Dietrich of Freiberg

First published Wed Feb 23, 2005; substantive revision Tue Oct 7, 2025

The philosopher and theologian Dietrich of Freiberg (c. 1250–1310) was one of the most original thinkers of his time. He belonged to what has been sometimes called the Cologne School or the German Dominican School, alongside figures such as Ulrich of Strasbourg (c. 1225–1277), Master Eckhart (c. 1260–1327), and Berthold of Moosburg (d. c. 1361)—a group particularly marked by the influence of Albert the Great (c. 1193–1280). Like these authors, Dietrich developed a doctrine shaped by a form of Neoplatonism and synthesized a wide range of sources, notably various Neoplatonic authors and Averroes. Rediscovered in the twentieth century, Dietrich gained fame for having argued that the categorial structure of things is produced by the intellect, a view that led some to regard him as a kind of ‘medieval Kant’ (Flasch 1972). Although this label has been challenged, it is also recognized that the significance of his work extends far beyond this striking thesis, which is embedded in a complex emanationist metaphysics. Moreover, Dietrich is considered the first scholar to have offered a correct explanation of the rainbow. Dietrich’s work thus spans a very broad range of interests, from metaphysics to concrete questions in natural philosophy concerning light and color, as well as theology and psychology. Across all these domains, his thought exhibits great originality and remarkable systematicity.

1. Life of Dietrich of Freiberg

Little is known with certainty about the life of Dietrich of Freiberg. He was born in Freiberg in Saxony around the year 1250. He is sometimes referred to as “Dietrich of Saxony,” and often as “Theodoricus Teutonicus.” He is also mentioned in medieval documents as “Magister” or “Master,” indicating that he had advanced university training. He joined the Dominican order at a young age. We know that he was still a youth when Albertus Magnus was coming to the end of his career. But it is not known whether Dietrich studied under Albert or ever met him. Around the year 1271 he served as lector in the Dominican convent at Freiberg in Saxony. That he studied at Paris is clear, that it was sometime during the period between 1272–1274 is probable. But it is not known with whom he studied. There is evidence provided by Dietrich’s own hand, found in chapter thirty of the second part of his Tractatus de intellectu et intelligibili and in other places in his works that suggests he may have studied under Henry of Ghent. Dietrich mentions a certain “solemn master” whom he heard dispute in Paris. Henry was known to his students as “doctor solemnis” and perhaps “magister solemnis” as well. An examination of Dietrich’s writings suggests some themes that could possibly owe their origins to Henry of Ghent (Porro 2009, 2013; Decaix 2021).

Dietrich returned to Germany in 1280 and held the post of lector in the city of Trier until 1281. He returned to Paris in 1281 in order to hold lectures on the Sentences of Peter Lombard, perhaps at Saint-Jacques. He may have remained in Paris until 1293. Although the documents are not clear, most historians agree that he was appointed prior of the Dominican convent in Würzburg. In 1293, he was named Provincial Superior of his order for the province of Germany, Albert the Great’s old post. Between 1296 and 1297, he was “Master of Theology” at the University of Paris. He continued to teach in Paris until 1300. In 1304, he was present at the general chapter of the Dominican order held at Toulouse. His name last appears in the acts of the general chapter of the order held in Piacenza in 1310. There he was appointed Vicar Provincial of Germany. After this time his name drops out of the documents (Eckert 1957/1959; Sturlese 1984; Kandler 2009).

2. Philosophical Works

Dietrich was a prolific writer. His writings include compositions on nearly every branch of theology, philosophy, and natural science known to his period. His philosophical and scientific works far outnumber his strictly theological treatises. His Opera omnia, published in the Corpus Philosophorum Teutonicorum Medii Aevi, occupy four volumes.

Among his theological writings are included his treatises on the beatific vision (De visione beatifica), on the nature of Christ’s body after the crucifixion (De corpore Christi mortuo), on the nature of glorified bodies (De dotibus corporum gloriosorum), on spiritual substances and the resurrection (De substantiis spiritualibus et corporibus futurae resurrectionis).

His philosophical writings—some of which may be also classified as scientific works—include: De habitibus, De ente et essentia, De magis et minus, De natura contrariorum, De cognitione entium separatorum et maxime animarum separatarum, De intelligentiis et motoribus caelorum, De corporibus caelestibus quoad naturam eorum corporalem, De animatione caeli, De accidentibus, De quiditatibus entium, De origine rerum praedicamentalium, De mensuris, De natura et proprietate continuorum, and the De intellectu et intelligibili.

It is also as a scientist—or, in the terms of the time, as a natural philosopher—that Dietrich distinguished himself. Some of his scientific treatises, which have long attracted the attention of historians of science, are famous. His treatises on light (De luce), on color (De coloribus), and on the rainbow (De iride), composed in the scientific spirit of Albert the Great, contributed greatly to the development of optics.

3. Noetics

Dietrich of Freiberg’s distinctive noetics—including his original theory of the intellect’s constitutive activity and his particular conception of the role of the soul’s faculties in the process of knowledge—has drawn the primary attention of historians of philosophy. Given that it indeed represents one of the most original components of his thought, and more importantly, that it serves as a central key to understanding the broader system of which it is an inseparable part, it is appropriate to begin by presenting it.

3.1 The constitutive power of the mind

Alternately compared to Kant’s transcendental idealism (Flasch 1972; Mojsisch 1977) or to the subjectivity in the modern cogito (Berland 2007), Dietrich of Freiberg’s noetics is highly innovative. Dietrich grants the intellect a constitutive power. This constitutive power is exercised over things of first intention (res primae intentionis) that have an extramental existence. In De origine rerum praedicamentalium (DORP), Dietrich systematizes the categories according to their origin, i.e., their principles and causes. According to him, the first three categories (substance, quantity, quality) have nature as their cause. However, the following seven categories are not directed by nature to a certain end, and thus are not the principle of a real—i.e., natural—operation. They must therefore be traced back to another kind of cause and principle, and since there are only two principles of being, namely nature and intellect, it can which can only be the intellect. The intellect thus plays a constitutive role with respect to relative categories. If this bipartition of categories into three on the one hand, and seven on the other, is similar to what we find in Henry of Ghent (Quodlibet, VII, 2), the major difference is that Dietrich considers the seven remaining categories constituted by the intellect to be just as “real” as the first three. Consequently, the intellect does indeed possess a constitutive power with regard to reality.

Furthermore, the human intellect not only constitutes the seven relative categories, but also what Dietrich calls quidditative being (esse quiditativum). The fifth chapter of De origine rerum praedicamentalium demonstrates this original thesis. For Dietrich, the intellect is never passive: it is a “simple form”. It cannot be moved by sensible corporeal objects, because these are inferior in nobility, following Augustine, and because of its own separation, following Averroes. Consequently, intellection does not proceed from the reception of an intelligible form transmitted by the internal senses to the intellect. The intellect is active and initiates its relation to its object. In this sense, the intellect is indeed the cause of its proper object: it constitutes it in its ratio of being an object, i.e., in its intelligibility. This audacious thesis opens up an interpretation of his noetics in terms of “intentionality” (DORP, 5 (26), 186–7; see Perler 2003; Decaix 2021).

His theory of the internal senses, summarized in the Quaestio utrum in deo sit aliqua vis inferior intellectu, is equally interesting. Notably, he makes original use of the cogitative faculty, inherited from Averroes, capable of producing, through its abstractive power, the universal intention of the thing, naked and stripped of all accidental marks (DORP, 5 (28); see Colli 2008; De Libera 2009).

3.2 Ens conceptionale

For Dietrich, noetics is inherently linked to metaphysics. In his emanationist universe, each kind of being is assigned a distinct mode of knowledge according to its place and order in the universe (see Section 5.3 below). This particular connection between metaphysics and noetics is coined in the concept of ens conceptionale (Mojsisch 1984): each kind of being (manieres entium) possesses a distinct mode of knowing, and their being is none other than a mode of cognizing. In De visione beatifica, Dietrich states that the distinction between conceptional and real being is the very first division of being, thereby replacing the Thomist division between ens reale and ens rationis.

Conceptional being (ens conceptionale) is really coextensive with what Dietrich calls the university of beings (universitas entium) because the former exemplifies in itself all the modes of natural being. Furthermore, conceptional being includes for Dietrich not just the objects of the intellectual act but the act itself. So, in its similitude to divine creation, the intellect possesses an emanative activity which Dietrich calls emanatio simplex, by analogy with the creative emanation of God. Of course, the intellective act is also reproductive, it does establish a mirror of external reality (the meaning of ens reale for Dietrich).

Furthermore, ens conceptionale forms a conceptional hierarchy of its own, complementary to the general hierarchy of being described below (Section 5.3). At the bottom of this conceptional order are the external senses, followed by the interior senses, the vis cogitativa, the possible intellect, and finally the agent intellect at the very top. Due to its superiority, the intellect is resplendent with the universe of beings. “All beings shine forth (resplendent) in its essence” (DVB, 1.1.4 (4), 29), according to Dietrich. In the realm of intellects, Dietrich tells us, there is a fourfold order in which intellectual reality stands: at the top of this order are intellects existing through their essence, followed by intelligent spiritual substances that are called angels, then species, and finally the individual realities included in species that are known to mind. Further subdividing this hierarchy of conceptual being, Dietrich specifies that there are three kinds of intellects that exist through their essence: the separate intelligences, the intellects united to celestial bodies, and human intellects.

The various modes of being within the entire hierarchy of being as well as the different kinds of beings subordinate to the first being (see Section 5.3 below) all bear a likeness to God. Dietrich innovatively describes the properties of the agent intellect (DVB, 1.1.6), emphasizing its substantiality. First (DVB, 1.1), the agent intellect is substance, because it is the image of God (DVB, 1.1.1, 15–6), and it always cognizes in act (DVB, 1.1.2, 22–5), thus it always cognizes itself in its essence (DVB, 1.1.3, 26–8). Moreover, insofar as it is an exemplar and likeness of the totality of being (DVB, 1.1.4, 28–30), in cognizing itself, the agent intellect cognizes all other things (DVB, 1.1.5, 30). The substantiality of the agent intellect is demonstrated through a dynamic approach, inherited from Augustine: (1) substance is that which exceeds its subject (DVB, 1.1.7, 31–3), that which cannot pertain to accidents. (2) The agent intellect, as an image of God (imago dei), encompasses a substantial likeness, or an essential conformity to God (DVB, 1.2, 36–53), which is why (3), it is capable of God (capax dei, cf. DVB, 1.4, 61), and (4) essentially converted into God (DVB, 1.5, 62–3). The agent intellect gives rise to an order of emanation that is just as vast as that of the creative emanation of God in the order of real beings. In fact, it mirrors this order perfectly: it is itself identified with the universe of beings (exemplar et similitudo totius entis). By its intimate, essential and immediate self-knowledge, Dietrich’s conception of the agent intellect has been compared to a philosophy of the self. The possible intellect, on the contrary, needs to be actualized: it is by knowing other things that it comes to understand itself.

But the various members of Dietrich’s hierarchy of being are also bound together into a universe of beings by the similitude they bear to each other. This similitude, however, is the result of the essential order of causation, according to which every being in the universe of beings is ordered to every other being either as cause or effect. Thus, the totality of beings are bound together making up a universe where every creature bears a relation of similitude to every other creature and to the primary unifying principle from which they emanate, i.e., God. The intellect is a universal nature, in accord with its intellectual essence, which is not determined to understand only this or that thing. This is clear from its object, which is not this or that quiddity, but universally any quiddity and being as being, that is, whatever possesses the character of being.

3.3 Intellect and the individual soul

Dietrich’s account of intellection raises another question, namely: what kind of causal relationship exists between the agent intellect and the human soul? Dietrich gives a very precise answer to this question, no doubt based on his acceptance of Proclus’ exposition of the principles of generation within the hierarchy of being. The agent intellect, according to Dietrich’s solution, is the intrinsic essential principle of the intellectual soul. That it cannot be the material cause is self-evident. It cannot be the final cause since a final cause perfects a thing, but does not establish it in being, which is what the agent intellect does for the soul.

The importance of Averroes in his philosophy (Flasch 2007; Calma 2009) should not be interpreted as including Dietrich among the “Latin Averroists.” Indeed, in his De intellectu et intelligibili, he argues, against Averroes, that the agent and possible intellects are individuated and numbered by the individual souls. Dietrich, however, basing his position squarely upon an old Augustinian tradition, argues that separation is a characteristic of intellect as such, and in a human soul it is present in the form of an intraneitas, that is to say, the “interiority” which Augustine claimed was not joined to the body as its form.

His notion of individuality is also original: dismissing the Thomistic model of individuation through quantified matter, Dietrich holds that quantified matter does not represent a universal principle of individuation, insofar as spiritual substances—such as angels—do not possess matter. Nonetheless, in most individualized beings there exists a form of composition consisting in what Dietrich calls “parts posterior to the whole” (see, e.g., DLEO, 10 (3), 17), which are parts that do not modify the essential nature of a being (unlike the “parts prior to the whole” represented by genus and species in an essential definition). For corporeal substances (including celestial bodies), these parts posterior to the whole are quantitative, and individuation indeed occurs by means of the dimensions of matter (DCC, 7 (3), 383): Dietrich maintains that prime matter possesses indeterminate dimensions, which receive their full determination only through a substantial form (DCC, 4, 382). In the case of angels, however, these individuating parts are qualitative and involve a form of composition among different faculties—notably, between active and passive powers (DII, II.26 (3), 165). Beings that do not even possess “parts posterior to the whole,” such as agent intellects, are individuated by real relations existing in the natural order (respectus reales naturales) between the different beings, like being equal, similar, or different (DII, II.27 (3), 166). This view of individuality encompasses thus immaterial beings such as angels, separate substances, simple intelligences, and the intellect (Suárez-Nani 1998).

The idea that the intellect is both what is most intimate to the individual and, in a certain sense, separate from them, has important consequences. The agent intellect cannot be the formal cause of the soul—at least not in the natural order of things. Dietrich argues that if it were the formal cause of the soul—given that the soul, by definition, is the formal cause of the human person—then it would follow that there would be a form of a form in the same species (human). But this is contrary to the natural order of things because whatever is the form of something in the genus of substance is by the whole of itself the act of its subject. Thus, the same thing cannot be in potency to more than one form in its genus. A human being is therefore not fully joined to his intellect, an intellect that is always in act and resplendent with the universe of beings. Such a vision, as we will shortly see, is expanded in De visione beatifica.

4. Theology

Unlike his famous predecessor Thomas Aquinas, the Saxon Master’s theological works have not been transmitted to posterity in their totality. Even if his sermons have been lost, and might have earned Dietrich the same fame as his no-less famous successor Master Eckhart, we do know that he held an impactful vernacular preaching. As a result, Dietrich has often been considered part of the Rhenish mysticism alongside with Albert the Great and Master Eckhart (cf. Sturlese 1977; De Libera 1990). The question De subiecto theologiae seems to be the only remnant of his Commentary on the Sentences.

A word of caution is necessary here: distinguishing what properly belongs to theology in Dietrich’s thought—as opposed to his noetics, metaphysics, or even cosmology—can at times prove difficult, due to the intimate connection he establishes between these domains, and the strictly philosophical stance he often adopts on theological questions. His De visione beatifica, for example, has been read and interpreted primarily for the theory of knowledge it develops. Throughout his work, Dietrich of Freiberg adopts the position of a consistent metaphysician who refuses to allow any compromise between philosophy and the dogmas of sacred faith. Such attempts lead both to intolerable error in the eyes of philosophy, and to serious damage to True Doctrine. In these treatises (DVB, DA, DQE, DEE), Dietrich of Freiberg’s antithomism is very prominent, playing Averroes off against Thomas Aquinas, in favor of a coherent Aristotelianism. It is nevertheless clear that, given his institutional position and the breadth of the writings he left us, a portion of Dietrich’s work concerns theological themes. The present section successively presents his theory of the beatific vision and his positions on major theological controversies of his time.

4.1 On the beatific vision

In De visione beatifica, Dietrich of Freiberg promotes an intellectualist model of the beatific vision. He argues that the beatific vision is immediate and direct. It is a vision of God’s essence that requires no intermediary (i.e., no “species” according to the terminology of the time). Therefore, beatific vision occurs through the agent intellect, and not the possible intellect, which cannot think without images. Dietrich’s treatise is polemical against the communiter loquentes of the “common doctrine,” according to which the beatific vision is produced through the light of glory (lumen gloriae)—a position defended in particular by Thomas Aquinas (Imbach 1997; Robin 2009). According to this doctrine, the possible intellect receives a light from God, the light of glory, which comforts and supports it until it can rise to the grasp of God in essence.

Dietrich rejects any theory of supernatural illumination. Drawing again on Averroes, he defends that the beatific vision comes about through a junction with the agent intellect. In this junction, the agent intellect unites with the human intellect as its form, enabling it to intellectually grasp the very intellection through which it knows itself, and to be then essentially turned toward God. When fully joined to the agent intellect—if the intellect becomes the soul’s form— the human intellect can understand everything all at once. In this union, the human intellect understands the entire universe of beings in a single mental act. When the agent intellect unites with the intellectual soul as its form, it can then know in the mode by which the intellect knows itself, its intellectuality and its act. This is how it can know through its essence, and be immediately turned toward God. This junction with the agent intellect forms the highest point of intellectual knowledge, where the human soul rises to pure intellectuality through its own natural forces. The grasp of the highest object, God, is the climax of Dietrich of Freiberg’s noetics.

4.2 Theological controversies

Dietrich of Freiberg tackles famous theological problems of his time in several treatises, collected under the incipit of the ‘Three Difficult Questions’ (DA, DVB, DAC), which are polemical in scope. One of these problems concerned the ontological status of accidents. The requirements of the Christian faith and, in particular, the belief that bread is changed into Christ’s body during the Eucharist had led many theologians of the time to accept the idea that accidents can subsist—although supernaturally—without their subject of inherence, i.e., without a substance. In his De accidentibus, as well as in his De quiditatibus entium, Dietrich demonstrates the inseparability of accidents from substances. Following Averroes, he defines accidents as beings of being (entia entis) and modes or dispositions of being (modi entium / dispositiones entium). As such, accidents can neither be nor be defined by themselves: accidents exist only in virtue of substances and thus exist by another (per aliud seu secundum aliud; cf. DA, 8, 63–4).

Consequently, Dietrich criticizes the definition of accidents by their being of inherence (in esse / esse in alio) which fosters the idea that they may possess a minimal being (inesse) by which they could subsist independently of a substance. In so doing, he rejects the common doctrine that promotes an additional model of accidents upon the substance, whose role would be to sustain and support them. Moreover, Dietrich targets the dominant doctrine of the separability of accidents through quantity (cf. Thomas Aquinas or Bonaventura, In IV Sent., dist. 12). His argument undermines such rational explanations of the dogmas of the Eucharist and Transubstantiation, detrimental to both rigorous philosophy and the true Faith (Imbach 1986/1998). Substance is not what supports accidents, but what substantiates and quiddifies them (that without which they cannot be nor be defined). Without elaborating further on the theological implications of his theory, Dietrich concludes that accidents are absolutely inseparable (DA, 19 (1)). 

In his De corpore Christi mortuo, Dietrich deals with another theological controversy of his time having important philosophical implications, namely whether one should appeal to a bodily substantial form distinct from the soul to account for the well-known problem of the triduum, i.e., the problem of how to explain the identity of Christ’s body during the three days between his death and resurrection. Dietrich firmly rejects this view, held by some philosophers and theologians of his time (mostly—though not exclusively—Franciscan thinkers) admitting a plurality of substantial forms in corporeal substances. As in the case of the Eucharist, Dietrich refrains from offering a positive explanation of this miracle. But he denies that the plurality of essential predicates constituting an essence (for example, rationality and animality in the case of the human being) constitutes a good reason to support the plurality of substantial forms—an argument often advanced to support this view (DCCM 4, 150). Like Aquinas, he thus stands in favor of the unicity of the substantial form. In connection with his theory of intellection, he interprets the plurality of essential predicates as different formal intentions (intentiones formales) through which the intellect apprehends a single, unified form (DORP, 4 (33), 178). As indicated above—and as this last remark about the role of the intellect in resolving ontological questions further illustrates—Dietrich’s noetics is closely tied not only to his theological views but also to his metaphysics, inviting us to turn now to his metaphysical framework as a key to better understanding what precedes.

5. Metaphysics

Metaphysics, for its part, is defined by Dietrich as the science of what is per se (substance) and its consequent properties (DORP, 1 (12), 140–1; see Decaix 2013). The metaphysician (philosophus primus) proceeds from the reconduction of accidental and contingent relationships to essential, inherently necessary ones (Flasch 2008; König-Pralong 2009). Furthermore, efficient and final causes are excluded from metaphysical consideration. Consequently, metaphysics is concerned with the essential elements of being, form and matter, and is the science that grasps being per se— the substance—on the basis of its form and quiddity (DORP, 5 (59), 199). As such, metaphysics has its own defined subject, which should not be confused with the divine science of philosophers, scientia divina philosophorum, nor with revealed theology, scientia divina sanctorum (cf. De subiecto theologiae).

5.1 Essence and existence

Dietrich has devoted extensive analyses of the key metaphysical terms esse, ens, entitas, quid, and quiditas. In his treatise De ente et essentia, he strictly rejects any real distinction between essence and existence, targeting Aquinas. He endorses the thesis that there is no distinction outside the mind between existence (esse) and essence (essentia). The existence of a thing expresses its essence and vice versa. According to Dietrich, the two notions differ only in the way they denote the thing of which they are predicated (in modis significandi): existence expresses being in the mode of an act, while essence expresses it in the mode of a possession and of the term of an act. Dietrich correlates his thesis of the real identity of existence and essence with his concept of being, both in its concrete form as ens or particular being and its abstract form as entitas. Ens denotes the essence of whatever is a determinate existing individual, while entitas denotes in an abstract manner. Strikingly, while Dietrich’s work shows little interest in logical and semantic issues, it is through a resolution influenced by the so-called “Modists” (modistae) that he unravels metaphysical issues regarding essence and existence.

Being (ens) is for Dietrich the most basic of all metaphysical concepts and the first transcendental of which he gives an original account: being is what differentiates or separates itself from nothingness (distat /differt a nihilo; see DEE, I.2 (2), 28–9; I.4 (2), 31; DORP, 1 (4), 138; 1 (25), 144; DNC 15 (1), 94–5). Both ens and entitas identify with essence. Therefore, one could say, according to Dietrich, that in considering a white ball, for example, its ens is white, its entitas is whiteness, and its essence is that through which it is white and participates in whiteness. It is the “very beingness of the thing, and hence that through which it may be said to stand outside of nothingness.”(Maurer 1956)

5.2 Form and quiddity

One of Dietrich’s most distinctive positions concerns the relationship between form, on the one hand, and essence and quiddity, on the other hand. A recurring question in medieval metaphysics and anthropology—arising due to the then-dominant framework of Aristotelian hylomorphism—was whether the essence or quiddity of a being is identical to its form alone, or rather to the composite of matter and form; that is, in the case of the human being, whether it is the soul alone or the composite of soul and body. The first option, often (though maybe wrongly) attributed to Averroes, had very few defenders prior to the late thirteenth century. Dietrich, however, accepts that quiddity is in fact identical with form alone, although the form does not constitute the whole essence of a composite being (DQE, 8 (3), 111).

To understand this point, a few words about the term ‘quiddity’ are in order. Compared to his analysis of the terms ‘essence’ (essentia) and ‘being’ (esse), Dietrich’s account of quid and quiditas is more limited. While ens, entitas, esse, and essentia are all existential terms answering the question whether something exists, in the De quiditatibus entium, Dietrich considers the question “What is it that exists?” He begins the treatise by distinguishing quid and quiditas from existential terms (DQE, 1, 99), and then proceeds to consider the differences with respect to being in substance, in logical concepts or intentions, and in accidents. Unlike Aquinas, who was more inclined to equate essentia and quiditas, Dietrich sees these metaphysical concepts as different, though not completely unrelated.

The analysis which De quiditatibus entium provides is subtle. The term quid denotes the essential mode of the being of a thing, that is, the mode of being by which it exists as a being of a certain kind. It answers the question “What is it?” (DQE, 8 (4), 112). On the other hand, the abstract term quiditas denotes the formality by means of which a thing is a quid. It is tempting to see a connection here between ens, entitas and quid, quiditas such that the second is the condition of the first. This may lead unwary reasoners, as Dietrich no doubt felt Thomas Aquinas and others were, into completely equating entitas and quiditas. But quiditas only denotes the formal determination of a thing. It is thus only the form of a thing. Hence the quiddity can be fully equated neither with the being (either the ens or the entitas) of a thing nor with its essence, although the quiddity presupposes a being.

The quiddity gives a being its specific intrinsic character by means of which it can be known. Insofar as Dietrich assimilates the question “quid est?” to the question “propter quid?” (i.e., to what end?), which serves to inquire into the intrinsic causes explaining why a material being is what it is, he claims that quiddity is, strictly speaking, only found in composite beings where a form determines some matter (DQE, 3, 101–3; 8, 111–2). Unlike Aquinas, thus, Dietrich employs the term “quiddity” neither to designate the whole composite nor to refer to immaterial beings. As a consequence, God and the Intelligences do not have quiddities since they are simple beings. Dietrich indeed strictly rejects what is sometimes called “universal hylomorphism,” namely, the idea that all beings possess some matter, including separate substances that have a kind of matter of their own, distinct from corporeal matter (cf. USS).

5.3 Universitas entium: A hierarchical universe

The creation that results from divine intellectual activity, however, takes the form of a hierarchy of beings that, according to Dietrich, constitutes the structure of the universe. We can note that Dietrich often employs the term universitas to refer to the totality of what exists, a term by which he emphasizes that the hierarchical universe as he understood it includes all beings, even the divine being. According to Dietrich, the hierarchy of beings can be explained through their essential relations to each other in the universe, that is, by the essential place they occupy in the chain of beings. In this chain, in which God is at the top, every being is essentially ordered to some other being as either its cause or its effect. “God,” Dietrich tells us in the first part of De intellectu et intelligibili, “means that than which nothing is superior, which stands in need of nothing with respect to either being or operation” (DII, I.7 (1), 140). All other beings are ordered under God and to each other in an essential ordering.

One of the key concepts in his thought—of Neoplatonic origin—is that of essential cause (causa essentialis), which serves as the keystone of his entire system (Mojsisch 1984; Decaix 2014). An essential cause is one that pre-contains in a nobler mode, i.e., more interior and essential, its effect (DAC, 8 (2), 19). In De cognitione entium separatorum (DCES, 23, 186–87), Dietrich sets out five conditions for something to be the essential cause of something else. It must be: 1) a substance, 2) living, 3) by essence, i.e., essentially alive, 4) living an intellectual life, 5) an intellect by essence in act. This implies, on the one hand, that no body as such can exercise this kind of causality: bodies act only by virtue of their extrinsic accidents, which excludes them from the essential order of universitas entium. On the other hand, this causality unifies several distinct states into one whole: God, simple Intelligences, separate substances, celestial orbs and souls, and the agent intellect.

In light of this emanationist model, Dietrich follows Proclus in classifying the various kinds of beings that constitute the total hierarchy of being and distinguishes four main classes of beings, in a decreasing order of dignity and ontological priority (DII, I.4 (2), 138; DCES, 9 (2), 175):

  1. God, i.e., Proclus’ One
  2. The Intelligences
  3. Souls
  4. Bodies

Using material found in Proclus, the Liber de causis, and Avicenna’s Metaphysics, Dietrich explains the order of the procession of these four kinds of beings as follows: From God there proceeds that which is called the first Intelligence. From the first intelligence the second intelligence flows forth along with the soul of the first celestial sphere and the first celestial sphere itself. This is the second stage. Then the process is repeated with the procession of the third intelligence, the soul of the second heaven, the second heaven itself, on down through all the celestial worlds until the intelligence and soul of the lowest heaven and the lowest heaven itself is reached. Thus all four kinds of beings are accounted for and are ordered according to their place in the celestial procession.

Each manner of being also corresponds to a measure of duration (mensura durationis), i.e., a distinct mode of temporality, according to the place each occupies in the universe of beings, and according to their relationship to God (Colli 2009). In his De mensuris, Dietrich attributes a distinct temporal mode to each of the four modes of being, according to its relation to God, to the others and to itself (in se). To God, who precedes the existence of the universe, he assigns eternity (eternitas), which has neither an initial nor a final term. To the second (the world, the celestial orbs), sempiternity (sempiternitas), or perpetuity (perpetuitas), as that which has a beginning, but no end. To the third (simple Intelligence, Angels), eviternity (aevum). To the fourth, material created things are corruptible, time (tempus), as they possess a beginning and an end, are subject to succession, and are caught up in past, present and future temporal dimensions. For its part, time (tempus), a specific dimension to the physical realm of material things, is as a successive continuous. Following Aristotle, it is defined as the “number of movement according to anterior and posterior” (Physics, IV, 10–14). However, influenced by Averroes’ commentary, Dietrich emphasizes the activity of the soul as the primary and proximate cause of time (DNPC, 5). The soul therefore plays an active role with respect to time: sensation perceives movement; reason grasps an interval of duration and establishes the order of succession between a “before and after”, which is the substance of time, and the definition of time in its quiddity is determined by the intellect.

In this hierarchically ordered universe, Dietrich posits a principle of continuity that operates at various levels and ensures its unity. Whereas the separate Intelligences are produced by way of emanation from the first principle—that is, God—the things of the sublunary world come into being through natural transmutation, that is, through motion involving matter. Between these two opposed modes of coming into being, the heavens and celestial bodies represent an intermediate mode of existence (DAC, 9–10, 20–2). Although they belong to corporeal nature, celestial bodies are not subject to generation and corruption; nor do they proceed directly from the divine intellect, as do the separate Intelligences. They are moved neither per emanationem nor per transmutationem but per informationem, i.e., by an Intelligence (or celestial soul) that constitutes their intrinsic formal principle—unlike sublunary bodies, whose motion is caused by an external mover (DAC, 15, 26).

This subtle hierarchical ordering of the genera of beings composing the universe can also be seen in Dietrich’s effort to distinguish celestial Intelligences (themselves distinct from pure Intelligences, which are completely separate from the corporeal realm) from angels: although angels are intellectual creatures, they are not ‘intellects by essence’ and therefore possess a different ontological status—one marked by contingency, a certain passivity, and a kind of composition between various cognitive powers (DAC, 19–28, 29–36). As we can see, then, the four-level hierarchy of beings inspired by Proclus represents only the general structure of a layered universe, which in fact contains a much more finely articulated internal differentiation—one that depends on the distinction between several types of intellects and corresponding modes of conception (see Section 3.2), as well as on the distinction between different types of souls and their different relations to corporeality.

The entire universe of beings is in a state of active procession of all creatures from God. Even at the lowest rank of the order of beings, i.e., at the level of bodies, there is also a dynamic at work, for bodies in their natural desire for form are in the process of returning to their source. Quoting directly from Proclus, he remarks that what is desirable to all things is intellect and that all things proceed from intellect as well as return through it. But he restrains himself from making any theological identity. It is clear, however, that love marks all the ranks of the hierarchy, every member of which is driven to return to its source by desire for intellect. Tacitly, Dietrich has left the door open for the interpretation that the God who is love as reported in Sacred Scripture has left the mark of that love in the universe of beings and that intellect (often identified by the earlier Christian Neoplatonists with the second Person of the Trinity) is the crucial agent in both the unfolding and retrieval of being.

6. Natural philosophy

We have seen that Dietrich viewed the complexity of the universe of being as itself a likeness to God. The world in all of its wonderful complexity revealed something of God to a mind willing to inquire into it, giving glory to God in its very complexity. Perhaps Dietrich’s metaphysical vision of the universe explains his keen interest in science, an interest that led him to write treatises summing up his research into light and color and into the material elements of the universe. At any rate, Dietrich’s intellectual interests included the study of nature and its particular phenomena. Clearly less concerned than some of his contemporaries with the most general questions of the natural philosophy of his time—such as “What defines nature as such?” or “What is motion?”—often prompted by commentaries on Aristotle’s Physics (a genre he set aside in favor of shorter treatises on natural philosophy), Dietrich showed a marked interest in concrete explanatory inquiries into phenomena such as the rainbow, colors, or celestial motions. The present section aims to present some of Dietrich’s most noteworthy theories in natural philosophy which, as will become clear, are grounded in and consistent with the views previously outlined, thus avoiding any chasm between his metaphysics and his science.

6.1 Scientific method

A few preliminary remarks on the nature of Dietrich’s scientific method are necessary at this point. It has been argued that the remarkable results he achieved—notably his explanation of the rainbow—can be attributed to his adoption of a distinctive scientific method, one reflecting a transitional stage between the qualitative paradigm of Aristotelian physics and the quantified approach that would later characterize modern science (Wallace 1959). In reality, however, assessing the precise methods followed by Dietrich in his investigations of natural phenomena proves to be quite difficult. The extant texts do not provide a clear account of his methodological procedures; rather, they present, in the form of treatises, the conclusions he reaches, modeled on Aristotle’s Posterior Analytics—that is, as propter quid explanations, or demonstrations through causes (Grant 1961; Sturlese 1985, xiii-xviii; Flasch 2007, 19–60). Moreover, Dietrich’s scientific expositions often contain an inseparable metaphysical dimension. He frequently seeks to explain particular sensible phenomena by tracing them back to the most general causes that govern the behavior of beings in the universe. To give just one example: the analysis of contrariety in the Tractatus de natura contrariorum is ultimately aimed at explaining the movement of contrary qualities in nature. Yet the treatise employs a complex combinatorial framework that draws upon Dietrich’s theory of the transcendentals (Aertsen 1999; Flasch 2007, 439–70; Roudaut 2020). It is nonetheless clear that Dietrich relied on careful observation of phenomena, as well as on a rudimentary form of experimentation—traces of which can be found in his writings, particularly in optics—even though it remains difficult to assess the sophistication of these experimental procedures or their exact role within his scientific approach. Similarly, Dietrich makes explicit use of mathematics—especially geometry—in the field of optics (Husson 2009). By contrast, his writings on qualities and motion show no evidence of the quantitative methods that will later emerge in 14th-century physics, and thus remain within a paradigm that may still be described as qualitative.

6.2 Optics, light, and colors

The works for which Dietrich has most attracted the attention of historians of science concern optics and the theory of light. He devoted specific treatises, respectively, to light, to color, and to the rainbow. His theory of light and its causes reveals the deep interweaving of metaphysical and physical considerations throughout his thought. Dietrich explains the behavior of light—its capacity to be transmitted through different media and to manifest itself instantaneously therein—by reference to the kinds of “parts” that bodies possess. In the De luce et eius origine, he develops a detailed typology of the parts of a body, showing that certain properties are such that bodies suitably disposed to receive them remain in potency with respect to them until an external agent brings them into act (DLEO, 11–13, 18–20). This characterization of certain types of parts explains why these properties—like light—do not have a positive contrary and manifest themselves instantaneously in a medium capable of receiving them. Dietrich establishes these properties of light through a typology of forms, within which he identifies a type of what he calls “perfectional forms,” which appear to be distinct from the usual division of forms into substantial and accidental. Remarkably, this notion also appears in his Quaestio utrum in Deo sit aliqua vis cognitiva inferior intellectu, where he uses it to account for the modes of operation of the divine intellect. This reinforces the close parallel he draws—within a broadly Neoplatonic framework—between light and intellection, a parallel that will be further developed by Berthold of Moosburg, on whom Dietrich’s influence will be of primary importance (Roudaut 2022).

Dietrich treats both the problem of radiant colors (as in the case of the rainbow) and that of natural colors, namely those present in natural bodies. His theory of natural color reflects a dynamic approach to the phenomenon. According to Dietrich, natural colors can be explained through a particular conception of the “complexion” of corporeal substances—a notion that suggests the likely influence of medical theories on his reflections in this area (DC, 7, 281–2; see Wallace 1959, 152–73, 188–205; Flasch 2007, 627–77; Decaix 2024). This conception leads him to reject the Aristotelian-inspired theory that identifies red, green, and blue as the only intermediary colors (between the extremes of black and white) and regards yellow as merely an optical illusion (DC 6 (1), 281). The degree to which Dietrich may have employed experimentation to support his analysis remains a matter of debate (Crombie 1953, 233–59; Boyer 1959, 110–28).

Dietrich’s theory of the rainbow builds upon and extends that of Ibn al-Haytham (known in Latin as Alhazen), on which it explicitly relies. Like Ibn al-Haytham, Dietrich employs geometry to demonstrate the principles of reflection and refraction of light within a watery medium. However, much like the contemporary scholar Kamāl al-Dīn al-Fārisī—despite there being no known historical link or transmission between them—Dietrich takes the explanation further. He shows that the refraction of light entering a droplet, its internal reflection, and its subsequent refraction upon exiting the droplet can account not only for the primary rainbow, but also for the secondary rainbow (Crombie 1953, 233–77; Wallace 1959, 188–96). He further explains the specific angle at which these phenomena occur, thereby accounting for the relative positions of the primary and secondary rainbows (DIRI, II.25, 189–90; II.39, 210–2; II.42–43, 215–6). By demonstrating that the secondary rainbow is caused by an internal reflection occurring between the two refractions of light traveling through a watery medium, he explains the reversal of color order between the primary and secondary rainbows (DIRI, II.29, 195–6).

6.3 Elements and mixtures

The notion of mixture occupies a significant place in Dietrich’s natural philosophy. He draws upon the concept of complexion in his theory of color and, as we will see, seeks to explain the motion of natural bodies on the basis of a classification of the role played by the parts within a body. A central question in the physics of Dietrich’s time concerned the structure of mixed bodies and the precise status of the elements that compose them. Three principal theories contended on this issue, discussed in Dietrich’s De miscibilibus in mixto: The first, inspired by Avicenna, holds that the elements retain their substantial forms—distinct from their elemental qualities (such as heat, cold, etc.)—in act within the compound. The second, stemming from a particular interpretation of the way Aristotle describes mixtures in On Generation and Corruption, maintains that the substantial forms of the elements are corrupted in the mixture (since otherwise the mixture would lack its own substantial unity), but that they nevertheless remain ‘virtually’ insofar as their properties or powers (virtutes) persist in some manner. A third theory, traceable to Averroes and best described as intermediate, posits that the substantial forms of the elements remain in the mixture in a diminished or attenuated state—an idea that implies a certain gradation or variability in substantial forms. It is worth noting that all of these positions presuppose that the elements possess substantial forms distinct from their qualities. Dietrich adopts the third view, which he considers the most adequate for explaining the role of the elements in the behavior of a compound, while avoiding the respective shortcomings of the two opposing extremes (DMIM, 20–21, 46–7).

6.4 Natural motions

In several of his works, Dietrich offers detailed explanations of the natural motion of bodies—whether of sublunary bodies (especially in his De elementis corporum naturalium) or of celestial motions (in his De animatione caeli, De intelligentiis et motoribus caelorum, De corporibus caelestibus quoad naturam eorum corporalem, and in a short Quaestio utrum sunt epicyli et excentrici in corporibus caelestibus). In his De elementis corporum naturalium, he undertakes to elucidate the causes of the variety of motions according to place (i.e., local motion) observed in nature. A guiding idea in his explanation of the different types of motion exhibited by sensible bodies is the need to distinguish between the simplicity or compositeness of bodies and the simplicity or compositeness of their motions: the composite character of a motion (e.g., partly rectilinear, partly circular) does not necessarily indicate that the body in motion is itself composite, just as the composite nature of a body does not necessarily entail a composite motion (DECN, 13–15, 69–71; cf. Wallace 1961). Certainly, a natural element (such as fire or water), in the absence of external constraints, moves rectilinearly toward its natural place. But more generally, in line with his broader tendency to reduce accidents to the corporeal dispositions of substances, Dietrich insists that one must analyze the types of parts composing a body in order to explain its motion, as well as the role these parts play in the movement of the body as a whole. More precisely, the parts of a body may move the body as a whole (as in the case of a simple element) or only in part (as in the case of animal movement). By combining this criterion with the influence of external forces that constrain motion, Dietrich accounts for the variety of celestial, elemental, and sublunary motions—including the behavior of fluid bodies like rivers or clouds (DECN 20–21, 73).

On the basis of these explanatory principles, he also seeks to explain certain aspects of celestial motions and the natural phenomena related to them. Dietrich indeed holds that the celestial bodies are composed of matter, although this matter is not of the same kind as that of generable and corruptible beings in the sublunary realm (Tractatus de corporibus caelestibus, 1 (7–9), 380). This celestial matter, because it possesses dimensions, makes these bodies subject to local motion and to the laws governing it. While Dietrich attributes the primary cause of celestial motion to Intelligences (or celestial souls, which he distinguishes from angels) that serve as their intrinsic formal principles, the specific trajectories of the celestial spheres are, in his view, also determined by the distribution of matter, which constrains their local movement. Thus, several facts can be explained by admitting the existence of multiple centers of gravity in the natural world, depending on the distribution of matter in the universe, which do not always coincide with its geometric center (DIMC, 17, 368). Explanations based on the distribution of mass in nature better account, on the one hand, for astronomical observations that contradict the strictly circular motion of the heavens posited by Aristotle—leading him to prefer the Ptolemaic system (DIMC, 13 (3), 365–6). On the other hand, this hypothesis also serves to limit the total number of celestial spheres to nine, avoiding the need to posit, as Albert the Great did, a hypothetical tenth sphere to account for phenomena such as the retrograde motion of the planets (DIMC, 3, 357). On these grounds, Dietrich also tries to explain the phenomenon of tides, although he includes in this explanation qualitative hypotheses (involving the salinity of seawater) that make his theory outdated today (DECN, 24, 75–6).

In his short treatise De magis et minus, Dietrich also addresses the important contemporary problem of explaining intensive variations in quality, i.e., the so-called de intensione formarum controversy (Conolly 2014; Flasch 2007, 411–38). Contrary to a growing trend at the time to explain intensive variations of properties such as color or heat through a model of addition—according to which degrees or parts of a form are quantitatively accumulated to produce a more intense quality—Dietrich maintains that intensive variation involves the production of a new individual quality at each instant (an idea also defended by several philosophers active in Paris around the turn of the 14th century like Godfrey of Fontaines or Walter Burley). However, he concedes that qualitative variations presuppose something akin to quantitative increase (quasi incrementum), without constituting proper addition (DMM, 12 (4), 56). Here again, one may appreciate the internal coherence of Dietrich’s positions at the intersection of physics and metaphysics: just as in his treatment of the problem of the plurality of substantial forms, he refuses to admit any real composition within a form, which he regards as a unified entity distinct from the compositionality proper to physical bodies.

The exact influence of Dietrich of Freiberg in the history of philosophy and science remains, to a large extent, yet to be determined. His relative neglect over a long historical period was no doubt due to his anti-Thomist positions at a time when the canonization of Thomas Aquinas (in 1323) was reinforcing both the dissemination of his works and the doctrinal authority attached to them, and also partly due to Dietrich’s lost works—not least his commentary on the Sentences. As a result, Dietrich’s influence was more limited than that of some of his contemporaries, with whom his philosophical originality easily rivaled. Nonetheless, Dietrich exerted a direct influence on thinkers of his time, beginning with philosophers of the Dominican order. In addition to his attested interactions with Master Eckhart and John Picard of Lichtenberg, Dietrich also influenced Nicholas of Strasbourg and, to a much greater extent, Berthold of Moosburg. Nothing, at this stage of our knowledge of the history of ideas, excludes the possibility—indeed quite the contrary—of direct or indirect influences on other authors at the end of the Middle Ages and during the Renaissance. It remains the task of future studies to determine the exact role of this remarkable figure in the history of philosophy.

Bibliography

A. Works by Dietrich of Freiberg

  • Opera omnia, ed. K. Flasch et al., Opera omnia, Corpus Philosophorum Teutonicorum Medii Aevi, t. 1–4, Hamburg: Felix Meiner, 1977–1985.
  • –––, 1975, Schriften zur Intellekttheorie (Tomus 1):
  • ––– De visione beatifica (DVB), ed. B. Mojsisch, 13–124.
  • ––– De intellectu et intelligibili (DII), ed. B. Mojsisch, 137–210.
  • –––, 1980, Schriften zur Metaphysik und Theologie (Tomus 2):
  • ––– De ente et essentia (DEE), ed. R. Imbach, 25–42.
  • ––– De magis et minus (DMM), eds. R. Imbach and H. Steffan, 47–68.
  • ––– De natura contrariorum (DNC), ed. R. Imbach, 79–13.
  • ––– De corpore Christi mortuo, ed. M. R. Pagnoni–Sturlese, 141–50.
  • ––– De cognitione entium separatorum et maxime animarum separatarum (DCES), ed. H. Steffan, 161–260.
  • ––– De intelligentiis et motoribus caelorum (DIMC), ed. L. Sturlese, 351–69.
  • ––– De corporibus caelestibus quoad naturam eorum corporalem (DCC), ed. L. Sturlese, 378–85.
  • –––, 1983, Schriften zur Naturphilosophie und Metaphysik (Tomus 3):
  • ––– De animatione caeli (DAC), ed. L. Sturlese, 9–46.
  • ––– De accidentibus (DA), ed. M. R. Pagnoni–Sturlese, 53–90.
  • ––– De quiditatibus entium (QDE), eds. R. Imbach and J.–D. Cavigioli, 97–118.
  • ––– De origine rerum praedicamentalium (DORP), ed. L. Sturlese, 135–202.
  • ––– De mensuris, éd. R. Rehn, 213–48.
  • ––– De natura et proprietate continuorum (DNPC), ed. R. Rehn, 249–74.
  • ––– Fragmentum de subiecto theologiae, ed. L. Sturlese, 279–82.
  • ––– Quaestio utrum in Deo sit aliqua vis cognitiva inferior intellectu, ed. M. R. Pagnoni–Sturlese, 293–315.
  • ––– Quaestio utrum substantia spiritualis sit composita ex materia et forma (USS), ed. B. Mojsisch, 325–39.
  • ––– Quaestio utrum aliquid, quod est in potentia, possit se ipsum facere in actu, ed. M. R. Pagnoni–Sturlese, 355–7.
  • ––– Quaestio utrum potentiae sensitivae habeant aliquod principium activum intrinsecus, quod faciat eas in actu sentiendi in homine vel animali, ed. M. R. Pagnoni–Sturlese, 359–61.
  • ––– Quaestio utrum sunt epicyli et excentrici in corporibus caelestibus, ed. M. R. Pagnoni–Sturlese, 369–70.
  • ––– Fragmentum de ratione potentiae, ed. M. R. Pagnoni–Sturlese, 377–82.
  • –––, 1985, Schriften zur Naturwissenschaft, Briefe (Tomus 4):
  • ––– De luce et eius origine (DLEO), ed. R. Rehn, 9–24.
  • ––– De coloribus (DC), ed. R. Rehn, 267–88.
  • ––– De iride et de radialibus impressionibus (DIRI), eds. M. R. Pagnoni Sturlese and L. Sturlese, 127–268.
  • ––– Tractatus de miscibilibus in mixto (DMIM), ed. Wallace, 29–47.
  • ––– Tractatus de elementis corporum naturalium (DECN), ed. M. R. Pagnoni–Sturlese, 55–93.

B. Translations

English:

  • Treatise on the Intellect and the Intelligible, transl. by M. Führer, Milwaukee: Marquette University Press, 1992.

French:

  • L’être et l’essence, le vocabulaire médiéval de l’ontologie. Deux traités De ente et essentia de Thomas d’Aquin et Dietrich de Freiberg, transl. by A. de Libera, Paris: Seuil, 1996, 162–203.
  • Œuvres Choisies (Volume 1: Substances, Quidités et Accidents. Traité des accidents. Traité des quidités des étants), transl. by C. König–Pralong in collaboration with R. Imbach. Intro. by K. Flasch, Paris: Vrin, 2008.
  • Œuvres Choisies (Volume 2: Traité de la Vision Béatifique), transl. by A.–S. Robin Fabre in collaboration with R. Imbach, Paris: Vrin, 2012.

German:

  • Abhandlung über den Intellekt und den Erkenntnisinhalt, transl. by B. Mojsisch, Hamburg: Felix Meiner, 1980.
  • Abhandlung über die Akzidentien, transl. by B. Mojsisch, Hamburg: Felix Meiner, 1994.
  • Abhandlung über die beseligende Schau, transl. by B. Mojsisch, Tbilisi: Verlag Meridiani, 2002.
  • Abhandlung über den Ursprung der kategorial bestimmten Realität (ca 5), transl. by B. Mojsisch, in Bochumer Philosophisches Jahrbuch für Antike und Mittelalter, Volume 2, 1997/1998, 157–85.
  • Der tätige Intellekt und die beseligende Schau, transl. by B. Mojsisch, in K. Flasch (ed.), Geschichte der Philosophie in Text und Darstellung, Volume 2, Stuttgart: Reclam, 1982, 412–31.
  • Traktat über die Erkenntnis der getrennten Seienden und besonders der getrennten Seelen, in H. Steffan, Dietrich von Freibergs Traktat De cognitione entium separatorum. Studie und Text, (Ph.D. Dissertation), Bochum: University of Bochum, 1977, 321–477.

Italian:

  • Durata e tempo. Sulle misure. Sulla natura e proprietà dei continui, transl. by A. Colli, Bari: Edizioni di pagina, 2017.
  • L’origine della realtà predicamentali, transl. by A. Colli, Milan: Bompiani, 2010.

C. Secondary Sources

  • Aersten, Jan A., 1999, “Die Transzendentalienlehre bei Dietrich von Freiberg,” in Kandler et al. 1999, 23–47.
  • Beccarisi, Alessandra, 2010, “Johannes Picardi von Lichtenberg, Dietrich von Freiberg und Meister Eckhart: Eine Debatte in Deutschland um 1308”, in A. Speer and D. Wirmer (eds.), 1308: Eine Topographie historischer Gleichzeitigkeit, Berlin / New York: De Gruyter, 516–38.
  • Berland, Frédéric, 2007, “La généalogie du sujet moderne et la notion de substance chez Descartes et Dietrich de Freiberg,” in O. Boulnois (ed.), Généalogie du sujet. De Saint Anselme à Malebranche, Paris: Vrin, 55–73.
  • Biard, Joël, Dragos Calma and Ruedi Imbach (eds.), 2009, Recherches sur Dietrich de Freiberg, Turnhout: Brepols.
  • Birkenmajer, Aleksander, 1922, “Drei neue Handschriften der Werke Meister Dietrichs,” Beträge zur Geschichte der Philosophie des Mittelalters, 20(5): 70–90.
  • Boyer, Carl B., 1959, The Rainbow: From Myth to Mathematics, New York: Thomas Yoseloff.
  • Calma, Dragos, 2009, “La connaissance réflexive de l’intellect agent. Le ‘premier averroïsme’ et Dietrich de Freiberg”, in Biard et al. 2009, 63–105.
  • –––, 2010, Le Poids de la citation. Étude sur les sources arabes et grecques dans l’œuvre de Dietrich de Freiberg, Fribourg: Academic Press Fribourg.
  • Colli, Andrea, 2008, “Sensi, immaginazione e intelletto. Un’analisi delle forme conoscitive nel De origine rerum praedicamentalium”, Annali del Dipartimento di Filosophia, 14, Florence: Firenze University Press, 5–15.
  • –––, 2009, “Aevum currens” e durata dell’anima: l’influenza agostiniana nel pensiero di Dietrich di Freiberg, Angelicum, 86: 713–28.
  • –––, 2010, Tracce Agostiniane Nell’Opera Di Teodorico Di Freiberg, Genoa / Milan: Marietti.
  • –––, 2014, “The ‘Nobility’ of the Agent Intellect and its Sources: Thomas Aquinas, Matthew of Aquasparta and Dietrich of Freiberg on De Anima 430a18–19”, Schede Medievali, 52: 203–18.
  • Conolly, Brian F., 2014, “Dietrich of Freiberg on the Succession of Forms in the Intensification of Qualities”, Recherches de Théologie et Philosophie médiévales, 81(1): 1–35.
  • –––, 2004, Studies in the Metaphysics of Dietrich von Freiberg, Ph.D. Dissertation, Bloomington: Indiana University.
  • Decaix, Véronique, 2013, “Le temps comme structure catégoriale chez Dietrich de Freiberg”, in P. Avez, C. Capet, and G. Guyomarc’h (eds.), Sentir et penser, Lille: Presses Universitaires du Septentrion, 53–66.
  • –––, 2013, “Les transcendantaux et l’Un: Dietrich de Freiberg à l’école de Thomas d’Aquin”, Bochumer philosophisches Jachbuch für Antike und Mittelalter, 16: 146–62.
  • –––, 2013, “Théologie rationnelle ou métaphysique? Les deux sens de la métaphysique chez Dietrich de Freiberg”, Quaestio,13: 303–21.
  • –––, 2014, “Structure et fonction de la causalité essentielle chez Dietrich de Freiberg”, Chôra (χώρα). Revue d’études anciennes et médiévales, 12: 171–88.
  • –––, 2021, Constituer le réel. Noétique et métaphysique chez Dietrich de Freiberg, Paris: Vrin.
  • –––, 2024, “Dietrich of Freiberg on the Generation and Differentiation of Colours”, in V. Decaix and K. Ierodiakonou (eds.), Theories of Colours from Democritus to Descartes, London: Routledge, 233–53.
  • Dyroff, Adolf, 1915, “Über Heinrich und Dietrich von Freiberg”, Philosophisches Jahrbuch, 28: 55–63.
  • Eckert, Willehad P., 1957, “Dietrich von Freiberg,” Neue Deutsche Biographie, Volume 3, Berlin: Historischen Kommission bei der Bayerischen Akademie der Wissenschaften.
  • –––, 1959, “Dietrich von Freiberg,” in Lexikon für Theologie und Kirche, Volume 3, ed. W. Kasper et al., Freiberg: Herder–Verlag, 384.
  • Federici Vescovini, Graziella, 2008, “La nozione di oggetto secundo la Perspectiva di Teodorico di Freiberg”, in G. Federici Vescovini and O. Rignani (eds.), Oggetto e spazio. Fenomenologia dell’oggetto, forma e cosa dai secoli XIII–XIV ai post–cartesiani, Florence: SISMEL – Edizioni Galluzzo, 81–89.
  • Finke, Heinrich, 1891, Ungedruckte Dominikanerbriefe des 13. Jahrhunderts, Paderborn: F. Schöningh.
  • Flasch, Kurt, 1972, “Kennt die mittelalterliche Philosophie die konstitutive Funktion des menschlichen Denkens? Eine Untersuchung zu Dietrich von Freiberg”, Kant-Studien, 63: 182–206.
  • –––, 1978, “Zum Ursprung der neuzeitlichen Philosophie im späten Mittelalter. Neue texte und Perspektiven”, Philosophisches Jahrbuch Freiburg, 85(1):1–19.
  • –––, 1984, “Bemerkungen zu Dietrich von Freiberg De origine rerum praedicamentalium”, in K. Flasch (ed.), Von Meister Dietrich zu Meister Eckhart, Hamburg: Felix Meiner, 35–45.
  • –––, 1985, “Von Dietrich zu Albert,” Freiburger Zeitschrift für Philosophie und Theologie, 32: 7–26.
  • ––– (ed.), 1987, Von Meister Dietrich zu Meister Eckhart, Hamburg: Felix Meiner.
  • –––, 1986, “Procedere ut imago. Das Hervorgehen des Intellekts aus seinem göttlichen Grund bei Meister Dietrich, Meister Eckhart und Berthold von Moosburg”, in K. Ruh (ed.), Abendländische Mystik im Mittelalter, Stuttgart: Metzler, 125–34.
  • –––, 1998, “Converti ut imago – Rückkher als Bild: Eine Studie zur Theorie des Intellekts bei Dietrich von Freiberg und Meister Eckhart”, Freiburger Zeitschrift für Philosophie und Theologie, 45: 130–50.
  • –––, 2007, Dietrich von Freiberg. Philosophie, Theologie, Naturforschung um 1300, Frankfurt: Klostermann.
  • –––, 2007, “Introduction”, in Dietrich de Freiberg, Œuvres choisies. I Substances, quidités et accidents, Paris: Vrin.
  • –––, 2008, D’Averroès à Maître Eckhart, les sources arabes de la « mystique » allemande, Paris: Vrin.
  • –––, 2008, “Dietrich von Freiberg und Siger von Brabant. Eine Studie zur ‘Schule’ Alberts des Großen”, in A. Beccarisi, R. Imbach, Porro (dir.), Per Perscutationem philosophicam. Neue Perspektiven der Mittelalterlichen Forschung, Hamburg: Felix Meiner, 127–41.
  • Führer, Markus, 1999, “The Agent Intellect in the Writings of Meister Dietrich of Freiberg and its Influence on the Cologne School,” in Kandler et al. 1999, 69–88.
  • Führer, Markus and Stephen Gersh, 2014, “Dietrich of Freiberg and Berthold of Moosburg”, in S. Gersh (ed.), Interpreting Proclus From Antiquity to the Renaissancet, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 299–317.
  • Gauthier, Casimir, 1910, “Un psychologue de la fin du XIIIe siècle. Thierry de Fribourg”, Revue augustinienne, 15: 657–73; 16: 178–206, 541–66.
  • Goris, Wouter, 1999, “Dietrich von Freiberg und Meister Eckhart über das Gute”, in Kandler et al. 1999, 169–88.
  • Grant, Edward, 1961, “The Scientific Methodology of Theodoric of Frieberg: A Case Study ofthe Relationship between Science and Philosophy by William A. Wallace”, Speculum, 36(1): 188–94.
  • Husson, Matthieu. 2009. “Les figures dans les textes optiques de Dietrich de Freiberg”, in Biard et al. 2009, 239–64.
  • Imbach, Ruedi, 1979, “Gravis iactura verae doctrinae. Prolegomena zu einer Interpretation der Schrift De ente et essentia Dietrichs von Freiberg”, Freiburger Zeitschrift für Philosophie und Theologie, 26: 369–425.
  • –––, 1996, “Metaphysik, Theologie und Politik : Zur Diskussion zwischen Nikolaus von Straßburg und Dietrich von Freiberg über die Abtrennbarkeit der Akzidentien”, Theologie und Philosophie, 61: 359–65 [repr. in Quodlibeta, Ausgewählte Artikeln, Fribourg: Academic Press Fribourg, 1996, 251–95].
  • –––, 1998, “Pourquoi Thierry de Freiberg a–t–il critiqué Saint Thomas d’Aquin? Remarques sur le De accidentibus”, Freiburger Zeitschrift für Philosophie und Theologie, 45(1–2): 116–29.
  • –––, 1999, “L’antithomisme de Thierry de Freiberg”, Revue Thomiste, 97(1), 245–58.
  • Iremadze, Tengiz, 2004, “Konzeptionen des Denkens im Neuplatonismus. Zur Rezeption der Proklischen Philosophie im deutschen und georgischen Mittelalter: Dietrich von Freiberg – Berthold von Moosburg – Joane Petrizi”, Bochumer Studien zur Philosophie, 40, Amsterdam / Philadelphia: Grüner.
  • Jeck, Udo R., 1994, Aristoteles contra Augustinum: Zur Frage nach dem Verhältnis von Zzit und Seele bei den antiken Aristoteleskommentatoren, im Arabischen Aristotelismus und im 13 Jahrhundert, Philadelphia: John Benjamin.
  • –––, 1999, “Der Spruch des Apollophanes. Dietrich von Freiberg über Pseudo–Dionysius Areopagita in der Schrift De cognitione entium separatorum. Ein Beitrag zur Diskussion kosmologischer Paradoxien im Mittelalter,” in Kandler et al. 1999, 89–119.
  • Kandler, Karl–Hermann, 1990, “Dietrich von Freiberg—zwischen Scholastik und Mystik,” Herbergen der Christenheit, 17: 127–40.
  • –––, 1999, “Theologische Implikationen der Philosophie Dietrichs von Freiberg,” in Kandler et al., 1999, 121–34.
  • –––, 2009, Dietrich von Freiberg. Philosoph—Theologie—Naturforscher, Freiberg: Medienzentrum der Technisches Universität Bergakademie Freiberg.
  • Kandler, Karl–Hermann, Burkhard Mojsisch, and Franz-Bernhard Stammkötter (eds.), 1999, Dietrich von Freiberg. Neue Perspektiven seiner Philosophie, Theologie und Naturwissenschaft, Bochumer Studien zur Philosophie, vol. 28, Amsterdam / Philadelphia: Grüner.
  • King, Evan, 2021, “Sapiens modernus: The Reception of Dietrich of Freiberg in Berthold of Moosburg”, in D. Calma and E. King (eds.), The Renewal of Medieval Metaphysics. Berthold of Moosburg’s Expositio on Proclus’ Elements of Theology, Leiden / Boston: Brill, 243–81. [King 2021 available online]
  • Kobusch, Theo, 1987, “Die Modi des Seienden nach Dietrich von Freiberg”, in Flasch 1987, 46–67.
  • König–Pralong, Catherine, 2008, “Dietrich de Freiberg: métaphysicien allemand antithomiste”, Revue Thomiste, 108(1): 57–79.
  • –––, 2009, “Le traité Des Accidents de Dietrich de Freiberg. Stratégies exégétiques pour une reconduction de l’accidentel au par soi”, in Biard et al. 2009, 107–29.
  • Krebs, Engelbert, 1906, Meister Dietrich. Sein Leben, seine Werke, seine Wissenschaft, in Beiträge zur Geschichte der Philosophie des Mittelalters, 5: 5–6.
  • Largier, Niklaus, 1999, “Negativität, Möglichkeit und Freiheit. Zur Differenz zwischen der Philosophie Dietrichs von Freiberg und Eckharts von Hochheim,” in Kandler et al. 1999, 149–68.
  • –––, 2001, “Time and Temporality in the ‘German Dominican School’. Outlines of a Philosophical Debate between Nicolaus of Strasbourg, Dietrich of Freiberg, Eckhart of Hoheim and Ioannus Tauler”, in P. Porro (ed.) The Medieval Concept of Time : Studies on the Scholastic Debate and its Reception in Early Modern Philosophy, Leiden / Boston / Cologne, Brill: 221–53.
  • Libera, Alain (de), 1987, “La problématique des ‘intentiones primae et secundae’ chez Dietrich de Freiberg,” in Flasch 1987, 68–94.
  • –––, 1994, La Mystique rhénane: d’Albert le Grand à Maître Eckhart, Paris: Seuil.
  • –––, 2009, “D’Averroès en Augustin. Intellect et cogitative selon Dietrich de Freiberg”, in Biard et al. 2009, 15–62.
  • Maurer, Armand, 1956, “The De Quidditatibus Entium of Dietrich of Freiberg and its Criticism of Thomistic Metaphysics”, Mediaeval Studies, 18: 173–203.
  • Mazzarella, Pasquale, 1967, Metafisica e gnoseologia nel pensiero di Teodorico di Vriberg, Naples: La Nuova Cultura.
  • McPike, David R., 2015, Thomas Aquinas on the Separability of Accidents and Dietrich of Freiberg’s Critique, Ph.D. Dissertation, Ottawa: University of Ottawa.
  • Mojsisch, Burkhard, 1977, Die Theorie des Intellekts bei Dietrich von Freiberg, in K. Flasch (ed.), Beihefte zu Dietrich von Freiberg Opera omnia, Volume 1, Hamburg: Felix Meiner.
  • –––, 1980, “La psychologie philosophique d’Albert le Grand et la théorie de l’intellect de Dietrich de Freiberg”, Archives de philosophie, 43: 675–93.
  • –––, 1984, “‘Causa essentialis’ bei Dietrich von Freiberg und Meister Eckhart”, in Flasch 1984, 106–14.
  • –––, 1985, “Mittelalterliche Grundlagen der neuzeitlichen Erkenntnistheorie”, in M. Gerwing and G. Ruppert (eds.), Renovatio et Reformatio, Münster: Aschendorff, 155–69.
  • –––, 1986, “‘Dynamik der Vernunft’ bei Dietrich von Freiberg und Meister Eckhart”, in K. Ruh (ed.), Abendländische Mystik im Mittelalter, Stuttgart: J.B. Metzler, 135–44.
  • –––, 1987, “Sein als Bewußt–Sein. Die Bedeutung des ens conceptionale bei Dietrich von Freiberg”, in Flasch 1987, 95–105.
  • –––, 1994, “Averroistische Elemente in der Intellekttheorie Dietrichs von Freiberg”, in F. Niewöhner and L. Sturlese (eds.), Averroismus im Mittelalter und in der Renaissance, Zürich: Spur Verlag, 1994, 180–186
  • –––, 1997, “The Theory of Intellectual Construction in Theodoric of Freiberg”, Bochumer Philosophisches Jahrbuch für Antike und Mittelalter, 2: 69–81.
  • –––, 1998, “Dietrich von Freiberg : Tractatus de origine rerum praedicamentalium”, in K. Flasch (dir.), Hauptwerke der Philosophie. Vol. 2 : Mittelalter, Stuttgart: Reclam, 318–32.
  • –––, 1999, “Aristoteles’ Kritik an Platons Theorie der Ideen und die Dietrich von Freiberg berücksichtigende Kritik dieser Kritik seitens Bertholds von Moosburg”, in Kandler et al. 1999, 267–81.
  • –––, 2000, “Konstruktive Intellektualität. Dietrich von Freiberg und seine neue Intellektheorie”, in J. A. Aertsen (ed.), Geistesleben im 13. Jahrhundert, Miscellanea Medievalia, 27, Berlin / New York: De Gruyter, 70–8.
  • –––, 2000, “Dietrich von Freiberg – ein origineller Rezipient der Mens – und Cogitatio–Theorie Augustins”, in J. Brachtendorf (ed.), Gott und sein Bild. Augustins De Trinitate im Spiegel gegenwärtiger Forschung, Paderborn / Munich / Vienna / Zürich: Schöningh, 241–47.
  • –––, 2008, “Die Theorie des Bewußtseins (ens conceptionale) bei Dietrich von Freiberg. Aristoteles–Rezeption und Aristoteles–Transformation im 13. Jhdt”, in A. Beccarisi, R. Imbach, and P. Porro (eds.), Per perscrutationem philosophicam, Neue Perspektiven der mittelalterlichen Forschung. Loris Sturlese zum 60. Geburstag gewidmet, Hamburg: Felix Meiner, 142–55.
  • Pagnoni–Sturlese, Maria Rita, 1978, “La ‘Quaestio utrum in Deo sit aliqua vis cognitiva inferior intellectu’ di Teodorico di Freiberg”, in Xenia Medii Aevi Historiam Illustrantia, oblata Thomae Kaeppeli O., Rome: Edizioni di Storia E Letteratura, 101–74.
  • –––, 1987, “Filosofia della natura e filosofia dell’intelletto in Teodorico di Freiberg e Bertoldo di Moosburg”, in Flasch 1987, 115–27.
  • Perler, Dominik, 2002, Theorien der Intentionalität im Mittelalter, Frankfurt: Klostermann.
  • –––, 2003, Théories de l’intentionnalité au Moyen Âge, Paris: Vrin.
  • –––, 2015. “What is a Dead Body? Richard of Mediavilla and Dietrich of Freiberg on a Metaphysical Puzzle”, Recherches de Théologie et Philosophie médiévales, 82(1): 61–87.
  • Porro, Pasquale, 2009, “Res Praedicamenti e ratio praedicamenti. Una nota su Teodorico di Freiberg e Enrico di Gand”, in Biard et al. 2009, 131–43.
  • –––, 2013. “Déduction catégoriale et prédicaments relatifs à la fin du XIIIe siècle : le De origine rerum praedicamentalium de Dietrich de Freiberg et son contexte”, Quaestio, 13, 2013, 197–220.
  • Putallaz, François–Xavier, 1991, La Connaissance de soi au XIIIe siècle, Paris: Vrin.
  • Rehn, Rudolf, 1984, “Quomodo tempus sit? Zur Frage nach dem Sein der Zeit bei Aristoteles und Dietrich von Freiberg”, in Flasch 1984, 1–11.
  • Robin, Anne-Sophie, 2009, “L’antithomisme de Dietrich de Freiberg dans le De visione beatifica”, in Biard et al. 2009, 165–91.
  • Roesner, Martina, 2004, “Continu, individu, esprit. La conception du temps chez le jeune Heidegger face à la théorie du temps de Dietrich de Freiberg”, Archives de Philosophie, 67: 465–91.
  • Roudaut, Sylvain, 2022, “Dietrich of Freiberg’s Theory of Perfectional Forms”, Vivarium, 60(1): 28–62.
  • –––, 2020, “The Definition of Contrariety and the Classification of Forms in Dietrich of Freiberg’s De Natura contrariorum”, Recherches de Théologie et de Philosophie médiévales, 87(1): 27–58.
  • Stammkötter, Franz-Bernhard, 1999, “Dietrich von Freiberg und die praktische Philosophie”, in Kandler et al. 1999, 135–47.
  • Steffan, Hartmut, 1977, Dietrich von Freibergs Traktat De cognitione entium separatorum. Studie und Text, Ph.D. Dissertation, Bochum: University of Bochum.
  • Stegmüller, Friedrich, 1942, “Meister Dietrich von Freiberg über die Zeit und das Sein”, Archives d’histoire doctrinale et littéraire du moyen du moyen âge, 13: 153–221.
  • –––, 1978, “Il De animatione caeli di Teodorico de Freiberg”, in T. Kaeppeli (ed.), Xenia Medii Aevi: Rome, Edizioni di Storia e Letteratura, 175–247.
  • Sturlese, Loris, 1977, “Alle origini della mistica speculativa tedesca. Antichi testi su Teodorico di Freiberg”, Medioevo, 3: 21–87.
  • –––, 1979, “Dietrich von Freiberg,” in K. Ruh (ed.), Die deutsche Literatur des Mittelalters: Verfasserlexikon, Volume 2, Berlin / New York: W. de Gruyter, 127–37.
  • –––, 1984, Dokumente und Forschungen zu Leben und Werke Dietrichs von Freiberg, Hamburg: Felix Meiner.
  • Suárez-Nani, Tiziana, 1989. Tempo ed essere nell’autunno del Medioevo. Il De tempore di Nicola di Strasburgo e il dibattito sulla natura ed senso del tempo agli inizi del XIV secolo, Amsterdam: Grüner.
  • –––, 1998, “Remarques sur l’identité de l’intellect et l’altérité de l’individu chez Dietrich de Freiberg”, in F. Cheneval, Ruedi Imbach, and T. Ricklin (eds.), Albert le Grand et sa réception au Moyen Âge. Hommage à Zénon Kaluza, Fribourg: Éditions Saint-Paul Fribourg, 96–115.
  • –––, 1999, “Substances séparées, Intelligences et Anges chez Thierry de Freiberg”, in Kandler et al. 1999, 46–67.
  • –––, 2009, “Les êtres et leurs lieux”, in Biard et al. 2009, 145–63.
  • Tétreau, Richard D., 1966, The Agent intellect in Meister Dietrich of Freiberg: Study and Text, Ph.D. Dissertation, Toronto: University of Toronto.
  • Wallace, William A., 1959, The Scientific Methodology of Theodoric of Freiberg, Fribourg: Fribourg University Press.
  • –––, 1961, “Gravitational Motion According to Theodoric of Freiberg”, The Thomist, 24: 327–52.
  • Winkler, Norbert, 1999, “Dietrich von Freiberg und Meister Eckhart in der Kontroverse mit Thomas von Aquin. Intellektnatur und Gnade in der Schrift Von der wirkenden und der vermögenden Vernunft, die Eckhart von Gründig zugeschrieben wird”, in Kandler et al. 1999, 189–266.

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Copyright © 2025 by
Sylvain Roudaut <sylvain.roudaut@u-paris.fr>
Véronique Decaix <Veronique.Decaix@univ-paris1.fr>
Markus Führer

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free