been challenged since the early twentieth century (Buttel-Reepen 1917). Yet this view still has its defenders. Allen-Hermanson (2008) argued that honeybees and other insects are “natural zombies”, their appearance of consciousness being a collection of well-adapted reflexes. Hunt (2007, p 187) decried the attribution of “teleology” and “motivation” to insects as “the greatest impediment to progress and understanding” in understanding their behavior.
On the other side of the debate, Tye (1997) argued decades ago that there is “ample evidence” that “honey bees … are phenomenally conscious: there is something it is like for them… Honey bees make decisions about how to behave in response to how things look, taste, and smell. They use the information their senses give them to identify things, to find their way around, to survive. They learn what to do in many cases as the situation demands. Their behavior is sometimes flexible and goal-driven.” His book Tense Bees and Shell-Shocked Crabs includes an argument that bees have a global workspace (Tye 2016). Meanwhile, Barron and Klein have argued that the central complex in the insect brain is analogous to the vertebrate midbrain, and thereby satisfies the conditions of Merker’s midbrain-centric theory of consciousness (Barron and Klein 2016; Klein and Barron 2016). And Chittka has argued, provocatively, that “if we apply the same behavioral and cognitive criteria as we do to much larger-brained vertebrates, then bees qualify as conscious agents with no less certainty than dogs or cats” (Chittka 2022, p. 208).
Domesticated European honeybees (and, especially in Chittka’s work, bumblebees) have long been model organisms for insect cognition. Studies on honeybees have revealed evidence of pattern recognition, concepts of “same” and “different”, navigation, communication, visual working memory, mood and cognitive bias and numerosity (Chittka 2022). Their long-term, flexible “landscape memory”, established during orientation flights and subsequently refined throughout their foraging career, allows them to return home after far-ranging flights or after displacements, and allows them to take a short-cut between a familiar foraging location and one indicated by another bee via a waggle-dance (Menzel and Greggers 2015).
The complexity of the honeybee’s waggle dance is still being unraveled. One may be tempted to say: the waggle dance is pure instinct, not evidence of conscious processing. But the evidence continues to surprise. If a bee observes a dance indicating a location where they have been attacked by predators or by other bees, they often respond with a distinctive “stop signal” that inhibits performance of and recruitment to the dance (Nieh 2010). Further, the signal appears to encode information about degree of threat: the stop signals of bees who have encountered a highly dangerous predator are more powerful than those of bees who have met with a lesser threat (Dong et al. 2019). This hints at the possibility of an episodic memory of the encounter with the predator.
Meanwhile, bumblebees alter their foraging behavior after being attacked by predators, either avoiding a location or flower-type associated with the attack, or approaching more cautiously (Chittka, 2017; Wang et al. 2018). They can learn from demonstrators to perform artificial tasks neither they nor their ancestors will have encountered in the wild, such as pulling a string to bring a reward into reach, or rolling a ball into a target area (Chittka 2017, 2022; Alem et al. 2016, Loukola et al. 2017). They make slower, more accurate decisions when they must integrate information about risk (e.g. of a simulated predator attack) with learned expectations about relative reward. However, when it becomes more difficult to distinguish between safe-high-reward and dangerous feeders, they switch to safe-low-reward feeders to avoid making the risky, time-consuming judgment (Ings et al. 2008; Wang et al. 2018). This suggests an ability to choose between cognitive strategies (i.e. to make vs avoid a difficult judgment), as well as showing that bees spend longer on difficult or higher-stakes judgments.
Beyond the bees, Polistes wasps have been shown capable of individual facial recognition, and transitive inference relating to social dominance fighting ability (Tibbetts 2019). Termites learn to avoid noxious smells in a Y-maze (Ding and Li 2024). Carabid beetles of several different species learned over time to adjust their behavior when interacting with dangerous ants in artificial environments, depending on whether the ants were high or low aggression and whether they were tethered and unable to pursue the beetle (Reznikova and Dorosheva 2013).
A growing appreciation of insect minds has led to renewed interest in the question of whether they might experience pain. A traditional view is that insects will continue to feed and mate despite catastrophic injury and that this shows they feel no pain (Bastin 1927). However, even if we grant the claim about feeding and mating behavior (which appears to rest on anecdotal evidence rather than systematic study) for at least some insects, the inference to the absence of pain is very questionable, especially given the apparent sensitivity of many insects to noxious heat. A recent study showed that when a heat probe touches a bee’s antenna, the bee will tend to the antenna by grooming it for several minutes (Gibbons et al. 2024). Another showed that bees are more likely to choose lower-quality rewards over higher-quality rewards when accessing the better reward requires standing on a heat pad (Gibbons et al. 2022a). Indeed, insects of six different orders have been found to display at least some traditional pain markers, to varying degrees, although many evidence gaps remain (Gibbons et al. 2022b).
B.4 Arachnids
Let us turn to spiders and other arachnids, such as scorpions, pseudoscorpions, whip-spiders, solifuges and vinegaroons. An evolutionary big picture that links consciousness to the challenges of managing a complex, active body (see “Evolutionary Big Pictures” in the main entry) predicts that all arthropods are probably conscious, including arachnids, since they clearly have such bodies. However, there is a relative paucity of studies in spiders directly probing the question.
Although nociceptors have not been described in arachnids, they use a variety of escape, defensive, and wound-tending behaviors in response to noxious stimuli such as heat, shock, and toxins such as acetylcholine and bradykinin. They also display signs of an arousal and stress modulation system (Kralj-Fišer and Matjaž 2019). When encountering ants for the first time, spiderlings first approach and then stalk ants as prey, before switching to anti-predator behavior upon encountering dangerous resistance. They subsequently avoid ants, suggesting that they reclassified ants based on their aversive experience (Edwards and Jackson 1994).
Evolutionarily, arachnids have diversified into a wide array of body plans based on novel configurations of weaponry and sensors. The opposed, crab-like lateral claws of scorpions, pseudoscorpions, whip-spiders and vinegaroons are familiar to many of us, as is the scorpions’ unique forward facing tail. Less familiar, perhaps, are the specialized antenniform (i.e. antenna-like) legs of whip-spiders and vinegaroons, which arguably constitute a distinct sense modality (Eberhard 2019).
Diverse arachnids show impressive abilities to guide behavior with integrated spatial representations. Jumping spiders appear to plan out routes to their prey, taking detours to avoid hazards, leading to a long-running debate about how they do this (Cross et al. 2020; Jackson and Wilcox 1993; Wilcox and Jackson 1998). They are also able to circle around to the back of their prey and remain motionless when an enemy is facing them, suggesting a form of gaze-tracking. Diverse arachnids exhibit central-place foraging (Ortega-Escobar et al 2023), a lifestyle requiring an advanced toolkit of navigational abilities. Web-building spiders appear to hold representations of prey and of their webs in memory. Rodriguez et al. (2011) found that when spiders search for experimentally pilfered prey, their memory of the prey influences the searching behavior; spiders searched longer for larger lost prey items, and continued searching until the lost prey was found despite finding other distracting items. The authors took this to show that the search behavior was guided by a mental representation of the target, based on the memory of when the prey was cached.
In a striking study, Sergi (2022) examined the behavior of black widow spiders when they were placed back into a web the spider had created but not occupied in a week, with a cricket already in the web. The aim was to test whether a mismatch between the spider’s expectation of the web’s layout and the reality could compete for its attention with the prey item. In the control group, the previously occupied web had the same spatial structure as the one the spider had been in since. In this group, no spiders searched, and almost all approached the cricket directly. In the experimental conditions, the spatial layout of the two chambers, and hence webs, differed either slightly or greatly. Roughly half of these spiders engaged in a distinctive searching behavior, walking about the web and probing it for a time before proceeding to devour the cricket. Sergi interpreted these to show that these spiders were distracted from the cricket by the mismatch between expectation and actuality, proposing this (controversially, of course) as a marker of subjective experience.
As with decapods and insects, some may assume that, if arachnids are conscious at all, their inner lives must be extremely simple. Yet this is a prejudice with no basis in the evidence – and indeed, there is evidence at least suggestive of complex forms of experience. Many species of arachnid have complex social lives and even many those classified as “solitary”, such as jumping spiders, display elaborate courtship rituals (Muralidharan and Hill 2022). When observed in birds, similar rituals are sometimes interpreted as indicating a capacity for aesthetic judgement on the part of the female (Prum 2017). Amblypygids (whip spiders), uropygids (vinegaroons), and schizomida (short-tailed whip scorpions) are all known to exhibit extended parental care, including guarding and carrying of eggs and young (Rayor and Taylor 2006). Amblypygids, large arachnids with pronounced mushroom bodies (Sinakevitch, Long and Gronenberg 2021), show sibling-sibling and mother-offspring affiliative behavior, with offspring orienting toward the mother, who will “sit in the middle of a group of her offspring and stroke their bodies with her whips”. In response to an experimental disturbance (the cage being lightly rattled), sibling interactions ceased and the young hid under their mother (Rayor and Taylor 2006).
For discussion of what all this evidence means, and what big pictures it might be pointing towards, we refer the reader back to the main entry!