1. The actual pair in Adams 1970 is If Oswald hadn’t shot Kennedy, Kennedy would be alive today and If Oswald didn’t shoot Kennedy, Kennedy is alive today. Adams only claims that the former is justified while the latter is unjustified. Adams did not claim the former is true while the latter is false, as he denied conditionals could be true or false in the first place. See section 6.2 and the entries on indicative conditionals and the logic of conditionals.

2. These labels are used to distinguish two broad functional categories of verbal mood across languages that indicates different commitments toward the reality of the event described (Palmer 1986: §1.1.2). Indicative indicates the clause is being committed to, while the subjunctive is noncommittal (it often includes imperatives, optatives, interrogatives). Some languages have a widely used subjunctive mood, but do not employ it in the relevant conditionals (Palmer 1986; Iatridou 2000). Many linguists working on non-Indo-European languages use the labels “realis” and “irrealis” in a related but different way (Palmer 1986: §§6-7). Stone (1997: 8) suggests the terminology remote vs. vivid modality. von Fintel and Iatridou (2023) prefer the term “X-marking”, since subjunctive marking is also found in other constructions, such as wish reports and ought claims. Some theorists argue the indicative-subjunctive is more of a spectrum than a binary distinction (Comrie 1986).

3. This formulation of safety must be revised if we assume strong centering (section 5.1). For this reason, the most common formulation of safety does not appeal directly to counterfactuals, but does invoke ideas from the variably strict analysis of counterfactuals discussed in section 5: S’s belief that P is safe iff P is true at all nearby worlds where S believes that P.

4. See Kant (1781: A533/B560–A558-B586) and Smilansky (2000) for something like this pragmatic view, and Pereboom (2014: 176–178) for criticisms of it.

5. Both notations have an important limitation: they combine the modal would and if…then… into a single connective. This makes it difficult to adequately represent certain subjunctive conditionals, e.g., If Maya had run for Senator, she either would have been elected or she might have run again in the next election. Because of this, some theorists advocate for semantic treatments of if and were/would as separate devices (Kratzer 2012; Starr 2014a; Khoo 2022).

6. Goodman thought the problem was especially acute for laws, as he saw no obvious way to specify which generalizations count as laws except that they support counterfactuals. However, this characterization of laws is controversial. See the entry on laws of nature.

7. A further problem is that two facts can be individually cotenable with the antecedent but not collectively: e.g., The room is dark and The room is dark only if I did not strike the match are each true and compatible with the antecedent, but collectively they are incompatible with the antecedent.

8. Quine (1950: Ch.3) drew a different conclusion: he thought examples like (10) simply cast doubt on the very idea of developing a systematic analysis of counterfactuals. Most scholars do not embrace Quine’s skepticism, though see section 7.1 for a recent revival of Quinean skepticism.

9. Downward-monotonicity is also known as antitonicity or anti-monotonicity (not to be confused with non-monotonicity). Only the antecedents of counterfactuals appear to behave non-monotonically: the consequents of counterfactuals are (upward)-monotonic. So, strictly speaking, we should say counterfactuals are “not downward-monotonic in their antecedents”. That’s a mouthful. We’ll just say counterfactuals are “non-monotonic” to mean their antecedents are not downward-monotonic.

10. The auxiliary assumptions needed to prove these are mutually equivalent are as follows:

• Identity: \(\vDash {{A}} \mathbin{>} {{A}}\)
• Entailment: if \({{B}}_1,\dots,{{B}}_n \vDash {{C}}\), then \({{A}} \mathbin{>} {{B}}_1, \dots, {{A}} \mathbin{>} {{B}}_n \vDash {{A}} \mathbin{>} {{C}}\)
• Replacement of Equivalent Antecedents (REA): if \(\vDash {{A}} \equiv {{B}}\), then \(\vDash ({{A}} \mathbin{>} {{C}}) \equiv ({{B}} \mathbin{>} {{C}})\)
• Necessity Condition: \(\neg{{C}} \mathbin{>} \bot \vDash {{A}} \mathbin{>} {{C}}\)
• Limited Transitivity: \({{A}} \mathbin{>} {{B}}, ({{A}} \wedge {{B}}) \mathbin{>} {{C}} \vDash {{A}} \mathbin{>} {{C}}\)

We leave it as an exercise to the reader to show the counterfactual fallacies are equivalent given these assumptions. Hint: First show that SDA is equivalent to Antecedent Strengthening (use REA; see also section A.4 of Debates over Counterfactual Principles). Then show that Antecedent Strengthening implies Transitivity (use Limited Transitivity) and Contraposition (use Necessity Condition). Finally, show that Transitivity implies SDA and that Contraposition implies SDA.

11. Peirce (1896: 33) attributes this view to Philo the Logician, a member of the early Hellenistic Dialectical School. However, Bobzien and Duncombe (2023: §3.1) presents Philo as a material implication theorist. For these historical issues see Sanford 1989: Ch.2; Zeman 1997; Copeland 2002.

12. For accessible introductions to modal logic, see Priest 2008, van Benthem 2010, Sider 2010, and the entry on modal logic. For more advanced treatments, see Chellas 1980, Hughes and Cresswell 1996, and Blackburn, de Rijke, and Venema 2001.

13. Note that any has another “free choice” use that is licensed outside of downward-monotonic environments. For example, one can say You may choose any flavor of ice cream, even though may is not downward-monotonic.

14. This statement of the ordering semantics assumes world-orderings are total. But it can be generalized to drop this assumption:

Ordering Semantics (not assuming totality)
\({{A}} \mathbin{>} {{C}}\) is true iff for every accessible \({{A}}\)-world \(w\), there is an \(({{A}} \wedge {{C}})\)-world \(v\) such that:

1. \(v\) is at least as close (to the actual world) as \(w\), and
2. no \(({{A}} \wedge \neg{{C}})\)-world is at least as close as \(v\).

This generalized semantics, without totality, is effectively equivalent to the premise semantics discussed in section 6.1.

15. Note that the limit assumption always holds in models where there is only finitely many worlds. Thus, the simplified formulation can always be used in place of the general formulation for finite cases. One only has to pay attention to the difference between them in infinite cases.

16. Transitivity fails because \({{B}} \mathbin{>} {{A}}\) and \({{A}} \mathbin{>} {{C}}\) are true but \({{B}} \mathbin{>} {{C}}\) is false. Contraposition fails because \({{A}} \mathbin{>} \neg{{B}}\) is true while \({{B}} \mathbin{>} \neg{{A}}\) is false. SDA fails because \(({{A}} \vee {{B}}) \mathbin{>} {{C}}\) is true while \({{B}} \mathbin{>} {{C}}\) is false.

17. Note that the chanciness of this example is not essential. Sanford (1989: 173) gives the following example to illustrate this point: If we had bought one more artichoke this morning, we would have had one for everyone at dinner tonight.

18. Francis Fairbairn (p.c.) points out that the counterexamples proposed by Kment (2006) and Wasserman (2006) assume that Lewis’s second constraint requires maximizing not just the continuous spatio-temporal region of exact match before a small miracle, but match over subsequent regions discontinuous with the initial one too. It is somewhat difficult to see how that interpretation of Lewis’s second constraint would adequately address the original future similarity objection.

19. David Lewis (1973b: 65) refers to this as a “metalinguistic” theory of counterfactuals, though this is a misnomer: “premises” need not be understood as sentences but can instead be more “worldly” items such as propositions or facts.

20. Hájek (2025: 23) suggests context might supply a relevant reference time. Leitgeb (2012a: 67) suggests counterfactuals might contain a parameter for a reference time in their logical form. Kocurek (2022) effectively builds the relevant shift into the update operation on chance statements.

21. One can already see with this example how structural equation models can significantly reduce the number of values that must be stored. The corresponding joint probability distribution over 8 variables requires storing \(2^8=256\) probability values—one for each consistent conjunction of literals with these variables—while this Bayesian network would require only 18—one conditional probability for each consistent conjunction of literals with parent variables, and one for each of the two independent variables. See Sloman (2005: Ch.4) and Pearl (2009: Ch.1) for details.

22. By “ordinary”, Hájek simply means the counterfactuals one often hears in typical conversations. Usually, these are bare counterfactuals of the form \({{A}} \mathbin{>} {{C}}\). By “most”, Hájek acknowledges that there may be exceptions, e.g., counterfactuals where the antecedent necessarily implies the consequent or where the consequent is probabilistically qualified, but he says these “are typically extraordinary—rarified, recondite, recherché counterfactuals that philosophers may occasionally traffic in, but not normal people” (37–38).

23. What follows is a presentation of Hájek’s most well-known argument, viz., the argument from chance. Hájek also presents other arguments for counterfactual skepticism, which, for reasons of space, we cannot cover in full depth. That said, one of the arguments, viz., from the underspecificity of antecedents, relies on two controversial principles (SDA and REA) that collectively lead to Antecedent Strengthening, which we discuss in section A.4 in the supplement Debates over Counterfactual Principles. See Loewenstein 2021a,b and Schwarz 2025 for further discussion of this argument.

24. Kocurek (2022) observes that Hájek’s argument employs principles that are subtly inconsistent with very modest auxiliary principles. Similarly, Boylan (2024) notes a parallel argument can be given for skepticism about the future, suggesting the argument overreaches. But these “counterarguments” do not yet say where, if anywhere, Hájek’s argument goes wrong, though both Kocurek and Boylan provide positive diagnoses along these lines.

25. While examples like (31) are standardly taken to be counterpossibles, not everyone agrees these “counteridenticals” are counterpossibles. See Ninan 2012; Deigan 2017; Kauf 2018; Kocurek 2018.

26. While Kocurek and Jerzak spend most of the paper defending this view only for counterlogicals (counterfactuals with logically impossible antecedents), they suggest their arguments extend to all counterpossibles (695–698). Subsequent research has suggested it is possible to simulate as much hyperintensionality as other impossible worlds approaches using this strategy (Kocurek 2021, 2024a,b).

27. Some authors distinguish counterlogicals, like If it were both raining and not raining…, whose antecedent is an explicit contradiction, from countermetalogicals, such as If the law of excluded middle had failed…, whose antecedent states a metalogical falsehood about, say, which logic is correct or which laws of logic hold. For ease of exposition, we’ll use the label counterlogical for both kinds here.

28. Notable exceptions are typically classical languages, such as ancient Greek (J. Greenburg 1986: 249), classical Chinese (Harbsmeier 1981; Fung 2020), and classical Arabic (Ferguson et al. 1986: 6). Some languages use other grammatical devices besides tense to mark the subjunctive. For example, Russian marks subjunctives by combining если (if) with a particle бы (by). Comrie (1986: 93) observes that Ngiyambaa marks counterfactuals with a clitic -ma in antecedent and consequent (he also observes there is no word for if; the antecedent is distinguished by the fact that it obligatorily precedes the consequent (p. 84)). Similarly, Bittner (2011) discusses Kalaallisut, which lacks tense and thus counterfactuals bear no morphological affinity with past; instead, counterfactuals are marked with a suffix -galuar in the antecedent and consequent.

29. Conversely, Khoo (2022) argues indicatives can have a metaphysical reading. Mackay (2023) provides a helpful overview of which distinctions do, and do not, align with the indicative-subjunctive divide.