Divine Freedom

First published Wed Apr 23, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Klaas Kraay replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

The topic of divine freedom concerns the extent to which a divine being — in particular, the supreme divine being, God — can be free. There are, of course, many different conceptions of who or what God is. This entry will focus on one enormously important and influential model, according to which God is a personal being who exists necessarily, who is essentially omnipotent, omniscient, perfectly good, and perfectly rational, and who is the creator and sustainer of all that contingently exists.[1] (For more discussion of these attributes, see the entries on omnipotence, omniscience, perfect goodness, and creation and conservation.)

God, so construed, is widely held to have a will, and God’s will is widely thought to be free – although divine freedom is understood in various ways, to be set out below in section 1.[2] Why hold that God has free will? Kittle (2016) offers four typical reasons: (1) God is a personal being, and free will is required for personhood; (2) freedom is a perfection that one should expect the supreme being to have; (3) freedom is required for moral responsibility, and God is morally responsible;[3] and (4) the freedom of God’s purposes and actions gives them greater significance than they would otherwise have.[4] The idea that God is free can also be motivated by (5) appeal to sacred texts and religious traditions that depict God this way.[5]

This entry will not attempt to summarize everything that has been said throughout the history of philosophy or theology about the freedom of God; it will instead focus on the contemporary discussion of divine freedom among analytic philosophers. Three goals can be discerned in this literature. One is expository: philosophers develop and defend interpretations of what canonical figures have held about this issue.[6] A second goal might be termed ‘constructive-critical’: philosophers devise models of God’s freedom, while criticizing rival views – whether or not these are found in, or inspired by, canonical sources. The third goal is to discover connections between models of divine freedom and the question of whether God exists. This entry will not discuss the first. It will focus primarily on the second goal, by setting out the central models of divine freedom found in the literature (sections 1.1–1.4), and the contexts to which these models have been applied (sections 2.1–2.7). The third goal will be discussed along the way, and the relevant threads will be drawn together and extended in section 2.7.

Here are two important issues pertaining to divine freedom that will not be discussed further in this entry. The first is whether God is free with respect to creating the things that contingently exist. Some thinkers have understood creation to be an involuntary consequence of God’s nature, whereas others have thought that God freely chooses to create.[7] The second is a particular issue for Christians. Traditional Christian doctrine holds that God is tri-personal, and that Christ, the second person of the Trinity, has two natures: one fully human, the other fully divine. Unsurprisingly, then, questions about whether Christ is free (and if so, in what fashion) have long been discussed. For a survey of some recent work on this topic, see Pawl and Timpe (2016).

Two preliminary points are worth mentioning before continuing. First, while it has been argued that human freedom is only analogically similar to divine freedom, the contemporary discussion generally takes for granted that there is univocity between divine freedom and human freedom, meaning that the same concepts are in play, and are to be understood in the same way.[8] Second, granting this univocity, it remains an open question whether, if human beings and God are free, they have the same sort of freedom.[9]

1. Conditions for Divine Freedom

Whether human beings have free will, and if so, what this amounts to, are perennial questions throughout the history of philosophy, and they continue to receive enormous attention. (See the entry on free will.) The contemporary literature on human freedom is much larger than the contemporary literature on divine freedom, and – unsurprisingly – the former influences the latter, with respect to how issues are framed, which positions are articulated, and how these positions are defended.[10]

Theories of human free will are traditionally divided into two groups: compatibilist and incompatibilist. The former hold that human free will is compatible with determinism; the latter hold that the two are incompatible. (For more on this, see the entries on compatibilism, on incompatibilist (nondeterministic) theories of free will, and on arguments for incompatibilism.) Of course, neither view entails that human beings actually have free will, and both views are consistent with this claim. But the traditional way of understanding this division is not helpful for categorizing theories of divine free will. That’s because the (causal) determinism at issue holds that the future is fully determined by the past states of the universe, together with the laws of nature – but theists generally hold that God created and has complete control over the universe and the laws of nature, so God cannot be determined by them (e.g., Swinburne 1977, 128–9; Leftow 2023, 170). As we will see, however, while God’s actions cannot be determined in this way, some philosophers have argued that God’s actions are nevertheless determined by his nature – in particular, his perfect goodness or his perfect rationality. Compatibilists about divine freedom hold that God can nevertheless be free even if God’s actions are determined in this way, whereas incompatibilists deny this.

Libertarianism is one of the traditional theories of human free will. It is the conjunction of incompatibilism with the claim that human beings are free. (While this is a minority view among philosophers in general, it is a much more popular view among philosophers of religion in particular.[11]) A libertarian about divine freedom, then, holds that God is free, and that God’s actions are not determined in any relevant way. Libertarianism is often taken to involve an additional commitment to the Principle of Alternative Possibilities, one generic version of which holds that a person acts freely only if, at the time of action, she could have chosen otherwise. (That said, there are libertarians who reject this requirement, and compatibilists who endorse it. For more on this, see the entries on free will and on moral responsibility and the principle of alternative possibilities.) The remainder of this section discusses several putative conditions for divine freedom, beginning with this one. Defenders of these conditions typically hold that they are necessary for divine freedom – and sometimes hold that they are sufficient, too.

1.1 Alternate Possibilities At the Time of Action

An ordinary, intuitive conception of freedom – which has a long historical pedigree – requires that alternate possibilities be available to the agent at the time of action. Thomas Flint expresses this idea as follows: “an agent is truly free with respect to an action only if the situation in which he is placed is logically and causally compatible with both his performing and his not performing the action” (1983, 255). Theodore Guleserian expresses this idea in terms of the power to do otherwise than one does at the time of action, and holds it to be a necessary truth: “Necessarily, for every [agent] x, [act] A, and [circumstance] C, if x is free with respect to doing A in C then x has the power to refrain from doing A” (1985, 221). Others who endorse this requirement on divine freedom include William Rowe (2004), Simon Kittle (2016, 2022), and Frances Howard-Snyder (2017).

Beyond its intuitive appeal and historical pedigree, there is another reason why some hold that divine freedom requires alternate possibilities. Arguments from evil attempt to show that God does not exist by appeal to some fact(s) about evil. (See the entry on the problem of evil.) An important family of responses invokes human free will. In simple terms, these hold that human beings freely bring about evil, and that this evil does not count against God’s existence, since it is a very great good for human beings to have freedom – even if they misuse it. These responses take human freedom to require alternate possibilities: after all, if human free will were compatible with determinism, God could bring it about that human beings never bring about evil, and that they do so freely. Given the enormous value accorded to human free will of this sort in these responses, it’s natural for their defenders to hold that God also has this sort of freedom (Flint 1984; Morriston 1985, 2000; Howard-Snyder 2017.)[12] Of course, as noted above, some thinkers deny that divine freedom and human freedom must be understood in the same way.

All that said, the claim that divine freedom always requires alternate possibilities at the time of action is a minority view in the contemporary literature. It is rejected in various ways by, for example, Talbott 1988; Lehe 1986; Senor 2008; McCann 2013; Timpe 2014; Director 2017; Murphy 2017; Daeley 2021, and Couenhouven 2012, 2016, and 2023. One important motivation for denying this invokes perfect goodness. Since God is a necessary being, and is essentially perfectly good, it seems that there can be no alternate possibilities in which God’s actions fail to be perfectly good. If this is correct, then those who wish to maintain that God freely acts with perfect goodness must hold that divine freedom does not always require alternate possibilities.[13]

One final issue is worth mentioning. Some authors follow Alvin Plantinga in distinguishing morally significant freedom from freedom. According to Plantinga, “… an action is morally significant, for a given person at a given time, if it would be wrong for him to perform the action but right to refrain, or vice versa” (1974, 166). Given this distinction, and given the model of freedom that requires alternate possibilities, to hold that God cannot fail to act in a morally perfect fashion is to say that God lacks morally significant freedom – but this is compatible with God having morally insignificant freedom.

1.2 Absence of External Constraints

It seems obvious that external constraints can be freedom-undermining: for example, a prisoner’s lack of freedom to leave is due to constraints imposed by the prison, the cell, the shackles, etc. Likewise, it is widely held that a necessary condition for divine freedom is the absence of external constraints on God’s will (e.g., Swinburne 1977; Lehe 1986; Morris and Menzel 1986; Helm 1988; Wierenga 2002; Senor 2008; Talbott 2009; Oppy 2014; Timpe 2014; Couenhouven 2023, and Leftow 2023). Robert Lehe expresses this idea as follows: “A more profound sense of freedom than the liberty to do or refrain from performing an action is freedom in the sense of being determined by nothing and subject to no authority beyond oneself” (1986, 322). Thomas Morris and Christopher Menzel similarly state that God is “neither constrained nor compelled by anything existing independent of God and his causally efficacious power” (1986, 357). Brian Leftow (2023) offers the most detailed defence of this condition. He identifies several candidates for what might count as external contraints, and argues that none of these truly bind God. These are: logic and mathematics, the laws of nature, the past, and the free choices of creatures (and their consequences). Leftow himself holds that logic and mathematics are not external to God, since they arise out of God’s nature, but he notes that even if this is incorrect, they should not be deemed genuine constraints; they instead mark where possibilities run out. He then argues that on several prominent accounts of the laws of nature, these also cannot count as external constraints on God. Next, he argues that although God cannot change the past, this is not an external constraint, because if God is atemporal, then time is God’s creation, and if God is temporal, then time is just a consequence of God’s nature. Finally, Leftow argues that the actions of free creatures cannot be treated as an external constraint: after all, God permits any actions that occur, and always has the power to destroy them (or to refrain from sustaining them in existence.)

1.3 Responsive to Reasons

Human beings are limited in knowledge, rationality, and will-power. We sometimes fail to grasp reasons for action. Even if we grasp them, we sometimes fail to weigh them properly. And even if we grasp them and weigh them properly, we sometimes nevertheless fail to act on them appropriately (see the entry on weakness of will). God, however, has no such limitations. As Brian Leftow puts it: “Omniscience guarantees that God fully grasps all the facts, and the reason-giving force of any fact. Perfect wisdom or rationality guarantees that He acts on His reasons” (2023, 175; and see also Pearce and Pruss 2012, 410–412). In a similar vein, Thomas Senor writes:

God’s reason for having the volition God has, and for performing the action God does, is God’s recognition of the reasons for performing the action in question, God’s knowing and appreciating all the reasons for refraining from that action, and God’s seeing that the reasons for performing the action are weightier than the reasons for refraining. It’s God’s understanding of the reasons that leads God to act as God does. (2008, 183)

Acting in a way that responds to reasons is sometimes thought to be a necessary condition for free action (Pearce and Pruss 2012, 411). Senor appears to believe that it is sufficient (2008, 184), and Swinburne thinks that is both necessary and sufficient: “a person is ‘perfectly free’ iff his actions are governed by reason alone” (1977, 146).

It is generally thought that if the reasons for God’s acting a certain way are decisive, then God will, necessarily, act that way (Murphy 2017, 28). This might seem freedom-undermining, but defenders of this condition on divine freedom disagree. In fact, they think that infallibly acting on decisive reasons is constitutive of perfect freedom. Fales, for example, claims that: “For God, [the] correct choice is as obvious as it can be. But that means that God is perfectly free. His rationality functions flawlessly, unmarred by ignorance, weak reasoning, or temptation. It turns out, then, that God’s freedom, precisely because it is perfect, represents a limiting case of freedom” (1994, 84, and see also Talbott 2009, and Timpe 2014, 2016a, and 2016b). Clearly, on this view, alternative possibilities are not always required for freedom.

Two further points are worth mentioning. To say that God acts on reasons needn’t involve the claim that God engages in discursive reasoning in the way that humans do. Even if God just ‘sees’ directly what reason dictates, and acts accordingly, it can still be maintained that God acts on reasons (Fales 1994, 83). Second, those who hold that God is perfectly responsive to reasons needn’t require that God can freely φ only if there are undefeated reasons to φ. Swinburne (1977), for example, thinks that if there are two equally good actions, and God can only perform one of them, then God can still freely choose, even if reason favours neither choice. (For more on this scenario, see section 2.3 below.)

1.4 Agent Causation / Ultimate Sourcehood

Because God’s actions are neither caused nor determined by anything outside of himself, God is often taken to be the ultimate source of his actions. Sometimes this idea is expressed in the language of agent causation.[14] On this view, God is the sole cause of God’s actions, or, as Thomas Talbott puts it, God is “the uncaused cause of every event he causes to occur” (2009, 380). Importantly, agent causation does not reduce to event causation on this view, since the agent, God, is the ultimate source of action, rather than some event involving God. A bit more specification is required. As Graham Oppy notes, agent causation should be non-chancy, non-deviant, and there should be no internal defeating conditions on freedom of action, such as addiction or psychological disorder (2014, 255–6). Clearly, no such conditions obtain in God’s case. This model of divine freedom is popular in the literature; for elaborations and defences of it, see Wierenga (2002), Senor (2008), Couenhoven (2012, 2023), Talbott (2009), Timpe (2014), and Daeley (2021).

A typical objection to ultimate sourcehood accounts of freedom is that it is at best mysterious, and at worst incoherent, to say that an agent causes actions in a way that is not reducible to causation by mental states or events. As Thomas Talbott expresses the worry: “when agency theorists appeal to agent causation in an effort to distinguish a free choice, uncaused by any events, from random chance, they too often merely deepen the very mystery that they are trying to explain away” (2009, 384). (For elaborations of this worry, and discussion of replies, see section 2.5 of the entry on free will and section 3.3. of the entry on incompatibilist (non-deterministic) theories of free will.)

A second objection to this model of divine freedom is that it conflicts with the idea that God acts on reasons. Rebekah Rice articulates this concern as follows: “The challenge for the pure agency view concerns its ability to ascribe to reasons their proper role as motivators of action. If we’re willing to grant that in acting, God acts for a reason (or a set of reasons), where that reason motivates God to so act, then there will be some true account of reasons explanation for divine action.” On the agent-causal view, however, “[w]hat explains God’s forming the relevant intention [to act] is his exercise of agent-causal power. But this is not to give a reasons explanation since it remains altogether unclear in what sense the intention was formed for a reason” (2016, 267, emphasis added).[15] For responses to this sort of worry in the human case, Clarke (2003, Chapter 8).

Another objection holds that if God’s nature fully determines how God will act, then this undermines freedom as much as external determination would.[16] William Alston rejects this out of hand, saying: “God’s activity is the activity of a free agent in the most unqualified sense. Not only are the things He directly brings about the result of ‘agent causality’ rather than ‘event causality,’ even where the events or states are states of His own psyche; it is also the case, if this is indeed a separate point, that no exercise of this agent causality is determined by anything, not even by states of Himself” (1988, 269, as quoted in Rice 2016, 259). But Wes Morriston (2006), in contrast, defends this objection by invoking the following thought experiment. He imagines a finite person named Bonnie Chance who comes to exist purely by chance, without any external cause whatsoever, and whose nature prevents her from ever choosing other than what rationality and morality require. Morriston thinks it’s perfectly clear that Bonnie should not be deemed free: “[s]ince it is Bonnie’s nature – and not Bonnie herself – that is responsible for her good behavior, we can only conclude that she is not acting freely” (96).[17] Likewise, Morriston thinks, an agent-causal account will not work for divine freedom.

Here are three responses to this objection. First, some hold that it is a mistake to distinguish between God and God’s nature, since the two are identical. This is a version of the doctrine of divine simplicity (see the entry on divine simplicity). If this view is correct, then there can be no sense in which God is rendered unfree by God’s nature.[18] A second response attacks the Bonnie Chance example. Talbott (2009) distinguishes between essence and nature. The former is the set of a thing’s essential properties; the latter is a person’s accidental character traits, behavioural dispositions, and the like. Talbott grants that an ordinary person’s nature, in this latter sense, can indeed be part of a causal explanation of action, such as when someone with an honest character tells the truth. But, Talbott thinks, this is irrelevant to the present objection, and so he says that Morriston must have God’s essence in mind. Talbott then points out that an essence is an abstract object, and hence is causally inert – in which case it cannot abrogate God’s freedom.

A third response attempts to place the locus of God’s ultimate control logically prior to God’s nature, by holding that God causes God’s nature. This strategy is defended by Morris and Menzel (1986) and Morris (1987). Morris and Menzel defend a view called theistic activism, according to which necessarily existing abstract objects like numbers, properties, and propositions (together with their truth values and modal status) are quite literally caused by God’s “efficacious intellective activity” (1986, 356). They apply this view to God’s nature, and insist that it does not commit them to the (absurd) claim that God is temporally or metaphysically prior to God. Morriston, however, disagrees: “In sum, it is hard to see how God could create anything without (already, prior to creating it) having a nature that makes it possible for him to create it. If, therefore, God causes his own nature, his nature must be at least part of its own cause, and the dread spectre of self-causation rears its ugly head” (2000, 357; 2006.). Similarly, Bergmann and Cover (2006) hold that on this view, God’s exerting his causal power to cause divine properties is both logically prior to and logically posterior to his exemplifiying the property of having causal powers – which is incoherent. William Rowe (2004, Chapter 7) agrees that this view is incoherent – but also holds that even if it is coherent, it will not suffice to secure God’s freedom. According to Rowe, freedom requires the ability to choose between alternate possibilities, but God has no such choice with respect to causing his nature. God’s nature, after all, is essential to God, and God exists in all possible worlds, so God could not have had a different nature than God has. This particular objection, however, is not likely to persuade those who favour ultimate sourcehood over alternative possibilities in their account of divine freedom in the first place.

2. Applications

This section sets out the role that divine freedom plays in seven discussions in contemporary philosophy of religion. The first is about whether there is a conflict between two divine attributes: omnipotence and perfect goodness. The second is about whether God can be deemed free if there is precisely one best of all possible worlds. The third is about whether God can be deemed free if there are multiple unsurpassable worlds (which are either tied or incomparable in value). The fourth is about whether, if God must select an unsurpassable world, this leads to some form of modal collapse. The fifth is about whether God can be deemed free if there are no unsurpassable worlds, but rather an infinite hierarchy of increasingly better worlds. The sixth is about how divine freedom connects to the appropriateness of thanking, praising, and worshipping God. The final subsection examines the role that divine freedom plays in certain arguments for and against God’s existence.

2.1 Omnipotence, Moral Perfection, and Divine Freedom

God is traditionally taken to be both omnipotent and perfectly good, and, moreover, essentially so. Perfect goodness is generally understood to involve moral perfection, so God is thought to be essentially morally perfect as well. Given that God exists necessarily, this means that there is no possible world in which God fails to be omnipotent or morally perfect. But there seems to be a tension between these two attributes. It is natural to think that omnipotence includes the power to act in ways inconsistent with moral perfection. It is also natural to think that one can have this power only if there is at least one possible world in which one acts in such a way. But, of course, if there is a possible world in which God acts in a morally imperfect fashion, then God is not essentially morally perfect. If this reasoning is correct, and if omnipotence and moral perfection are essential properties of God, then this model of God is self-contradictory – in which case God, so construed, cannot exist. We next turn discuss five responses to this challenge found in the literature, with a brief note on how each one pertains to divine freedom.

The most obvious way to resolve this tension is to jettison either omnipotence or moral perfection from one’s concept of God. Peter Geach (1973) famously recommends the former, while J. Gregory Keller (2010) recommends the latter, saying that moral perfection is an incoherent attribute.[19] Morriston (2001) defends a variant of this strategy, suggesting that the best possible combination of attributes needn’t include both omnipotence and moral perfection. This idea can be fleshed out in three ways. The first privileges the former, by insisting that God is omnipotent while holding that God’s moral goodness is as great as it can be, consistent with omnipotence. The second way, which Morriston endorses, privileges the latter, by insisting that God is morally perfect, and as powerful can be, consistent with moral perfection. The third way holds that God has the greatest amount of power and moral goodness that a being can have, even if God is neither omnipotent nor morally perfect.[20] Retaining omnipotence in one’s concept of God, while jettisoning moral perfection, can help to preserve God’s freedom – at least if divine freedom requires alternate possibilities. That’s because on this view, one can hold that it is within God’s power to act in ways inconsistent with moral perfection, which is another way of saying that these are genuine possibilities. But it is not clear that giving up moral perfection can help with the reasons-responsiveness model of divine freedom: what reason could God have, after all, for acting in a morally imperfect way in any possible world? Giving up omnipotence, on the other hand, restricts the scope of divine freedom on an alternate-possibility model of divine freedom, since then God would presumably be unable to perform some logically possible actions. But prioritizing moral perfection at the expense of omnipotence avoids the worry for the reasons-responsiveness model of divine freedom just mentioned. Either move seems compatible with models of divine freedom that prioritize ultimate sourcehood or freedom from external causes. All that said, giving up either omnipotence or moral perfection is costly, given that these are widely thought to be non-negotiable divine attributes.

A second way to resolve the tension holds that God is either contingently omnipotent or contingently morally perfect. On this view, either or both are indeed attributes of God, but not essential attributes: there are worlds in which God fails to exhibit one, or even both.[21] Guleserian (1985, 2000) thinks that God is essentially omnipotent, and that, accordingly, it is logically possible for God to perform actions inconsistent with moral perfection. But given this, he argues, God should not be thought essentially morally perfect. Guleserian further argues that a non-essentially morally perfect being should be thought to be superior to an essentially morally perfect being.[22] As with the previous strategy, giving up essential moral perfection in this way can be thought to preserve God’s freedom – at least if divine freedom requires alternate possibilities. But, as before, it is not clear that that this move can help with a reasons-responsiveness model of divine freedom, because it seems that God could have no reason for acting in a morally imperfect way in any possible world. Meanwhile, this move seems compatible with models of divine freedom that prioritize ultimate sourcehood, or freedom from external causes. But again, all that said, giving up essential moral perfection is still costly, since it is widely thought that this attribute is essential to God.

A third strategy for resolving this tension holds that it is logically impossible for God to act in any way inconsistent with moral perfection, and accordingly, that God’s inability to do so should not be thought to count against omnipotence.[23] One version of this strategy holds that although it is a power for us to be able to act in ways inconsistent with moral perfection, this is not a power for God – it is, instead, a liability. (Or, more precisely, it would be a liability if God were able to act in ways inconsistent with moral perfection, and so God’s inability to do so does not threaten God’s omnipotence.) T.J. Mawson (2005a, 2005b, 2017) argues that the ability to act in morally imperfect ways is only plausibly a power when one is in a situation where one desires an outcome that one reasonably believes one can only achieve by acting in such a way. We frail human beings are all-too-familiar with such desires – but God, of course, has no such desires. Accordingly, Mawson thinks, acting in a fashion inconsistent with moral perfection is not a power for God, but a liability.[24] On this view, God can be thought to freely act in a morally perfect way on three models of divine freedom: God is free from external constraints, God is the ultimate source of God’s actions, and God is responsive to (morally relevant) reasons. But if, on this model, there are no alternate possibilities in which God acts in ways inconsistent with moral perfection, and if freedom requires such possibilities, then God cannot be free.

In an important paper, Pike (1969) rejects the idea that it is logically impossible for God to act in any way inconsistent with moral perfection. Pike holds that while it is logically impossible for God to create a square circle or a married bachelor, because these are not consistently describable entities, there is no such logical impossibility involved in the case at hand. Moreover, Pike thinks, true moral perfection requires one to have the ability to perform morally imperfect actions, while also having the strength of character to refrain. Accordingly, Pike thinks that it is logically possible for God to act in a morally imperfect way, but that since doing so would be “contrary to a firm and stable feature of His nature”, we have “complete assurance that He will not exercise this ability” (216). Thus, he thinks, essential omnipotence and essential moral perfection are compatible – and so this constitutes a fourth way to resolve the tension. The problem with this move is that ‘complete assurance’ that God will not exercise this ability is naturally read as either expressing or entailing the modal claim that there is no possible world in which God exercises this ability – but Pike insists that there are such worlds.[25] At any rate, on Pike’s account, the ‘complete assurance’ that God will not act in a morally imperfect way is difficult to square with an account of divine freedom that requires alternate possibilities. But insofar as it preserves omnipotence, Pike’s account comports well with accounts of divine freedom that involve the absence of external constraints, and being the ultimate source of one’s actions. Moreover, if Pike’s model is coherent, it does seem that God is maximally responsive to (morally relevant) reasons, so it fits well with this view of divine freedom too.[26]

A fifth way to resolve the tension holds that God’s power is not restricted to logical possibility (Talbott 1988). Suppose that God, as a morally perfect being, will ensure that in every world the following proposition is true:

(P)
There is a favourable balance of good over evil.

On this supposition, and given theism, (P) is a necessary truth. Now, it is also a necessary truth that:

(Q)
2 + 2 = 4.

But God does not bring about the truth of (Q), nor is there anything that God could do to bring about the falsity of (Q). In contrast, Talbott says, God does indeed bring about the truth of (P), and, equally, there is something that God could do to bring about its falsity. Accordingly, Talbott thinks, God should be deemed to have the power to perform morally imperfect actions, even though these are logically impossible, given his essential moral perfection. In a move reminiscent of Pike (1969), Talbott thinks that God could exercise this power if he wanted to – but insists that God will never want to. And “since, moreover, his refusal to exercise these powers is in no way determined by antecedent causal conditions outside his control, he is, in the fullest sense, free to exercise them. He is, in the fullest sense, free to exercise his power to bring about certain impossible states of affairs” (Talbott 1988, 9).[27] Evidently, Talbott thinks that this model renders God free in one sense: God is not subject to any external constraints. Moreover, Talbott’s model also fits well with the view that God’s freedom requires ultimate sourcehood or agent causation, and with the reasons-responsiveness account of freedom. It is less clear, however, that this model helps with the alternate possibilities requirement for freedom. After all, appealing to logical impossibilities cannot help to establish alternate (logical) possibilities. At any rate, this move has not been well-received. For example, Zachary Manis says “I cannot fathom how Talbott’s thesis could be true” (2011, n.14), and Rowe dismisses Talbott’s view as “… an instance of ‘language gone on holiday’” (2004, 149). These authors think it is straightforwardly incoherent to hold that God has the power to perform logically impossible tasks.

2.2 Divine Freedom if there is One Best Possible World

As noted, God is held to be the creator and sustainer of all that contingently exists.[28] This idea is typically expressed in the language of worlds. God is pictured as surveying the vast array of possible worlds, and choosing exactly one to be the actual world. This is called actualizing a world.[29] When thinking this way, it is tempting to imagine (a) that God stands outside this landscape of possible worlds in order to survey them; that (b) God creates something in every possible world; that (c) God determines each and every feature of the ensuing world (d) all at once. The first of these claims is false, and the rest are often denied.

Regarding (a): God, as a necessary being, exists in every possible world. On this view, no sense can be made of the idea that God stands outside of the ensemble of worlds in order to select one for actualization. Since the possible worlds there are exhaust the way that things could be, there simply is no vantage point, divine or otherwise, entirely outside this ensemble. As for (b): while it is tempting to conflate world-actualization and creation, it is important to keep them distinct. Creation occurs, let’s say, when God causes some spatiotemporal entity to be actual, but it’s not the case that every instance of world-actualization involves this. Suppose that God exists, but creates nothing at all. If so, there still is an actual world. God, of course, is still responsible for this world’s being actual, and so it makes sense to say that God has actualized it, without creating anything.

With respect to (c), God’s actualizing a world need not mean that he determines each and every feature of the resulting world. Consider, for example, random processes. If a world includes these, then God causes it to be the case that they occur, but he does not determine their outcome. Next, consider a world that includes libertarian-free creatures. Free choices made by these beings shape how the world unfolds, so it makes sense to say that such worlds are jointly actualized by God and by these creatures. As for (d), there is no need to suppose that God’s causal activity in actualizing a world is limited to one act at the (temporal or logical) beginning of that world. Some theists hold that God intervenes from time to time, and on this view, God performs many world-actualizing actions throughout the history of the world being actualized. In addition, as we have seen, theism holds that God’s world-actualizing activity includes sustaining whatever is actual. This also suggests that God’s actualizing activity does not occur ‘all at once’ at the outset of a world.

On what basis does God choose a world to actualize? It is widely taken for granted in this literature that each world has an objective, overall axiological status. On this view, it makes sense to say that one world is good and another is bad, or that one world is better than, or worse than, another. God, as an omniscient being, is taken to know the axiological status of each world, and this knowledge informs God’s choice.

It is generally held that there are three candidate hierarchies of possible worlds. First, perhaps there is exactly one best of all possible worlds. Second, perhaps the hierarchy of worlds has an upper bound, but no unique world at the top. This could happen in two different ways. Perhaps there are two or more equally good unsurpassable worlds. These might include duplicates, or near-duplicates: worlds that differ from each other in only trivial or axiologically irrelevant ways. Alternatively, perhaps there are two or more worlds that are unsurpassed, but that are incomparable with each other.[30] Third, perhaps there are no unsurpassable worlds at all, but instead an infinite hierarchy of increasingly better worlds.

God’s freedom has been discussed on each of these four scenarios. The first scenario is discussed in this section, the second scenario in section 2.3, and the third scenario in section 2.5.[31] While the literature tends to focus on God’s choice of a world, the issues generalize to any case of God’s action (assuming that these actions have objective axiological status). In principle, God might find himself in a situation where there is exactly one best action to perform, or several unsurpassable actions (whether equal or incomparable), or no best action.

If there is exactly one best of all possible worlds, it is natural to think that God will select it. On the accounts of divine freedom set out in sections 1.2, 1.3, and 1.4, this poses no problem for God’s freedom: in choosing the best world, God is maximally responsive to reasons, is not constrained by anything external, and is the ultimate source of his action. But if freedom requires alternate possibilities, as the model discussed in section 1.1 suggests, then God’s choice of the best possible world is free only if God could have chosen a suboptimal world instead. Robert Adams offers a partial, indirect argument for the claim that God could indeed have chosen a suboptimal world, by criticizing two reasons for thinking that God would choose the best world:[32]

(Q)
A creator would necessarily wrong someone (violate someone’s rights), or be less kind to someone than a perfectly good moral agent must be, if he knowingly actualized a less excellent world instead of the best that he could.
(R)
Even if no one would be wronged or treated unkindly by the actualization of an inferior world, the creator’s choice of an inferior world must manifest a defect of character.

Adams argues that God could actualize a sub-optimal world with the following characteristics:

(S)
none of the individual creatures in it would exist in the best of all possible worlds;
(T)
none of the creatures in it has a life which is so miserable on the whole that it would have been better for that creature if it had never existed; and
(U)
every individual creature in the world is at least as happy on the whole as it would have been in any other possible world in which it could have existed.

Against (Q), Adams thinks it obvious that if God were to actualize a world with characteristics (S), (T), and (U), God would neither wrong anyone nor be less than perfectly kind to anyone. Against (R), Adams claims that, far from manifesting a defect of character, God’s choice of an inferior world could manifest the Judeo-Christian virtue of grace, which he defines as ‘… a disposition to love which is not dependent on the merit of the person loved’ (97–8).

Adams’ attacks on (Q) and (R) have not been well-received. With respect to (Q), Michael Levine argues that ‘…the criterion of personal identity Adams’ argument rests upon is both stipulative and counterintuitive’ (1996, 31). David Basinger grants Adam’s account of personal identity, but insists that even if God actualizes a world with characteristics (S), (T), and (U), it may still be the case that God wrongs individuals in that world (1983).[33] With respect to (R), many authors have criticized Adams’ appeal to grace. Most of these authors object either to Adams’ understanding of this virtue or its application to this issue (e.g. Basinger 1983; Thomas 1996; Gale 1991; Grover 2003). In contrast, Erik Wielenberg suggests that even if God exhibits the virtue of grace in actualizing a world other than the best, God also exhibits the absence of a different virtuous trait: the disposition to pursue intrinsically valuable states proportionally (2004, 51–2). Accordingly, Wielenberg thinks, God’s action in selecting a sub-optimal world would manifest a defect of character, just as (R) says.

Moreover, and importantly, William Rowe argues that even if Adams achieves his stated goals of undermining (Q) and (R), this is insufficient for showing that God can select a suboptimal world:

As forceful and persuasive as Adams’s arguments are, I don’t think they yield the conclusion that God’s perfect goodness imposes no requirement on God to [actualize] the best world that he can … What Adams’s argument show, at best, is that God’s moral perfection imposes no moral obligation on God to [actualize] the best world he can. His arguments establish, at best, that God need not be doing anything morally wrong in [actualizing] some other world than the best world. But this isn’t quite the same thing as showing that God’s perfect goodness does not render it necessary that he [actualize] the best world he can (1993, 228, and see 2004, 82. See also Wierenga 2002).

Rowe holds that if God fails to actualize the best possible world, then God’s action in selecting a sub-optimal world is surpassable. And, he says, if God’s action is surpassable, then God is surpassable (1993, 2004). Others have agreed, sometimes by suggesting that God’s choosing the sub-optimal over the optimal would indicate surpassability with respect to goodness, and sometimes by suggesting that it would indicate surpassability with respect to rationality.[34]

One way to resist the idea that God must choose the optimal over the sub-optimal is to invoke satisficing. Defenders of satisficing hold that it can be morally or rationally acceptable to choose the worse over the better. Indeed, Adams’ argument involves an implicit appeal to divine satisficing.[35] He holds that human satisficing, in relevantly similar choice situations, is morally and rationally acceptable – and then Adams suggests that, by parity of reasoning, divine satisficing is likewise acceptable. Thus, for example, Adams considers the case of a man who decides to breed goldfish instead of more excellent beings such as cats or dogs. Adams suggests that the breeder satisfices by choosing a good enough species to breed, and says that there is nothing immoral or irrational in so doing, even if the breeder could have chosen a more excellent species instead (1972, 329). Adams thinks that God can likewise satisfice in his selection of a world, by choosing a sub-optimal one that is nevertheless good enough. Adams’ (S), (T), and (U) thus constitute a partial account of the sort of world that would be good enough for God to actualize. Kraay (2013) offers arguments against the intelligibility of divine satisficing. Tucker (2016) argues that Adam’s argument should be construed as invoking motivated submaximization instead of satisficing, and defends Adams’ claim on this interpretation. Kraay (2021) responds to Tucker (2016).

2.3 Divine Freedom if there are Equally Good, or Incomparable, Unsurpassable Worlds

Suppose that there is not just one unique best of all possible worlds, but multiple unsurpassable worlds. This could happen in several ways. Perhaps there are duplicate unsurpassable worlds, or perhaps there are near-duplicates that differ from each other in trivial ways, or, at any rate, axiologically irrelevant ways. All such worlds would be ‘axiologically tied’, so to speak: they would be equal to each other in unsurpassable value.

Alternatively, perhaps there are failures of comparability between worlds, all of which are nevertheless unsurpassed by any other world.[36] Here are two ways that this could occur. First, there might not be one set of axiological criteria relevant to all worlds: perhaps some worlds are properly to be evaluated by one set of axiological criteria; and other worlds are properly to be evaluated by a different set. Let’s say that pairs of worlds that cannot be evaluated by a common set of axiological criteria are incommensurable. No two incommensurable worlds are overall comparable – precisely because there is no basis for comparison.[37] Second, even if all worlds are commensurable with each other, there might still be failures of comparability between them. Here are two ways this could happen:

  • Consider a comparison between two philosophers, Eunice and Janice, with respect to philosophical talent (Chang 1997, 22–23). Plausibly, there are multiple good-making properties of philosophers (originality, insightfulness, clarity of thought, clarity of expression, and the like), and perhaps there is no single best way to weigh the contributing effects of these on overall talent. Perhaps Eunice surpasses Janice with respect to some properties, but Janice surpasses Eunice with respect to others. If no such ‘sharpening’ is privileged, one might argue that the two philosophers are incomparable, even though they are commensurable with respect to the set of philosophical good-making properties. Arguments like this can be generalized to worlds: if there are multiple legitimate ways to rank a pair of commensurable worlds with respect to a common set of axiological properties, they are incomparable.

  • Several philosophers have argued that when neither of two items surpasses the other, but when a minor improvement to one item fails to make it better than the other, it is reasonable to deem these items incomparable. Inspired by an example given by Raz (1986), Mann (1991, 270–1) imagines an individual’s choice between two different careers. Teresa, in Mann’s story, is faced with the choice between a vocation serving the dying poor in Calcutta, and a successful operatic career.[38] Mann stipulates that neither option can be pursued fully without detriment to the other, and urges that neither option surpasses the other. Nor are they exactly equal, says Mann, since this would mean (for example) that one additional outstanding performance of Tosca would – absurdly – make that career surpass the career in which Teresa serves the poor, and thereby justify Teresa’s choice of a musical career. Again, this sort of argument can be generalized to worlds: if the states of affairs consisting in Teresa’s alternative careers are incomparable, perhaps worlds that include them, ceteris paribus, are incomparable too.[39]

Suppose, then, that God is faced with a hierarchy of worlds that has an upper bound, but no unique unsurpassable world, either because there are duplicates (or near-duplicates) at the top, or because there are failures of comparability between unsurpassable worlds in any of the ways just set out. Against this backdrop, defenders of divine satisficing (like Adams) can hold that God could defensibly choose one of the suboptimal worlds (so long as it is sufficiently good). If this move succeeds, and if alternate possibilities are required for freedom, then one could say that God is free to choose one of the unsurpassable worlds, or else one of the surpassable-but-sufficiently-good ones.

But suppose instead that, given God’s goodness and rationality, God must choose one of the unsurpassable worlds. On this view, if divine freedom requires alternate possibilities, then God could not be deemed free in one important sense: God could not be said to freely choose an unsurpassable world in lieu of a surpassable one. (Of course, if either responsiveness to reasons, lack of external constraints, or ultimate sourcehood are sufficient for divine freedom, then one could still hold that God will freely select an unsurpassable world in lieu of a surpassable one.)

On this scenario, there are many alternative unsurpassable worlds that God might have chosen instead of the one that God chooses. So, if alternate possibilities are necessary for freedom, then one could hold that there is a different sense in which God is free: God freely chooses one of the unsurpassable worlds instead of any other one. (Equally, of course, if lack of external constraints, or ultimate sourcehood, are sufficient for divine freedom, then God could plausibly be deemed free in this way as well.) For defences of divine freedom along these lines, see Swinburne (1977), Flint (1983), Garcia (1992), Pruss (2016), and Mawson (2017).

Some authors, however, hold that either (a) God is not free with respect to choosing one out of the many unsurpassable worlds, or that (b) God’s freedom is trivial in this case. David Mason is in the former camp, saying that this is “not so much a free decision as something like the toss of a coin or sheer capriciousness” (1982, 196). Edward Wierenga agrees that this is not an adequate account of God’s freedom, “… for it amounts to saying that God is free only when it does not matter what he does” and that God “might as well choose blindly or arbitrarily” (433). Thomas Senor is in the latter camp, at least with respect to a choice between duplicates or trivially different worlds, saying that in such a case, God’s “freedom is strictly superficial” (2008, 191).

Those who think that God is unfree (or has only trivial freedom) in such cases seem to be driven by the responsiveness-to-reasons account of divine freedom. After all, it seems that God could have no rational basis for choosing one unsurpassable world from a set of duplicates or trivially-different alternatives, or between incomparable unsurpassable worlds. The image of God’s being faced with a choice between multiple unsurpassable worlds, and lacking a rational basis for choosing any of them, calls to mind the infamous story of Burdian’s ass, in which a donkey is equally distant from two bales of hay, and, lacking a rational basis for choosing one over the other, starves to death.[40] It’s important to see that God’s situation is different in one important respect: the donkey can refrain from choosing a bale of hay, but God cannot refrain from actualizing a world. Still, the crucial similarity is this: just as the donkey lacks a reason for preferring one haybale over the other, so too God lacks a rational basis for choosing any unsurpassable world over all of the others. However, some authors think that even if God lacks a reason for selecting one unsurpassable world over another, it does not follow that God acts irrationally. Strickland (2006) defends the claim that it is rational for God to choose randomly. (For criticisms, see Kraay 2008a.) A different model holds that in this case, it is rational for God to just pick a world, in the sense defended by Ullman-Margalit and Morgenbesser (1977). (See Murphy 2017, 40 and Garcia 1992, 198–199). If any such choice procedure is rationally defensible, then it can be harnessed to argue that God meets the responsiveness-to-reasons requirement for freedom, at least in a certain way.

Recently, several authors have developed more robust models of how God can freely choose between incomparable unsurpassable worlds. They hold that God’s choice can legitimately be driven by God’s brute preferences (Senor 2008, Leftow 2017, Wilson 2022) or because God is impressed by certain features of a world (Pruss 2016), or that God’s choice can be understood as an expression of God’s individuality, personality, or character (Leftow 2019, Draper 2019).[41] It might seem difficult to square these accounts with the responsiveness-to-reasons condition for freedom, because the proffered bases for these choices do not seem rational. There are, however, various ways to respond to this challenge. Leftow (2017) grants that God might not have reasons for his preferences, but holds that it is nevertheless more rational to act on one’s preferences than to ignore them and choose arbitrarily. The same point could be made for the models developed by Pruss (2016) and Draper (2019). For his part, Pruss (2016) argues that God’s being impressed by certain features of a world can constitute a contrastive explanation of why God chose it over other incomparable alternatives, and that this renders God’s choice rationally intelligible.

2.4 Interlude: Modal Collapse

The discussion in section 2.2. assumed that, given theism, it is coherent to picture modal space as including a unique best of all possible worlds as well as a vast array of suboptimal worlds. Likewise, the discussion in section 2.3. assumed that, given theism, it is coherent to picture modal space as including multiple optimal worlds as well as a vast array of suboptimal worlds. But there are reasons to doubt whether these pictures are coherent on theism.

To see why, consider some ways in which modal space is different on theism as opposed to naturalism. Here are two quick examples. On naturalism, it is very plausible that some evils are gratuitous, either in the actual world or in other possible worlds. But many authors have held that if theism is true, then gratuitous evil is impossible: it exists in no possible world. Meanwhile, it is widely held that if theism is true, then it is possible to have a personal relationship with God – but of course this is impossible on naturalism. In short, if God exists, then some things that would otherwise have been possible are not possible, and vice versa. Thomas Morris connects these ideas by saying that God is “a delimiter of possibilities” (1987, 48); Brian Leftow illuminates them with the image of God’s “modal footprint” (2005, 96; 2010, 30). Morris extends this thought to worlds as follows:

If there is a being who exists necessarily, and is necessarily omnipotent, omniscient, and good, then many states of affairs which otherwise would represent genuine possibilities, and which by all non-theistic tests of logic and semantics do represent possibilities, are strictly impossible in the strongest sense. In particular, worlds containing certain sorts of disvalue or evil are metaphysically ruled out by the nature of God, divinely precluded from the realm of real possibility (48).

What sorts of worlds are possible on naturalism but impossible on theism? Alvin Plantinga thinks that on theism, modal space includes no worlds that fail to be ‘very good’:

[A]ll possible worlds … are very good. For God is unlimited in goodness and holiness, as well as in power and knowledge; these properties, furthermore, are essential to him; and this means, I believe, that God not only has created [i.e. actualized] a world that is very good, but that there aren’t any conditions under which he would have created a world that is less than very good … The class of possible worlds God’s love and goodness prevents him from actualizing is empty. All possible worlds, we might say, are eligible worlds: worlds that God’s goodness, mercy, and love would permit him to actualize (2004, 8).

While Plantinga thinks that on theism, all worlds are ‘very good’, it might seem natural to set the bar even higher. As we have seen, some authors in the literature on divine freedom think that, given God’s perfect goodness and rationality, God must choose an unsurpassable world. This is, of course, the highest possible bar. But on this view, it’s tempting to think that surpassable worlds are not genuine possibilities on theism after all. If there is only one unique best of all possible worlds (the scenario discussed in 2.1.), then, on this way of thinking, total modal collapse ensues: on theism, there is only one possible world, and nothing could be otherwise than it is.[42] If there are multiple unsurpassable worlds (in any of the scenarios set out in 2.2.) then partial modal collapse ensues: on theism, there are no surpassable worlds in modal space, only an array of unsurpassable ones. In the former scenario, the lone world turns out to be only trivially the ‘best’, and in the latter scenarios, the worlds in modal space turn out to be only trivially ‘unsurpassable’. Ideas along these lines are briefly noted in Gale (1991, 31–32), Garcia (1992, 204), Wainwright (1996, 127), and Wierenga (2007, 208), and more developed arguments in this vein are offered by Resnick (1973) and Heller (1999).

Considerations like these have been marshalled into an argument against theism. In an important paper, Guleserian (1983) holds that our modal intuitions strongly suggest that there are indeed surpassable worlds in modal space. If the existence of God, as traditionally construed, is incompatible with there being such worlds, then these modal intuitions count against theism. For responses and discussion, see Garcia (1984), Tidman (1993), Almeida (2011), Kraay (2011b), and Mooney (2015). Bracketing this argument, it’s clear that partial modal collapse reduces the world-actualizing alternatives available to God, and total modal collapse eliminates them entirely. Accordingly, these scenarios imperil the model of divine freedom that requires alternate possibilities. However, modal collapse scenarios do not threaten models of divine freedom that instead privilege the lack of external constraints, responsiveness to reasons, or ultimate sourcehood.

2.5 Divine Freedom if there is an Infinite Hierarchy of Increasingly Better Worlds

Suppose that there are no unsurpassable worlds, but that there is, instead, an infinite hierarchy of increasingly better worlds. This appears to be the dominant view in contemporary analytic philosophy of religion. (See, for example, Plantinga 1974, 61; Schlesinger 1977; Forrest 1981; Reichenbach 1982, 121–9; Swinburne 1979, 114–5; and Rubio 2020.) Many philosophers hold that God’s choice of a world on this view can properly be thought free. Accounts of divine freedom against this ontological backdrop are generally developed in response to an argument for atheism called the problem of no best world, and we turn to this now.[43]

Various authors have suggested that, given an infinite hierarchy of increasingly better worlds, and given some putatively plausible principles about improvability, it can be shown that God does not exist. (This argument is advanced in various ways by Grover 1988, 2003, 2004; Rowe 1993, 1994, 2002, 2004; Sobel 2004, pp. 468–479; and Wielenberg 2004). The core of this argument can be expressed with reference to the following inconsistent set of propositions:

NBW
For every world w that is within God’s power to actualize, there is a better world, x, that God has the power to actualize instead.
P1
If it is possible for the product of a world-actualizing action performed by some being to have been better, then, ceteris paribus, it is possible for that being’s action to have been (morally or rationally) better.
P2
If it is possible for the world-actualizing action performed by some being to have been (morally or rationally) better, then, ceteris paribus, it is possible for that being to have been better.
G
There possibly exists a being who is essentially unsurpassable in power, knowledge, goodness, and rationality.

Defenders of this argument urge that since this set is inconsistent, and since P1 and P2 are plausible, defenders of NBW ought to reject G. This amounts to an a priori argument for the impossibility of an essentially unsurpassable God on NBW.[44]

Those who are committed to both NBW and G can respond in several ways. First, they can reverse the argument, by holding that G is more plausible than the conjunction of P1 and P2. Second, they can criticize P2. Since these criticisms do not typically invoke divine freedom, they are not discussed further here.

Some of the most prominent responses to this argument target P1, and these sometimes involve or suggest claims about divine freedom. For example, Bruce Langtry (2008, 74–78) explicitly invokes satisficing. He asks what a correct theory of morality should say about agents – divine or otherwise – who are forced to choose one item from an infinite series of good and increasingly better outcomes. He answers:

It should recommend that they satisfice – that is, that they select some good state of affairs even though they could select a better one. Therefore it should not also recommend, of each available good state of affairs, that they not select that one. Therefore it should not declare that, whichever state of affairs they select, there is at least one alternative member of the hierarchy such that selecting it would be a morally better action (78).

Langtry similarly argues that a correct theory of rationality should recommend that agents in such situations satisfice (76–7). In short, then, Langtry denies (P1) on the grounds that God must and can satisfice by selecting a world that is surpassable, but good enough. What sorts of worlds are good enough? Those which are: “non-disappointing in the light of the values that underlie the ranking of worlds, and moreover … abundantly better than those worlds that only just barely escape the accusation that they are disappointing” (81).[45]

On Langtry’s view, God cannot choose a world that fails to be good enough. If alternate possibilities are required for freedom, then God cannot be said to freely choose a good enough world in lieu of a non-good-enough world. If, as Langtry suggests, God can choose any of the good enough worlds, and again, if alternate possibilities are required for freedom, then God can be said to freely choose a good enough world in lieu of all the other good enough worlds. On models of divine freedom that prioritize lack of external constraint, reasons-responsiveness, and ultimate sourcehood, it seems that God can be deemed free in both senses: God freely selects a good enough world in lieu of a non-good-enough world, and God freely selects one good enough world in lieu of all the other good enough worlds. (Of course, this solution will only work if divine satisficing is defensible, and as noted above, this has been contested.)

Finally, it’s worth noting that a version of the problem of modal collapse also arises for any model on which God partitions the set of possible worlds into those that are good enough and those which are not. Given theism, if God cannot choose a world below the threshold, then it seems that all the worlds below it are not genuine possibilities after all: God’s ‘modal footprint’ precludes them entirely. And, of course, one might hold that this unacceptably violates our modal intuitions to the contrary.

2.6 Divine Freedom and the Appropriateness of Thanking, Praising, and Worshipping God.

God’s actions are typically thought worthy of thanks and praise only if they are free. If this is correct, then any plausible model of divine freedom supplies a necessary condition for an account of the appropriateness of thanking and praising God for his actions. Moreover, this can also ground an account of the appropriateness of worshiping God, since worship typically involves giving thanks and offering praise for God’s actions. On the other hand, any argument against divine freedom can likewise be extended to target the propriety or intelligibility of thanking God and praising God’s actions – and, by extension, the propriety or intelligibility of worshipping God.

Some authors think that the freedom needed for thanks and praise involves the availability of alternate possibilities. Rowe, for example, thinks that “non-libertarian notions of freedom in which God may be said to be free … are insufficient to support our being thankful and grateful to God” (2004, 7),[46] and Frances Howard-Snyder says that “[i]f an agent is worthy of thanks and praise – as God surely is – then he could have acted differently” (2017, 656).[47] But of course, defenders of rival models of divine freedom can hold that their models satisfy the necessary condition for judging God’s actions worthy of thanks or praise.[48]

It’s important to note that God can be thought praiseworthy, or worthy of worship, quite apart from his actions. (See, for example, Swinburne 1977, 292; Rogers 2008, 195–6; Franks 2015, 108). Moreover, Senor explicitly holds that, given this, God can sensibly be praised for who he is even if God is not free.

What makes God praiseworthy is God’s power together with God’s nature as fair, merciful, and loving – God’s embodying all that is valuable. God’s nature as both the source of all that is and as a benevolent Creator is what makes God worthy of our praise. This sense of praiseworthiness does depend on God’s naturally treating us a certain way, but it does not depend on God's freely treating us that way (185).[49]

Senor also holds that God can sensibly be thanked for his actions, even if they are unfree. He imagines the case of a benevolent aunt who frequently sends generous gifts out of concern for your well-being, but who is “not really able to resist” doing so, given her upbringing and strong religious convictions (186). Senor thinks that it is nevertheless be entirely appropriate – and indeed your duty – to thank your aunt. Likewise, Senor thinks, it is entirely proper to thank God for what God has done, even if it was not done freely. While Senor’s analogy of the benevolent aunt appears to invoke a conception of freedom that requires alternate possibilities, he seems to hold that it can be appropriate to thank God for what he has done even if God is unfree on other models of freedom. The bottom line, for Senor, seems to be that thanks are due whenever benefits are intentionally bestowed, whether or not they are bestowed freely.

2.7 Divine Freedom and Arguments For and Against Theism

There are, of course, many arguments for and against the existence of God. This section sets out some important connections between some of these arguments and divine freedom. Some of these were mentioned above; others were not.

Some arguments for the non-existence of God seek to show that some divine attribute that is plausibly thought essential is incoherent, or else that it cannot be exemplified by God. Freedom is generally thought to be an essential attribute of God, so it if can be shown that this attribute is incoherent, or that it cannot be exemplified by God, then this, in turn, shows that God does not exist. The models of divine freedom set out in sections 1.1–1.4 can be understood as ways to defend the claim that divine freedom is coherent, or that God can properly be thought free – and as such, they can be deployed in response to such arguments.

Other arguments for the non-existence of God seek to show that there is a logical conflict between two or more divine attributes that are plausibly thought essential. For example, some philosophers have argued that there is a conflict between omnipotence and moral perfection, if these are both held to be essential attributes. This was discussed in section 2.1, together with various responses – and their implications for divine freedom.

Philosophers have long discussed whether divine foreknowledge threatens human freedom. (See the entry on foreknowledge and free will.) Although it has seen surprisingly little discussion, a parallel issue arises for divine foreknowledge: if God infallibly foreknows what he will do at some future time, can his action at that time be deemed free? If not, then there is a conflict between omniscience and divine freedom – and this can also motivate an argument against any conception of theism that takes both of these to be essential attributes of God. Richard Swinburne (1977, 175ff) accepts that foreknowledge conflicts with divine freedom, but since he aims to defend the coherence of theism, he holds that God voluntarily limits his knowledge in order to preserve his freedom. Swinburne insists that, despite this self-limitation, God can nevertheless know what will happen in the future whenever these events are determined by past states of the universe and the laws of nature. But Michael Martin objects that God cannot know even this, since God – on Swinburne’s account – cannot foreknow whether he will intervene in the natural order (1990, 298). Accordingly, Martin thinks, even on Swinburne’s attenuated conception of omniscience, there remains a conflict between this attribute and divine freedom. Martin also argues that on Swinburne’s conception of omniscience, God cannot know the long-term consequences of his own free actions. Moreover, he continues, God cannot know the overall moral status of his free actions, since this is determined (at least in part) by their consequences (300–1). Accordingly, Martin thinks he has identified a further conflict between divine freedom and (attenuated) omniscience. (For further criticisms of Swinburne, see Fouts 1993).

Other arguments for atheism hold that there is a conflict between some claim(s) about God and some claim(s) about modal space. In sections 2.2, 2.3, and 2.5, we looked at three rival models of modal space. As we saw, it has been claimed that each of these models conflicts with divine freedom. If there is exactly one unsurpassable world, it has been held that God cannot be free with respect to choosing it. If there are multiple unsurpassable worlds, this has been thought to threaten divine freedom in two ways: (a) some have held that God cannot freely choose an unsurpassable world in lieu of a surpassable one; and (b) some have held that God’s choice of one unsurpassable world in lieu of all the other unsurpassable ones cannot be deemed free. Finally, if every world is surpassable, it has been held that God cannot be free. These, then, are all arguments for the incompatibility between divine freedom and some model of modal space. As we saw, defenders of theism have responded in various ways. (Also, as we saw in section 2.4, the intuition that modal space contains surpassable worlds has been held to count against theism.)

Still other arguments for atheism hold that there is a conflict between some claim(s) about God and some feature(s) of the actual world. Arguments from evil take this form. (See the entry on the problem of evil.) As noted in section 1.1, an important response to such arguments invokes the value of libertarian free will for human beings. And this, in turn, has led some philosophers to think that God must have libertarian free will too.

Finally, here are two connections between divine freedom and arguments for God’s existence. Ontological arguments for God’s existence typically involve a conception of God as the greatest conceivable, or greatest possible, being – and this notion is often held to include essential moral perfection (See Flint 1983, Morriston 1985, and Guleserian 1985.) But as we saw in section 2.1, essential moral perfection has been thought to conflict with divine freedom. Second, Kremers (2024) argues that certain a posteriori arguments for God’s existence, such as moral arguments and fine-tuning arguments, are more plausible if God lacks the power to refrain from creating anything contingent than if God is thought to have this power. If this is correct, and if God’s having this power is required for freedom, then these arguments’ plausibility is purchased at the expense of divine freedom.

Bibliography

  • Adams, Robert, 1972, “Must God Create the Best?”, Philosophical Review, 81: 317–332.
  • Almeida, Michael, 2011, “Theistic Modal Realism?”, Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion, 3: 1–15.
  • Alston, William, 1988, “Divine and Human Action”, in Thomas V. Morris (ed.), Divine and Human Action: Essays in the Metaphysics of Theism, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 257–280.
  • Basinger, David, 1983, “In What Sense Must God Be Omnibenevolent?”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 14: 3–15.
  • –––, 1985, “In What Sense Must God do His Best: A Response to Hasker”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 18: 161–164.
  • Bergmann, Michael, and Cover, Jan A., 2006, “Divine Responsibility without Divine Freedom”, Faith and Philosophy, 23: 381–408.
  • Bourget, David, and Chalmers, David, 2023, “Philosophers on Philosophy: The 2020 PhilPapers Survey”, Philosophers’ Imprint, 23: 1–53.
  • Byerly, T. Ryan, 2017, “The All-Powerful, Perfectly Good, and Free God”, Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion 8: 16–46.
  • Chang, Ruth, 1997, Incommensurability, Incomparability, and Rational Choice, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Clarke, Randolph, 2003, Libertarian Accounts of Free Will, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Coeuenhoven, Jesse, 2012, “The Necessities of Perfect Freedom”, International Journal of Systematic Theology 14: 396–419.
  • –––, 2016, “The Problem of God’s Immutable Freedom”, in Kevin Timpe and Daniel Speak (eds.), Free Will and Theism: Connections, Contingencies, and Concerns, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 294–312.
  • –––, 2023, “Why Christians Should (Still) Be Compatibilists”, in Aku Visala and Olli-Pekka Vainio (eds.), Theological Perspectives on Free Will: Compatibility, Christology, and Community, London: Routledge, 27–46.
  • Conee, Earl, 1994, “The Nature and the Impossibility of Moral Perfection”, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 54: 815–825.
  • Daeley, Justin, 2021, Why God Must Do What is Best: A Philosophical Investigation of Theistic Optimism, London: Bloomsbury.
  • Director, Samuel, 2017, “Why the Perfect Being Theologian Cannot Endorse the Principle of Alternative Possibilities”, European Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 9: 113–132.
  • Draper, Paul, 2019, “What if God Makes Hard Choices?”, Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion, 9: 18–30.
  • Ekstrom, Laura W., 2021, God, Suffering, and the Value of Free Will, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Fales, Evan, 1994, “Divine Freedom and the Choice of a World”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 35: 65–88.
  • Flint, Thomas, 1983, “The Problem of Divine Freedom”, American Philosophical Quarterly, 20: 255–264.
  • Forrest, Peter, 1982, “The Problem of Evil: Two Neglected Defences”, Sophia, 20: 49–54.
  • Fouts, Avery, 1993, “Divine Self-Limitation in Swinburne’s Doctrine of Omniscience”, Religious Studies, 29: 21–26.
  • Franks, W. Paul, 2015, “Divine Freedom and Free Will Defenses”, The Heythrop Journal, 56: 108–119.
  • Gale, Richard, 1991, On The Nature and Existence of God, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Garcia, Laura L., 1984, “A Response to the Modal Problem of Evil”, Faith and Philosophy, 1: 378–388.
  • –––, 1987, “The Essential Moral Perfection of God”, Religious Studies, 23: 137–144.
  • –––, 1992, “Divine Freedom and Creation”, The Philosophical Quarterly, 42: 191–213.
  • Geach, Peter, 1973, “Omnipotence”, Philosophy, 48: 7–20.
  • Grover, Stephen, 1988, “Why only the Best is Good Enough”, Analysis, 48: 224.
  • –––, 1998, “Incommensurability and the Best of All Possible Worlds”, The Monist, 81: 648–667.
  • –––, 2003, “This World, ‘Adams Worlds’, and the Best of All Possible Worlds”, Religious Studies, 39: 145–163.
  • –––, 2004, “Rival Creator Arguments and the Best of all Possible Worlds”, Sophia, 43: 101–114.
  • Guleserian, Theodore, 1983, “God and Possible Worlds: The Modal Problem of Evil”, Noûs, 17: 221–238.
  • –––, 1985, “Can Moral Perfection be an Essential Attribute?”, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 46: 219–241.
  • –––, 2000, “Divine Freedom and the Problem of Evil”, Faith and Philosophy, 17: 348–366.
  • Hasker, William, 1984, “Must God do His Best?” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 16: 213–223.
  • Heller, Mark, 2001, “The Worst of All Worlds”, Philosophia, 28: 255–268.
  • Helm, Paul, 1988, “Divine Freedom”, Chapter 10 of Eternal God, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 171–194.
  • –––, 2015, “How Are We to Think of God’s Freedom?”, European Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 7: 49–65.
  • Howard-Snyder, Daniel, 2008, “The Puzzle of Prayers of Thanksgiving and Praise”, in Yujin Nagasawa and Erik Wielenberg (eds.), New Waves in Philosophy of Religion, New York: Palgrave-Macmillan, 125–149.
  • Howard-Snyder, Daniel and Howard-Snyder, Frances, 1994, “How an Unsurpassable Being can Create a Surpassable World”, Faith and Philosophy, 11: 260–268.
  • Howard-Snyder, Frances, 2017, “Divine Freedom”, Topoi, 36: 651–656.
  • Johnston, Mark, 2019, “Why Did the One Not Remain within Itself?”, Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion, 9: 106–164.
  • Keller, J. Gregory, 2010, “On Perfect Goodness”, Sophia, 49: 29–36.
  • Kittle, Simon, 2016, “Possibilities for Divine Freedom”, Roczniki Filozoficzne, 64: 93–123.
  • –––, 2022, “Against Synchronic Free Will: Or, Why a Personal, Free God must be Temporal”, in Simon Kittle and Georg Gasser (eds.), The Divine Nature: Personal and A-Personal Perspectives, New York: Routledge, 176-194.
  • Kraay, Klaas, 2008a, “Can God Choose a World at Random?”, in Yujin Nagasawa and Erik Wielenberg (eds.), New Waves in Philosophy of Religion, New York: Palgrave-Macmillan, 22–35.
  • –––, 2008b, “Creation, Actualization, and God’s Choice Among Possible Worlds”, Philosophy Compass, 3: 854–72.
  • –––, 2010, “The Problem of No Best World”, in Charles Taliaferro and Paul Draper (eds.), A Companion to Philosophy of Religion, 2nd edition, Oxford: Wiley-Blackwell, 481-491.
  • –––, 2011a, “Incommensurability, Incomparability, and God’s Choice of a World”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 69: 91–102.
  • –––, 2011b, “Theism and Modal Collapse”, American Philosophical Quarterly, 48: 361–372.
  • –––, 2013, “Can God Satisfice?”, American Philosophical Quarterly, 50: 399–410.
  • –––, 2021, “Is Motivated Submaximization Good Enough for God?”, Religious Studies, 57: 403–417.
  • Kremers, Philipp, 2024, “Natural Theology and Divine Freedom”, Sophia, 63: 135–150.
  • Kretzmann, Norman, 1991, “A General Problem of Creation: Why Would God Create Anything at All?”, in Scott MacDonald (ed.), Being and Goodness: The Concept of the Good in Metaphysics and Philosophical Theology, Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 208–228.
  • Langtry, Bruce, 2008, God, the Best, and Evil, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Leftow, Brian, 2005, “The Ontological Argument”, in William Wainwright (ed.), The Oxford Handbook of Philosophy of Religion, New York: Oxford University Press, 80–115.
  • –––, 2010, “Necessity”, in Charles Taliaferro and Chad Meister (eds.), The Cambridge Companion to Philosophical Theology, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 15–30.
  • –––, 2017, “Two Pictures of Divine Choice”, in Hugh McCann (ed.), Free Will and Classical Theism: The Significance of Freedom in Perfect Being Theology. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 245–268.
  • –––, 2023, “Divine Freedom”, in Joseph Campbell, Kristin M. Mickelson, and V. Alan White (eds.), A Companion to Free Will, Hoboken, NJ: Wiley-Blackwell, 169–183.
  • Lehe, Robert, 1986, “Discussion: God's Perfection and Freedom: a Reply to Morriston”, Faith and Philosophy, 6: 319–323.
  • Levine, Michael, 1996, “Must God Create the Best?”, Sophia, 35: 28–34.
  • Lewis, David, 1993, “Evil for Freedom’s Sake?”, Philosophical Papers, 22: 149–172.
  • Manis, R. Zacharay, 2011, “Could God Do Something Evil? A Molinist Solution to the Problem of Divine Freedom”, Faith and Philosophy, 28: 209–223.
  • Mann, William, 1991, “The Best of all Possible Worlds”, in Scott MacDonald (ed.), Being and Goodness: The Concept of the Good in Metaphysics and Philosophical Theology, Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 250–277.
  • Markosian, N. (2012) “Agent Causation as the Solution to all the Compatibilists’ Problems”, Philosophical Studies, 157: 383–398.
  • Martin, Michael, 1990, Atheism: a Philosophical Justification, Philadelphia: Temple University Press.
  • Mason, David R., 1982, “Can God Be Both Perfect and Free?”, Religious Studies, 18: 191–200.
  • Mavrodes, George, 1963, “Some Puzzles Concerning Omnipotence”, Philosophical Review, 72: 221–223.
  • Mawson, T.J., 2002, “Omnipotence and Necessary Moral Perfection are Compatible: a Reply to Morriston”, Religious Studies, 38: 215–223.
  • –––, 2005a, “Freedom, Human and Divine”, Religious Studies, 41: 55–69.
  • –––, 2005b, “Perfect Freedom, Perfect Goodness, Necessity”, Chapter 3 of Belief in God: An Introduction to the Philosophy of Religion, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 2017, “Divine Free Will”, in Kevin Timpe, Meghan Griffith, and Neil Levy (eds.), The Routledge Companion to Free Will, New York: Routledge, 552–561.
  • –––, 2023, “Why Might God Create?”, Religious Studies, 59: 223–238.
  • McCann, Hugh, 2013, “Divine Nature and Divine Will”, Sophia, 52: 77–94.
  • Menssen, Sandra, and Sullivan, Thomas, 1995, “Must God Create?”, Faith and Philosophy, 12: 321–341.
  • Mooney, Justin, 2015, “Best Feasible Worlds: Divine Freedom and Leibniz’s Lapse”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 77: 219–229.
  • Morris, Thomas and Menzel, Christopher, 1986, “Absolute Creation”, American, Philosophical Quarterly, 23: 353–362.
  • Morris, Thomas V, 1987, Anselmian Explorations: Essays in Philosophical Theology, Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
  • Morriston, Wes, 1985, “Is God Significantly Free?”, Faith and Philosophy, 2: 257–264.
  • –––, 2000, “What is So Good about Moral Freedom?”, The Philosophical Quarterly, 50: 344–358.
  • –––, 2001, “Omnipotence and Necessary Moral Perfection: Are They Compatible?”, Religious Studies, 37: 143–160.
  • –––, 2006, “Is God Free? Reply to Wierenga”, Faith and Philosophy, 23: 93–98.
  • Murphy, Mark, 2017, God’s Own Ethics: Norms of Divine Agency and the Argument from Evil, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Murray, Michael, 2005, “Sponteneity and Freedom in Leibniz”, in Donald Rutherford and Jan A. Cover (eds.), Leibniz: Nature and Freedom, New York: Oxford University Press, 194–216.
  • Nagasawa, Yujin, 2017, Maximal God: A New Defence of Perfect Being Theism, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Oppy, Graham, 2014, “Freedom”, Chapter 9 of Describing Gods, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 253–268.
  • Page, Meghan, 2022, “Creativity in Creation”, Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion, 10: 120–144.
  • Pawl, Timothy, and Timpe, Kevin, (2016), “Freedom and the Incarnation”, Philosophy Compass, 11: 743–756.
  • Pearce, Kenneth L. and Pruss, Alexander, 2012, “Understanding Omnipotence”, Religious Studies, 48: 403–414.
  • Penner, Myron A., 2014, “Incommensurability, Incomparability, and Rational World-Choice”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 75: 13–25.
  • Pike, Nelson, 1969, “Omnipotence and God’s Ability to Sin”, American Philosophical Quarterly, 6: 208–216.
  • Plantinga, Alvin, 1974, The Nature of Necessity, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • –––, 2004, “Supralapsarianism, or ‘O Felix Culpa’”, in Peter van Inwagen (ed.), Christian Faith and the Problem of Evil, Grand Rapids: Eerdmans, 1–25.
  • Pruss, Alexander, 2016, “Divine Creative Freedom”, Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion, 7: 213–238.
  • Quinn, Philip, 1982, “God, Moral Perfection, and Possible Worlds”, in Frederick Sontag and M. Darrol Bryant (eds.), God: The Contemporary Discussion, New York: The Rose of Sharon Press, 197–213.
  • Rasmussen, Joshua, 2013, “On the Value of Freedom To Do Evil”, Faith and Philosophy, 30: 418–428.
  • Raz, Joseph, 1986, The Morality of Freedom, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Reichenbach, Bruce, 1982, Evil and a Good God, New York: Fordham University Press.
  • Rescher, Nicholas, 1969, “Choice without Preference: A Study of the History and of the Logic of the Problem of ‘Burdian’s Ass’”, in Essays in Philosophical Analysis, Pittsburgh: University of Pittsburgh Press, 111–157.
  • Resnick, Lawrence, 1973, “God and the Best Possible World”, American Philosophical Quarterly, 10: 313–317.
  • Rice, Rebekah, 2016, “Reasons and Divine Action: A Dilemma”, in Kevin Timpe and Daniel Speak (eds.), Free Will and Theism: Connections, Contingencies, and Concerns, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 258–276.
  • Rogers, Katherin, 2008, Anselm on Freedom, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Rowe, William L., 1993, “The Problem of Divine Perfection and Freedom”, in Eleonore Stump (ed.), Reasoned Faith: Essays in Philosophical Theology in Honor of Norman Kretzmann, Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 223–233.
  • –––, 1994, “The Problem of No Best World”, Faith and Philosophy, 11: 269–271.
  • –––, 1997, “Clarke and Leibniz on Divine Perfection and Freedom”, Enlightenment and Dissent, 16 (Special Issue on Samuel Clarke): 60–82.
  • –––, 2003, “Can God be Free?”, Faith and Philosophy, 19: 405–424.
  • –––, 2004, Can God be Free?, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Rubio, Daniel, 2020, “In Defence of No Best World”, Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 98: 811–825.
  • Schellenberg, John L., 2007, “The Free Will Offence”, Chapter 12 of The Wisdom to Doubt, Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 270–290.
  • Schlesinger, George, 1977, Religion and Scientific Method, Dordrecht: Reidel.
  • Senor, Thomas, 2008, “Defending Divine Freedom”, Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion, 1: 168–195.
  • Sobel, Jordan Howard, 2004, Logic and Theism: Arguments For and Against Beliefs in God, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Strickland, Lloyd, 2006, “God’s Problem of Multiple Choice”, Religious Studies, 42: 141–157.
  • Swinburne, Richard, 1977, The Coherence of Theism, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 1979, The Existence of God, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Talbott, Thomas, 1988, “On The Divine Nature And The Nature Of Divine Freedom”, Faith and Philosophy, 5: 3–24.
  • –––, 2009, “God, Freedom, and Human Agency”, Faith and Philosophy, 26: 378–397.
  • Thomas, Mark L., 1996, “Robert Adams and the Best Possible World”, Faith and Philosophy, 13: 252–259.
  • Tidman, Paul, 1993, “The Epistemology of Evil Possibilities”, Faith and Philosophy, 10: 181–197.
  • Timpe, Kevin, 2011, “An Analogical Approach to Divine Freedom”, Yearbook of the Irish Philosophical Society, 152–163.
  • –––, 2014, Free Will in Philosophical Theology, New York: Bloomsbury.
  • –––, 2016a, “God’s Freedom, God’s Character”, in Kevin Timpe and Daniel Speak (eds.), Free Will and Theism: Connections, Contingencies, and Concerns, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 277–293.
  • –––, 2016b, “The Best Thing in Life is Free: The Compatibility of Divine Freedom and God’s Essential Moral Perfection”, in Hugh J. McCann (ed.), Free Will and Classical Theism: The Significance of Freedom in Perfect Being Theology, New York: Oxford University Press, 133–151.
  • Tucker, Chris, 2016, “Satisficing and Motivated Submaximization (in the Philosophy of Religion)”, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 93: 127–143.
  • Ullmann-Margalit, Edna and Morgenbesser, Sidney, 1977, “Picking and Choosing”, Social Research: An International Quarterly, 44: 757–785.
  • Vargas, Manuel, 2016, “The Runeberg Problem: Theism, Libertarianism, and Motivated Reasoning”, in Kevin Timpe and Daniel Speak (eds.), Free Will and Theism: Connections, Contingencies, and Concerns, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 27–47.
  • Wainwright, William, 1996, “Jonathan Edwards, William Rowe, and the Necessity of Creation”, in Jeffrey Jordan and Daniel Howard-Snyder (eds.), Faith, Freedom, and Rationality: Philosophy of Religion Today, Lanham: Roman & Littlefield, 119–133.
  • Wielenberg, Erik, 2004, “A Morally Unsurpassable God Must Create the Best”, Religious Studies, 40: 43–62.
  • Wierenga, Edward, 1989, The Nature of God: An Inquiry into Divine Attributes, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • –––, 2002, “The Freedom of God”, Faith and Philosophy, 19: 425–436.
  • –––, 2007, “Perfect Goodness and Divine Freedom”, Philosophical Books, 48: 207–216.
  • Wilson, Luke, 2022, “Perfect Freedom and God’s Hard Choices”, Faith and Philosophy, 39: 291–312.
  • Zagzebski, Linda Trinkhaus, 2004, Divine Motivation Theory, New York: Cambridge University Press.

Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

The author thanks Scott Davison, Tim Mawson, and Kevin Timpe for helpful comments on an earlier draft.

Copyright © 2025 by
Klaas Kraay <kraay@ryerson.ca>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free