Dai Zhen

First published Fri May 2, 2025

Dai Zhen 戴震 (1724–1777), also known by his courtesy name Dai Dongyuan 戴東原, was a highly accomplished scholar of the Qianlong-Jiaqing era of the Qing dynasty. His expertise encompassed a wide range of fields, including philology, phonology, mathematics, astronomy, ancient institutions, geography, chorography, and philosophy. Although his contributions to other disciplines were recognized during his lifetime, his philosophy was not widely acknowledged. Despite this, his ideas significantly influenced philosophically-minded interpreters of the Confucian Analects and the Mencius, notably Jiao Xun 焦循 (1763–1820), who frequently referenced Dai’s works in his influential book, Mengzi Zhengyi 孟子正義 (The Correct Meaning of the Mencius). In the early twentieth century, prominent intellectuals such as Zhang Taiyan 章太炎 (1869–1936), Liu Shipei 劉師培 (1884–1919), Liang Qichao 梁啟超 (1873–1929), and Hu Shi 胡適 (1891–1962) revived interest in Dai’s ideas. Since then, Dai has been widely regarded as the premier ethical, psychological, and metaphysical thinker of the mid-Qing dynasty.

Dai argued that some of his influential predecessors in the Confucian tradition of the Song (960–1279) and Ming (1368–1644) dynasties, such as Zhu Xi, had in fact misunderstood the metaphysics of dao 道 (the Way) and its constituent patterns (li 理) and accordingly failed to grasp the ethical status of mundane psychological states such as wants and feelings. These errors led in turn to a misguided understanding of moral epistemology and of the process of personal ethical cultivation. For Dai, dao does not lie in abstract, transcendent patterns that can be realized by an appropriately clear, unsullied mind. Instead, pattern (li) and dao are inherent in concrete objects and everyday life, to be found in everyday activities such as “eating and drinking”. They are simply the appropriate order or pattern of organization of the concrete, everyday world, which can be discovered through detailed investigation based on evidence. Since patterns (li) are inherent in everyday life, it was an error for some Song and Ming thinkers to treat sensory desires as an obstacle to understanding and moral development. Desires or wants are an integral part of our psychology, and our shared ordinary feelings can actually be used as a guide to identifying patterns. Drawing on his encyclopedic philological knowledge of early Chinese texts, Dai employed meticulous exegesis of classical sources to argue that many of his predecessors’ purported errors stemmed from a faulty understanding of the classics. In many cases, in Dai’s view, their interpretations reflected a Daoist or Buddhist outlook, rather than what he regarded as a genuinely Confucian stance.

1. Life and Writings

Dai came from a poor family in Xiuning 休寧 county, Anhui 安徽 province. Because of his family’s financial constraints, Dai did not have the opportunity to study under renowned scholars during his youth. Although he attended a private school, his teacher could not provide satisfactory answers to his questions about the meaning of the terms in the classical texts. Instead, his teacher gave him dictionaries and encouraged him to continue his studies independently. Finding these dictionaries inadequate, Dai borrowed a set of the Shisanjing Zhushu 十三經注疏 (Commentaries on the Thirteen Classics) from a friend. According to Dai’s own account, at the age of 17 (by traditional Chinese reckoning, or in 1739), he developed his lifelong ambition to understand the dao (the right way or path of life) of the ancient sages and devised a methodology he pursued throughout his life: the chief means of understanding the dao is through comprehending ancient texts, he held, and to comprehend the texts thoroughly, it is necessary to understand the import of the terms in them. Such an understanding is in turn impossible without knowledge of classical institutions, terminology, and tools. Dai states:

經之至者道也，所以明道者其詞也，所以成詞者字也。由字以通其詞，由詞以通其道，必有漸。（〈與是仲明論學書〉）

What the classics are getting at is the dao; they explain the dao through their phrases; they form phrases through words. If we seek to comprehend the phrases through the words and the dao through the phrases, we will surely make progress. (DZQS 6, 368)[1]

In a letter to his student Duan Yucai 段玉裁 (1735–1815), Dai explained his ambition as a scholar:

僕自十七歲時，有志聞道，謂非求之六經、孔、孟不得，非從事於字義、制度、名物，無由以通其語言。（〈與段茂堂等十一札〉）

Since the age of seventeen, I have aspired to learn the dao, contending that it cannot be attained without seeking it in the Six Classics, Confucius, and Mencius and that without researching the import of words, the structure of institutions, and the terminology for various things there is no way to comprehend the language [of these texts]. (DZQS 6, 531)

Dai thus established his methodology for understanding the dao of the ancient sages before the age of 20 (or in 1742), when he met Jiang Yong 江永 (1681–1762), a renowned scholar specializing in the Three Ritual Classics and an expert in calendrical studies, mathematics, and phonology, who later became his teacher (Cai 2006: 3–27). Before turning 30 (in 1752), Dai completed several original works in philology, mathematics, phonology, and classical commentary. The most notable of these were Kaogongjitu 考工記圖 (Illustrated Research on Artisans’ Records) and his initial emendations of the Shujingzhu 水經注 (Commentaries on the Water Classic). In the former, he created precise diagrams of the ancient tools discussed in the Kaogongji 考工記 (Research on Artisans’ Records) of the Zhouli 周禮 (The Rites of Zhou). Later archaeological discoveries confirmed the accuracy of some of Dai’s illustrations. During Dai’s lifetime, an ancient bell was discovered that matched an illustration in his work (DZQS 7, 187). In his work on the Water Classic, Dai attempted to distinguish the canonical text of the Shuijing from its commentaries (zhu 注). Because the two had been intermingled in transmission, the text of the Water Classic had become incomprehensible. Dai’s initial emendations provided new insights into reading the text. When he arrived at the capital in 1754, these early achievements earned him attention and recognition among renowned scholar-officials, such as Ji Yun 紀昀 (1724–1805), Qian Daxin 錢大昕 (1728–1804), and Zhu Yun 朱筠 (1729–1781) (DZQS 7, 144–8).

Dai Zhen began writing Yuan Shan 原善, a philosophical work in three essays, in 1753 and continued revising it for over 10 years. He later expressed to Duan Yucai that he was thrilled upon completing the first essay (DZQS 7, 153). This excitement was at odds with the academic climate of the time, which deprecated philosophical inquiry in favor of studies based on evidence and facts, such as philology, phonology, geography, astronomy, mathematics, and history. These fields were highly valued and heavily researched in the Qing dynasty, as part of a movement known as “evidential learning” or “learning based on examination of evidence” (kaozhengxue 考證學). By contrast, philosophy was considered too speculative, partly as a result of the perceived excesses of Song- and Ming-dynasty thought. In response to criticism that his Yuan Shan essays were “empty talk”, Dai expanded them into a book by adding citations from the classics and classical commentaries to support his interpretations. Despite this effort, he felt frustrated by the negative reception and chose not to publish the book, even when it was completed in 1766 (DZQS 6, 7). Instead, he circulated it among a select few acquaintances, possibly including Zhang Xuecheng 章學誠 (1738–1801), an up-and-coming young scholar who visited him that year. According to Zhang, he was shocked and intimidated by Dai’s claims about his contemporaries’ methodologically incompetent understanding of classical texts. Zhang was among the few who were sympathetic to and influenced by Dai’s philosophical thought. As was the case with Dai’s work, Zhang’s philosophy, particularly his approach to the philosophy of history, was not fully appreciated until the early twentieth century (see Yu 1996 and 2016).

Dai passed the provincial civil service examination in 1762 at the age of 40, finally qualifying him to take the metropolitan examination held every three years in the capital. From 1763 to 1775, he failed the metropolitan examination five consecutive times. Nevertheless, his reputation as a leading evidential scholar and his friendships with prominent scholar-officials earned him a position as an editor in the Sikuguan 四庫館 (“Office of the Four Storehouses”), established in 1772 to fulfill the Qianlong Emperor’s decree to compile a comprehensive library of all valuable publications. Despite failing in the metropolitan exam for the fifth time in 1775, his contributions at the Sikuguan, especially his emendation of the Commentaries on the Water Classic, led the emperor to award him a shujishi 庶吉士 degree independently of the examination results. (The shujishi was a three-year trainee position in the Hanlin Imperial Academy, which was a prerequisite for central government service.) Unfortunately, Dai’s health soon declined, partly due to overwork at the Sikuguan, and because of medical malpractice he died unexpectedly in 1777 at the age of 55.

Before his unexpected death, Dai completed what he considered his greatest work, the philosophical masterpiece Mengzi Ziyi Shuzheng 孟子字義疏證 (Evidential Commentary on the Meaning of Terms in the Mencius). He spent over a decade revising this book, possibly starting around 1765 or 1766, when he feigned illness to take leave and draft the first version. Various early drafts were circulated among his friends and associates, resulting in many different versions. For instance, Dai’s Xuyan 緒言 (Prologue) is believed to be one of the early drafts of the Evidential Commentary. Dai’s dedication to revising this work stemmed from a writing principle he adopted from Fang Muru 方楘如: “Being good at composing is not as good as being good at revising, and being good at revising is not as good as being good at deleting” (DZQS 7, 204). The Evidential Commentary was meant to be part of an ambitious project Dai was unable to finish, to be called Qijing Xiaoji 七經小記 (Remarks on the Seven Classics). The “seven classics” referred to the Odes (Shi 詩), Documents (Shu 書), Rites (Li 禮), Changes (Yi 易), Annals (Chunqiu 春秋), Analects, and Mencius, which Dai believed jointly conveyed the dao. The Remarks was to be divided into five parts, approaching the seven classics from five perspectives, namely

  • Xugupian 訓詁篇 (containing works in philology and phonology),
  • Yuanxiangpian 原象篇 (mathematics and astronomy),
  • Xuelipian 學禮篇 (rituals and institutions),
  • Shuidipian 水地篇 (geography and chorography), and
  • Yuanshanpian 原善篇 (philosophy, construed primarily as ethics and metaethics).

All of Dai’s works can be categorized into these five areas. For example, his Illustrated Research on Artisans’ Records fits under the Xuelipian, his Commentaries on the Water Classic belong under Shuidipian, and his Evidential Commentary on the Meaning of Terms of the Mencius falls under Yuanshanpian. The relationship between these five areas can be inferred from Dai’s methodology, by which evidential learning is the means to discover the dao. Research in the first four areas serves as the foundation for work in the fifth (philosophy).[2]

2. “The Six Classics Convey the dao”

“The Six Classics convey the dao (Liujing zaidao 六經載道)” is a thesis accepted by all Confucians, although different thinkers interpret it differently (for convenience, we’ll refer to this as the “Conveyance Thesis”). (The Six Classics are the Classic of Change, the Documents, the Odes, the Rites, the Music, and the Annals.) Dai’s understanding of this thesis is reflected in his lifelong methodology. As shown in the letter to Duan Yucai quoted above, his stance is that study of the Six Classics is a necessary prerequisite for grasping the dao. In the letter, Dai ranks the Analects of Confucius and the Mencius on the same level as the Six Classics in importance (the importance of these two books is also reflected in the name of his Remarks on the Seven Classics). We will return to this point below. First, let’s explore the Conveyance Thesis. Dai writes:

宋儒譏訓詁之學，輕語言文字，是欲渡江而棄舟楫，欲登高而無階梯也。

Song dynasty scholars ridiculed the study of philology, dismissing the importance of language and written characters. This is akin to wanting to cross a river without using a boat and paddle or to climbing a height without using a ladder. (DZQS 6, 531)

Dai’s interpretation of the Conveyance Thesis is that studying the Six Classics is a necessary means for understanding the dao, because any purported account of the dao must be shown to conform to the content of the Six Classics. He repeatedly criticizes earlier thinkers for their failure to conform to “the Six Classics, Confucius, and Mencius” (see, for example, DZQS 6, 167, 168, 176, and 203). The opposing view would be that studying the Six Classics is not necessary. This opposing view does not necessarily reject a weaker version of the Conveyance Thesis, as there could be more than one way to discover the dao. For example, perhaps someone might argue for a self-discovery view, according to which the dao can be discovered directly from within one’s own heart-mind. (The Ming thinker Wang Yangming’s position is probably a version of a self-discovery view.) However, a self-discovery view faces the challenge of establishing that the dao discovered from the heart-mind is indeed the same as the dao of the Six Classics. For Dai, the Six Classics have the last word in this matter.

As Dai sees it, the primary issue here is epistemological. Scholars can claim to grasp the Confucian sages’ dao, but this claim needs verification. The Conveyance Thesis entails that the Six Classics are authoritative in verifying whether one’s understanding of the sages’ dao is correct. It is important to ask how thoroughly one must understand the Six Classics to establish the claim that the dao one grasps is the same as the sages’. For example, the Cheng brothers—two influential Song-dynasty thinkers—famously claim:

學者當以論語孟子為本。論語孟子既治，則六經可不治而明矣。（《四書章句集注》〈讀論語孟子法〉）

Scholars should take the Analects and Mencius as their foundation. Once the Analects and Mencius are well-studied, then the Six Classics can be understood clearly without further study. (Zhu SZJ: 44)

The Cheng brothers do not deny the Conveyance Thesis, but in its application, Dai is far more demanding than they are. For Dai, a complete understanding of each character in the Six Classics is necessary to grasp the dao. One might object that philology alone cannot settle interpretive issues. Even when we understand the meanings of the terms, multiple interpretations of a text may remain possible. Dai would likely accept this point. He needs to insist only that all philosophical interpretations must be consistent with some plausible philological interpretation.

This verification problem was already recognized in the Confucian tradition prior to the rise of Qing “evidential scholarship”. Yu Yingshih has influentially argued that Qing scholarship is a continuation of the demand for a “return to the source” arising from unresolved metaphysical disputes between the Cheng-Zhu and Lu-Wang schools in the Song and Ming dynasties. This demand dates back to the sixteenth century, when Luo Qinshun 羅欽順 (1465–1547) insisted that philosophy must be grounded in the Classics (Yu 1996: 21, 91). Wang Yangming 王陽明 (1472–1529) also appealed to the old text of the Great Learning (Daxue guben 大學古本) to defend his interpretation of the dao. The paradigm of Qing scholarship was established by Gu Yanwu 顧炎武 (1613–1682), who asserted that “the proper study of patterns (li 理) is the study of the classics” (jingxue ji lixue 經學即理學) (Yu 2016: 91, 114–6). Gu believed that understanding the Classics required knowledge of phonology. More broadly speaking, the dao could be known only through evidential learning, which comprises phonology, geography, astronomy, and so on. According to Gu, scholars aim to bring order to the world, which requires understanding the dao. This understanding is impossible without classical research (Qian 2011: 146). By the eighteenth century, scholars were so focused on evidential learning that they neglected philosophy.

A widespread concern with the verification problem helps to explain this shift in focus. The key lies in the object to be verified. For instance, the Rites of Zhou contains details about the rites established by the sages, such as the materials, size, and color used in mourning dress, which can be determined through evidential learning and empirical evidence. In contrast, although it too must be based on a correct understanding of the terms in the texts, the correct interpretation of the philosophy of the sages cannot be entirely settled by empirical evidence. This was why Qing scholars regarded evidential learning as solid learning (shixue 實學) and viewed philosophy as “empty” or “insubstantial” (xu 虛). These scholars applied a different interpretation of the Conveyance Thesis from Dai. For Dai, the dao of the sages lies in the philosophy underlying the creation of institutions; evidential learning is thus a necessary but not sufficient means to discovering the dao. In contrast, his contemporaries viewed the dao as immanent in the institutions, and thus evidential learning was both a necessary and sufficient means of discovering the dao.

This implicit difference in how Dai interprets the dao results in his distinct methodology and his dissatisfaction with the academic climate of his day. For Dai’s contemporaries, the dao is the institutions the sages established to govern the world. For Dai, the dao is the philosophy or guiding principles the sages applied in creating these institutions. However, we may question the scope of the understanding of the Classics that Dai demands. For example, to understand the sages’ guiding principles, a deep understanding of classical mathematics and astronomy may be unnecessary. It is unclear to what extent Dai’s philosophy is informed by his evidential learning. The literature to date has not yet provided a satisfactory answer.

To return to a point raised at the beginning of this section, since Dai’s goal is to understand the sages’ philosophy or principles, it makes sense that in his interpretive project he assigns the Analects and the Mencius, two relatively philosophical works, the same importance as the Six Classics. However, we can still ask why he chose the Mencius rather than the Xunzi as a foundational text for interpreting the sages’ dao. Dai believed that Mencius’s moral psychology was more plausible than Xunzi’s, but this alone does not fully justify the choice. A possible answer is this: While the Conveyance Thesis can rule out some interpretations of the dao—such as those of Daoism and Buddhism—it does not leave us with a single interpretation. Among interpretations that align with the Six Classics, Dai’s approach is to select the one he considers philosophically most plausible, which is that he finds in the Mencius. Hence he includes the Mencius rather than the Xunzi as a foundational text. To exclude the Xunzi solely because it contradicts the Mencius would be a case of obviously circular reasoning.

3. Metaphysics

3.1 Dao 道

In explaining the idea of dao 道 (the right ethical and social way of life), Dai distinguishes between the dao of Tian 天道 and the dao of humanity 人道. The dao of Tian—in effect, the path of the natural world—refers to the continuous flow and transformation of qi 氣 (dynamic “vital stuff”), leading to the endless creation and alteration of all things.

道，猶行也；氣化流行，生生不息，是故謂之道。《孟子字義疏證》

Dao is akin to a process or journey; it is the continuous flow and transformation of qi, the unending cycle of life. Thus it is called the dao. (Sz 16)[3]

Tian (“Heaven”, “Nature”) is an all-encompassing concept, roughly analogous to “the world” or “nature”, which includes living and non-living things. The birth of living things, including humans, is explained by the flow of qi, understood through the workings of yin 陰 and yang 陽 and the five phases, similar to how all objects are formed. Different endowments of qi lead to the varying natures (xing 性) of different living beings.

《大戴禮記》曰：「分於道謂之命，形於一謂之性。」言分於陰陽五行以有人物，而人物各限於所分以成其性。陰陽五行，道之實體也；血氣心知，性之實體也。有實體，故可分；惟分也，故不齊。古人言性惟本於天道如是。

The Dadailiji says, “The allotment from the dao is fate (ming 命), and formation into one thing is nature (xing 性)”. This refers to how people and creatures are divided out of the yin and yang and the five phases, and each person or creature has its nature formed on the basis of what has been allotted to it. Yin and yang and the five phases are the substance of the dao; the blood-and-qi and the understanding heart-mind are the substance of nature (xing). Because they have substance, they can be divided [in various ways]; and because they are divided [in various ways], they are not equal. This is why the ancients said that nature is based on the dao of Tian. (Sz 16)

Indeed, the everyday life of humans is a part of the dao of Tian.

出於身者，無非道也…道者，居處、飲食、言動，自身而周於身之所親，無不該焉也…

None of what issues from one’s person fails to be dao… Dwelling, eating and drinking, speaking and moving, our person and everything we see around us—all of this is appropriately regarded as dao… (Sz 33)

From this perspective, since humans are part of Tian, the dao of humanity is part of the dao of Tian.

Nevertheless, Dai sees a significant difference between the dao of humanity and the dao of inanimate objects and of living things that lack awareness (jingshuang 精爽), such as plants. Humans and other animals that possess awareness can act against what they should do, or what is “imperative” (biran 必然) for them.

一事之善，則一事合於天；成性雖殊而其善也則一，善，其必然也；性，其自然也；歸於必然，適完其自然，此之謂自然之極致，天地人物之道於是乎盡。在天道不分言，而在人物分言之始明。

When one thing is good, that thing conforms to Tian; although the nature (xing) of things may vary, their goodness is one and the same. Goodness is what is imperative (biran); nature (xing) is what is self-so (ziran). To return to what is imperative is to bring the self-so (ziran) to completion. This is called the ultimate fulfillment of what is self-so (ziran). In this way, the dao of Tian and earth, humanity and other animals, is completely fulfilled. Regarding the dao of Tian, we do not speak of this distinction [between the self-so and the imperative], but regarding humanity and other animals only by speaking of this distinction can we be clear. (Sz 32)

Dai uses the example of terrestrial animals dying in water and aquatic animals dying on land to illustrate the possibility and consequences of animals violating what is imperative for them (Sz 32). For humans, he cites northern people who cannot endure southern heat and southern people who cannot endure northern cold as examples of such transgression. Humans and other animals may fail to fulfill their dao if they do not adhere to what is imperative. In contrast, inanimate objects cannot violate what is imperative, so for them there is no distinction between the self-so and the imperative.

In different contexts, the dao of humanity functions as both a descriptive and normative notion. It refers to the actual daily lives of humans, but also to the patterns (li 理) they must follow to avoid harm. Similarly, in different contexts, the dao of Tian plays both descriptive and normative roles, depicting both what actually occurs and the ideal path by which everything flourishes (shengsheng 生生, the “thriving of generativity” or “flourishing of life”). (See Angle, forthcoming, for further discussion concerning the normativity of the dao of humanity and the dao of Tian.)

3.2 Li 理

Dai employs the idea of li 理 (orderly pattern or patterns) to explain what is imperative for humans and other animals. As Dai interprets them, some of his Song-dynasty Confucian predecessors held a dualist view, on which pattern (li), an immaterial, abstract organizing structure or grain, joins together with material qi 氣 (“dynamic stuff”) to form concrete objects and phenomena. (To what extent Dai is correct to attribute this view to thinkers such as Zhu Xi is a matter of scholarly controversy.) Against any such dualist view, Dai argues that patterns (li) are not entities existing separately from qi. Instead, they are the typical or normal grain, format, or regularities by which things are organized and behave. Dai says:

[孟子]舉理，以見心能區分….分之，各有其不易之則，名曰「理」。

[Mencius] raises the concept of li 理 to show that the mind is capable of making distinctions…. Through differentiation, each aspect has its own unchanging norms (ze), which are called “pattern” (li). (Sz 4)

以秉持為經常曰則，以各如其區分曰理，以實之於言行曰懿德。

To uphold something as regular is called a “norm” (ze); to treat each according to its differentiation is called “pattern” (li); to embody it in words and conduct is called “fine virtue” (yide). (Sz 3)

Patterns (li 理) are norms (ze 則) appropriately followed by an agent when conforming to them fulfills the inherent ends of that agent’s activity. For instance, any living creature is engaged in the activity of living, for which survival is a fundamental end and a necessary component of well-being. For terrestrial animals, living on land is pattern (li), because for them living on land contributes to their inherent end of survival. Accordingly, this pattern is also the basis for the norm (ze) that terrestrial creatures must live on land. Since patterns (li) are the causal regularities and relations by which such ends can be fulfilled, they do not have an ontological status separate from the activity of pursuing the ends. They simply describe the distinctions, regularities, and so forth that best align with these ends. Living on land allows terrestrial animals to survive. Living in water would cause them to die, and so it is pattern (li) for them to live on land. Since pattern in this example is simply a behavior regularity that facilitates certain creatures’ well-being, it is not an “entity” that exists independently of concrete creatures and their behavior.

Dai understands the dao of humanity—and thus the good human life—at least partly in terms of the fulfillment of people’s feelings (qing 情) and wants (yu 欲). Accordingly, he sees the fulfillment of feelings and wants as constituting pattern (li).

人倫日用，聖人以通天下之情，遂天下之欲，權之而分理不爽，是謂理。

As to human relations and daily activity, the sages apply their comprehension of all the world’s feelings to fulfill all the world’s wants; weighing these such that there are no errors in the differentiating patterns—this is called “pattern” (li). (Sz 40)

This relation to pattern explains the normative function of Confucian norms of conduct, or “ritual propriety” (li 禮). Dai claims that the sages’ rituals (li 禮) exemplify pattern (li 理) because they successfully promote human well-being by managing people’s feelings (Sz 37).

禮之設所以治天下之情，或裁其過，或勉其不及，俾知天地之中而已矣。

Rituals are established to regulate the feelings of the world, either by curbing excesses or by exhorting them where they fall short, simply so that people understand the fitting mean in the world. (Sz 37)

Another normative notion, virtue (de 德), is also integrated into this cluster of interrelated concepts. A virtuous person is one who follows dao and thus conforms to pattern (li) such that not only their own but others’ wants and feelings are fulfilled.

道德之盛，使人之欲無不遂，人之情無不達，斯已矣。

The flourishing of dao and virtue is simply for none of people’s wants to go unsatisfied and none of their feelings to go unfulfilled. (Sz 30)

The highest form of virtue thus lies in living according to norms that facilitate fulfillment for all persons. The sages in particular demonstrated the utmost virtue by not only living a morally exemplary life but establishing and promulgating norms of propriety that helped lead others to live virtuous lives.

4. Moral Psychology: People’s Nature

Dai’s novel, complex views about human moral psychology underwrite his account of pattern (li), his rejection of the dualism of pattern and qi (dynamic stuff), his explanation of normativity, his view of moral development, and his account of moral deliberation. This section sketches his systematic moral psychology.

Dai understands people to have a physical body, within which there are the “blood-and-qi” (xueqi 血氣) and the “understanding heart-mind” (xinzhi 心知). The blood-and-qi and the heart-mind are both part of the “actualized object” or the “materialization” of our nature (xing 性) (Sz 16). The blood-and-qi are fluid- or vapor-like substances that circulate throughout the body. The understanding (zhi 知) is the heart-mind’s capacity for awareness and cognition. Although the blood-and-qi function similarly in all healthy persons, the clarity and accuracy of people’s awareness and understanding vary. Depending on experience, education, attention, and habit, some perceive only a limited range of patterns, while others—such as the sages—achieve the highest level of understanding, consistently discerning the underlying patterns (Sz 6).

The blood-and-qi produce yu 欲, or “bodily wants” (Sz 8, 30). Yu is often interpreted as “desire”, but for Dai it has a narrower scope. You can have a desire to be a doctor or a desire that your favorite team win the football game, but to Dai these attitudes are not “yu.” In his psychology, yu refers only to craving (ai 愛) or avoiding (wei 畏) sounds, colours, smells, and tastes and to cherishing life and fearing death (huaisheng weisi 懷生畏死, Sz 21, 30). Dai’s use of yu is thus closer to “basic wants” than to “desires”. Since such wants issue from the blood-and-qi, not the heart-mind’s understanding, they are roughly the same for all persons. (For further discussion, see Tiwald 2010a.)

The blood-and-qi also produce qing 情, or “feelings”. These are noncognitive responses of joy, anger, sorrow, and delight (xi lu ai le 喜怒哀樂), leading to misery or comfort (can shu 慘舒) (Sz 30). Craving ice cream because you are hungry is a “want” (yu); feeling delighted when you get the ice cream is a feeling (qing)—a comfortable or pleasant one, and so it is a “like” (hao 好), rather than a “dislike” (wu 惡). Like the basic wants, feelings do not require understanding and so are largely the same for everyone. By contrast, the emotions of alarm and sympathy Mencius says we have on seeing a child in danger are not “feelings”, according to Dai.

孟子舉惻隱、羞惡、辭讓、是非之心謂之心，不謂之情。

Mencius mentioned the hearts [mental attitudes] of compassion, shame-and-loathing, respect, and approval-or-disapproval and called them “heart-mind” (xin), not “feelings” (qing). (Sz 30)

These “mental attitudes” require understanding and so depend on the functioning of the heart-mind (xin 心). We might interpret them as inclinations, concerns, or states of mind.

The understanding of the heart-mind (xinzhi 心知) provides the capacity for perception and cognition, for aesthetic and normative judgment (mei chou shi fei 美醜是非) and accordingly for admiring “pattern and right” (liyi 理義) (Sz 7, 8). Moral attitudes such as sympathy, shame-and-loathing, respect, and approval-or-disapproval have a cognitive component, which arises from the understanding (Sz 21). This cognitive component involves seeing an analogy between one’s own wants and feelings and those of others, which triggers the moral attitude. The result, according to Dai, is that if we had no wants and feelings ourselves, we would be unable to have moral reactions such as sympathy to the situation of other people.

So, to feel the sympathetic concern associated with benevolence (ren 仁), we need to have wants (primarily, cherishing life and fearing death), which prompt us to have feelings such as delight in life and sorrow over death. To these states produced by our blood-and-qi, we apply our cognitive capacities—the understanding—to grasp the importance of life to us and, by analogy, to everyone.

孟子言「今人乍見孺子將入井，皆有怵惕惻隱之心」，然則所謂惻隱、所謂仁者，非心知之外別「如有物焉藏於心」也，己知懷生而畏死，故怵惕於孺子之危，惻隱於孺子之死。

Mencius said, “If people were to suddenly see a child about to fall into a well, they would all have a heart-mind of alarm and compassion”. That being so, what’s called “compassion” or “benevolence” is not some distinct thing concealed in the heart-mind, apart from the understanding. We ourselves understand [what it is] to cherish life and fear death, and so we are alarmed at the danger to the child and compassionate about the child’s [risk of] death. (Sz 21)

Hence, Dai holds, ethical norms and values are grounded partly in the wants of the blood-and-qi, which the heart-mind’s understanding recognizes and applies to evaluate and guide action. Norms and values do not come from some “outside”, transcendent source such as Tian or abstract, cosmic pattern.

古賢聖所謂仁義禮智，不求於所謂欲之外，不離乎血氣心知。

What the ancient worthies and sages called “benevolence”, “right”, “propriety”, and “wisdom” they did not seek outside of what they called “wants” and was not separate from the blood-and-qi and the heart-mind’s understanding. (Sz 21)

In Dai’s view, what he takes to be the prevailing Song- and Ming-dynasty Neo-Confucian view of moral cultivation as purifying oneself of everyday wants or desires and mundane, worldly human feelings is not only mistaken but incoherent. (Again, it is controversial whether his interpretation of his predecessors’ views is fair.) Without wants and feelings, we would lose our capacity for moral agency, because we would be unable to refer to our own wants and feelings as a benchmark by which to understand the well-being of other people.

Beyond merely being able to recognize others’ well-being, Dai thinks, the heart-mind’s understanding is constituted such that conforming to ethical norms is inherently pleasing to us. He makes this point by developing the claim in Mengzi 6A:7 that people share a tendency to be pleased by “pattern and right” just as we (purportedly) share a tendency to find the same foods delicious. Dai claims that this tendency is “self-so” for the understanding—that is, it arises from the inherent functioning of the heart-mind, without external influence.

欲者，血氣之自然；其好是懿德也，心知之自然。…心知之自然，未有不悅理義者。未能盡得理合義耳。

[To have] wants [is something that comes] self-so (ziran) for the blood-and-qi; to be fond of fine virtue [is something that comes] self-so for the understanding heart-mind…. What is self-so for the understanding heart-mind is such that there’s never been anyone who fails to be pleased by pattern and right; it’s just that [some people] cannot fully grasp pattern and comply with right. (Sz 15)

So Dai claims that insofar as we apply the heart-mind’s understanding correctly, we have an inherent disposition to follow pattern and do what is right because doing so is pleasing or satisfying.

Dai stresses that moral feelings such as the pleasure of conforming to appropriate norms have a physiological basis. The heart-mind is not a mysterious, abstract capacity but a physical organ composed of qi 氣 that is integral to moral deliberation and conduct. Dai asserts that the qi (here roughly the energy or spirit) of the heart-mind (xinqi 心氣) becomes strong and self-possessed (changran zide 暢然自得) when we follow patterns and norms that we believe to be correct. In contrast, acting against these norms causes the heart-mind’s qi to become depressed and frustrated (Sz 8). This gloomy state is an uncomfortable psycho-physiological condition that prompts us to avoid certain actions, whether immediately or in the future.

Despite how features of our motivational structure align with moral norms, Dai thinks, people do not always act morally. He identifies two main causes of moral failure: selfishness and blinkering.

人之患，有私有蔽；私出於情欲，蔽出於心知。

The problems with people lie in selfishness (si 私) and blinkering (bi 蔽); selfishness arises from feelings and wants, while blinkering arises from the heart-mind’s understanding. (Sz 40)

Selfishness refers to people’s drive to fulfill their feelings and wants, which can override their motivation to follow moral norms. Blinkering refers to an inability to grasp the correct patterns. The motivational structure Dai describes ensures that people are motivated to act according to what they judge to be the correct patterns, but their judgment can be mistaken. To avoid blinkering, Dai emphasizes the importance of learning, particularly from the teachings of the sages. To avoid selfishness, he believes that cultivating reverence (jing 敬) is essential, as it allows us to combat misguided wants and feelings (Sz 12). Applying a metaphor familiar from classical Confucianism, Dai views the heart-mind as analogous to a ruler that commands the other parts of the person. It is capable of judging what aligns with pattern and right (liyi 理義), overcoming the influence of wants and feelings, and so rectifying our actions (Sz 8). However, the primary focus of his discussion is on understanding, and thus blinkering, and he provides few details on how to cultivate reverence or to rectify our actions.

5. Normativity

One of Dai’s signature doctrines is the convergence of the self-so (ziran 自然) and the imperative (biran 必然). This convergence has both metaethical and practical dimensions. On the metaethical side, from facts about what is self-so, or comes naturally for things, we can discover what is imperative, or norms of conduct, which constitute normative patterns (li 理) or dao. On the practical side, Dai holds that conduct that conforms to the imperative fulfills what is self-so for the heart-mind. This fulfillment is manifested through a sense of peace and the absence of regret, presumably corresponding to how the heart-mind is pleased by pattern and right. Dai highlights the connection between the self-so and the imperative in a key passage:

由血氣之自然，而審察之以知其必然，是之謂理義；自然之與必然，非二事也。就其自然，明之盡而無幾微之失焉，是其必然也。如是而後無憾，如是而後安，是乃自然之極則。若任其自然而流於失，轉喪其自然，而非自然也；故歸於必然，適完其自然。

If we examine what comes self-so (ziran) for the blood-and-qi in order to discover what is imperative (biran) for it, [the result] is what we call “pattern and right”. The self-so and the imperative are not two separate matters. With respect to the self-so, to fully understand it such that there isn’t the slightest error—this reveals what is imperative (biran). If, attaining this, we are at peace, without regrets, then this is the ultimate norm for what is self-so [for moral agents]. If we indulge the self-so [our unregulated wants and feelings] and so drift into error, then the result is not that we attain the self-so but that we lose it. Thus by turning toward what is imperative (biran) for things, we bring what is self-so (ziran) to completion. (Sz 15)

Dai suggests that by thoroughly understanding the inherent propensities of things—what is self-so for them—we can identify the conditions in which they best fulfill, or “complete”, these propensities, attaining a state of well-being. These conditions can be taken to determine norms, which he calls the “imperative” (biran). The role of peace and regret here relates to our earlier discussion (section 4) about the qi of the heart-mind being strong and self-possessed when we follow what we take to be moral norms and frustrated when we fail to do so. What is self-so for the heart-mind, which draws us toward moral norms, is manifested partly in the natural movement of qi within one’s body. Therefore, by following what is self-so for the heart-mind, according to Dai, we can also fulfill what is imperative for humanity. Dai asserts that this convergence between the self-so and the imperative is the ultimate fulfillment for human agents.

歸於必然，適完其自然，此之謂自然之極致，天地人物之道於是乎盡。

By turning toward what is imperative (biran), one brings what is self-so (ziran) to completion. This is called the ultimate fulfillment of what is self-so (ziran). In this way, the dao of Heaven and Earth, of humanity and animals, is completely fulfilled. (Sz 32)

Why should one follow the qi of the heart-mind, which leads to moral actions when one has correct moral knowledge, rather than the blood-and-qi, which leads to selfish actions? Both sources of motivation are equally self-so for the human person, yet Dai’s conception of the “ultimate fulfillment” of the self-so seems to assign priority to the heart-mind’s qi. For Dai, the answer is that this prioritization is actually what is self-so for humanity. Of course, Dai holds that acting morally also entails fulfilling our blood-and-qi—our physical needs—and thus satisfying our basic wants and feelings (for further discussion, see section 7). But satisfying our basic wants and feelings does not mean simply indulging our physical wants. For in Dai’s framework, only by prioritizing the self-so of the heart-mind can we attain “completion” in the sense that both the blood-and-qi and the heart-mind are fulfilled. In contrast, indulging what is self-so for the blood-and-qi alone would leave the heart-mind unfulfilled. Arguably, this joint fulfillment of both parts of the person follows from Dai’s wider stance that the flourishing of all living things (shengsheng 生生) is a foundational value. The reasoning would be that the flourishing of living things naturally includes human flourishing, and human flourishing requires the fulfillment of both parts of the person. For both parts of the person to attain fulfillment, we must prioritize fulfillment of the heart-mind—and thus conformity to moral norms—over unrestrained indulgence of the blood-and-qi. (For more discussion, see Chong forthcoming.)

The ties between the concepts of the self-so and the imperative, along with the dual descriptive and normative roles Dai assigns to the concepts of pattern (li 理) and dao (道), can be taken to raise a version of the is-ought question. On the one hand, Dai treats patterns (li) as descriptive regularities that have no separate ontological status from qi, the dynamic, material stuff of which the world is constituted. Given the Confucian theoretical framework, there is no particular conceptual difficulty in claiming that regularities of behavior are part of the ontological realm of qi. However, Dai also takes self-so patterns (li) to underwrite his conception of the imperative (biran). How does he explain the link between descriptive pattern—or “is”—and imperative norms—or “ought”? Why should we follow the patterns (li)? Dai’s answer is that adhering to the patterns tends to fulfill people’s feelings and wants and the heart-mind’s inclination toward morality. However, even if we can confirm empirically that some pattern of behavior indeed has this outcome, we can still ask why we should seek to fulfill people’s feelings and wants or their heart-mind’s inclination. One possible answer, again, is that doing so is part of the flourishing of all life, which, like many Confucians, Dai posits as a foundational value (see Tiwald forthcoming-b). A second, overlapping answer may be that we already have a commitment to following the dao, and conforming to the patterns amounts to the best justified way of practicing the human dao that fulfills what is self-so for us (see Fraser forthcoming).

6. Moral Epistemology

6.1 Sympathetic Consideration

How do we identify pattern and thus the norms we should follow? How do we determine what course of conduct to take? Dai’s proposal is that the norms to follow are discovered through a process of measuring others’ feelings by reference to our own. The fundamental procedure by which to assess our activity is by identifying pattern—and thus norms—through the use of the sympathetic consideration (shu 恕) associated with the “negative golden rule” of the Confucian Analects. Dai contends that we should guide action by patterns we identify through a process of reflection and deliberation.

凡有所施於人，反躬而靜思之：「人以此施於我，能受之乎?」凡有所責於人，反躬而靜思之：「人以此責於我，能盡之乎?」以我絜之人，則理明。

Any time you undertake something that affects others, reflect and calmly consider: “If others did this to me, could I accept it?” Any time you hold others responsible for something, reflect and calmly consider, “If others held me responsible for this, could I fulfill the responsibility?” If we use ourselves [as a benchmark] to measure [whether things are suitable] for others, pattern (li) becomes clear. (Sz 2)

In conducting this reflection, the indicator of whether we could or could not accept the treatment we are considering is our “feelings” (qing 情), specifically, according to Dai’s moral psychology, the misery or comfort we feel in response to the joy, anger, sorrow, or delight incited by our interactions with things. Again, this role of feelings is why Dai thinks many Song- and Ming-dynasty Confucians were terribly mistaken to hold that ethical cultivation requires minimizing or eliminating wants (or desires) and feelings. Only because we have wants do we have feelings, and feelings are the basic data we work from to discover pattern. Without these wants, the mechanism for sympathetic concern cannot function (see Tiwald 2010a).

反躬者，以人之逞其欲，思身受之之情也。

Reflection is a matter of considering what feelings we would have if others were to indulge their wants and we were on the receiving end. (Sz 2)

以情絜情而無爽失，於行事誠得其理矣。

Using our feelings to measure others’ feelings without error, in conducting affairs we can indeed attain their patterns. (Sz 3)

Patterns are indicated by whether a proposed path of conduct can promote mutual satisfaction of wants and feelings. Dai’s idea of measuring others’ feelings with our own is not a matter of using ourself as a model for our treatment of others. Rather, he is attempting to use shared feelings and wants as a way of identifying what objectively tends to fulfill everyone’s wants and feelings. As we saw in section 4, in Dai’s moral psychology, wants and feelings are largely the same for all. For this reason, Dai holds, our own feelings can accurately indicate others’. Hence by hypothetically reflecting on the feelings a particular situation would induce in us, we can “measure” the feelings that others would have in the same or a similar situation. In principle, if we conduct this measurement process correctly, Dai thinks, the results will not be biased toward ourselves or others.

天理云者，言乎自然之分理也；自然之分理，以我之情絜人之情，而無不得其平是也。

Heavenly pattern refers to the distinguishing patterns of what is self-so. As to the distinguishing patterns of what is self-so, if we take our feelings to measure others’ feelings, such that nothing is out of balance, they are just this. (Sz 2)

不偏，則其情必和易而平恕也。

If one is not biased, then their feelings will surely be harmonious and gentle, balanced and sympathetic. (Sz 30)

When our feelings accurately indicate others’, they reflect pattern (li 理), or the correct norms. If we are “balanced and sympathetic”, we measure others’ feelings accurately, and so we can identify pattern, which is instantiated by conduct that satisfies the feelings of all sides. If we are not “balanced and sympathetic”, we may mistakenly prefer norms that are beneficial to ourselves at others’ expense, and these norms fail to conform to the proper patterns.

6.2 Common Affirmability

Dai’s aim is to offer a procedure for discovering “norms that cannot be exchanged” for anything more suitable, which are the objective content of pattern. One condition for such norms is that all persons would affirm them.

心之所同然始謂之理，謂之義…凡一人以為然，天下萬世皆曰「是不可易也」，此之謂同然。

Only what all minds similarly affirm to be so can be called “pattern” or “right”.…When each person affirms something and a myriad generations in the world all say, “this cannot be exchanged [for anything else]”, this is called “similarly affirming to be so”. (Sz 4)

Presumably, the “all” in question is hypothetical, as Dai is not suggesting the impossible task of actually surveying “a myriad generations” of people. On a “democratic” reading (see Tiwald forthcoming-a), common affirmability is a regulative ideal complementary to sympathetic consideration, as discussed in section 6.1. On this interpretation, Dai is implying that we should inquire as to whether judgments derived from sympathetic consideration are indeed what people, especially the powerless, would affirm. Through this procedure, potentially overconfident decision makers may avoid mistaken judgments about people’s shared feelings and wants.

An alternative reading is that common affirmability implies empirical verifiability. This line of interpretation builds on Dai’s remarks drawing analogies between proper pattern and craft tools. Just as the compass and set square are invariably reliable standards for identifying what is circular or square, a correct grasp of pattern (li) yields reliable norms of conduct.

苟得其理矣，如直者之中懸，平者之中水，圓者之中規，方者之中矩，然後推諸天下萬世而準。

If one attains the correct pattern, just as the vertical matches the plumb line, the level matches the water-level, the circular matches the compass, and the square matches the set square, the pattern is a standard that can be applied to a myriad generations in the world. (Sz 13)

By extension, then, if candidate norms indeed conform to the correct patterns (li), this conformity can be affirmed by anyone, just as anyone can use a compass to affirm whether a figure is a circle. For norms, the test would be whether they indeed facilitate the fulfillment of people’s feelings and wants (Chong forthcoming). As this relation is a matter of empirical fact, everyone—that is, “all minds”—can examine the result and affirm whether the norms indeed conform to the proper patterns. In contrast, if the verification mechanism were subjective, such as simply checking against one’s own level of confidence in the results of sympathetic consideration, it is unlikely that common affirmability could be achieved.

7. Normative Ethics

A notable aspect of Dai’s normative ethics is his recognition of human wants and feelings as legitimate considerations in moral reasoning. The main difference between Dai and Song-Ming Confucians lies in the conceptual priority of these wants and feelings. The influential Song-dynasty thinker Zhu Xi might agree with Dai, for example, that fulfilling certain human wants or desires, such as hunger and thirst, is morally permissible, but the two assign such wants or desires different places in the structure of their normative ethics (Tiwald forthcoming-b). For Zhu, desires, including wants, are justified only if fulfilling them complies with moral norms established on other grounds. For Dai, in contrast, wants and feelings are the grounds for the content of moral norms: fulfilling basic wants and feelings is constitutive of proper pattern (li).

Although Dai’s normative ethics takes the satisfaction of people’s wants and feelings as a basic value, unlike act utilitarianism, Dai does not evaluate discrete actions on the basis of whether they fulfill or promote this end. Instead, more like an indirect utilitarian, he understands various Confucian moral ideals such as virtue (de 德) and ritual propriety (li 禮) as fundamentally explained in terms of how they fulfill people’s wants and feelings. For example, he sees benevolence (ren 仁) as a virtue by which one contributes to the flourishing of all.

仁者，生生之德也；「民之質矣，日用飲食」，無非人道所以生生者。一人遂其生，推之而與天下共遂其生，仁也。

Benevolence (ren) is the virtue of sustaining flourishing lives (shengsheng). “People’s material character lies in their daily activities, eating, and drinking” means nothing other than that the dao of humanity is how life flourishes. When one person fulfills their own life and then extends this so as to join with all the world in fulfilling their lives together, that is benevolence. (Sz 36)

Given the connections Dai draws between moral norms and virtues and well-being, understood as the satisfaction of wants and feelings, some scholars have suggested that his normative ethics bears a strong similarity to indirect utilitarianism (see Hu 1963; Zheng 2015; Carleo forthcoming). Others have argued that Dai does not see moral virtue as determined purely by how much it maximizes well-being and so his stance is not appropriately characterized as utilitarian (Tiwald forthcoming-b). Insofar as Dai may be applying the concept of self-so patterns (li) as a foundational evaluative concept, his ethics may be structurally unlike any form of consequentialism (Fraser forthcoming). How best to characterize Dai’s normative ethical stance remains a disputed question.

A further, interrelated set of questions concern Dai’s foundational values. First, while the collective flourishing of all life (shengsheng 生生) is undoubtedly a value for him, it is unclear whether it is a unique foundational value or whether he also affirms other basic values. For instance, Tiwald (forthcoming-b) suggests that “good order” (tiaoli 條理) might be a further basic value or perhaps even a more fundamental value than collective flourishing (which Tiwald calls “life fulfillment”). Furthermore, given that collective flourishing (shengsheng) is clearly a value for Dai, the question arises of what the exact relation is between such flourishing and the satisfaction of wants and feelings, the pivotal good he takes to be indicative of pattern (li). In Dai’s framework, satisfying basic wants and feelings is surely a prerequisite for collective human flourishing. But is it a sufficient condition, or are other conditions also relevant? One response might be that satisfying the wants and feelings of all is sufficient for collective human flourishing. After all, satisfying all people’s wants and feelings is no easy task. Our joy, anger, sorrow, and delight are subject to many social constraints that are beyond our individual control. Fulfilling one’s own feelings probably also entails maintaining “harmonious” and “balanced” interpersonal relationships. It seems plausible to describe members of a community that attains mutual fulfillment of wants and feelings as living flourishing lives, at least by some minimal standard.

On the other hand, it also seems reasonable to argue that this conception of human flourishing is too thin, and a flourishing life should include other goods as well, such as ethical virtues, the fulfillment of personal projects, or artistic achievement. A plausible interpretation of some of Dai’s remarks about the “completion” or “fulfillment” of what is self-so, as discussed in sections 4 and 5 above, is that a further condition for a flourishing human life is the satisfaction of the xinqi 心氣 (the heart-mind’s vital stuff), which has an inclination toward moral norms. An implication is that individuals within a community can flourish only when they are morally virtuous. Intriguingly, since for Dai part of moral virtue is acting in a way that contributes to the fulfillment of all persons’ wants and feelings, a community whose members reliably manifested moral virtue would probably also be one in which people’s wants and feelings were fulfilled. Possibly, then, Dai might say that in practice the two conceptions of flourishing just sketched converge and mutually reinforce each other, a view suggested as well by our discussion in section 5. How best to explain Dai’s conception of human flourishing is another issue about which the scholarly literature has yet to reach a consensus.

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