1. This entry presumes neither that God exists, nor that God does not exist. We occasionally follow tradition by using masculine pronouns for God, but this is not meant to suggest that God has either a sex or a gender. This definition of theism, evidently, makes no such commitment.

2. Zagzebski (2004, Chapter 7) defends the rival position that God has no will, but for criticisms, see Leftow (2023).

3. Discussions of human free will generally hold that it is required for moral responsibility. (See section 2.1 of the entry on free will, and the entry on moral responsibility.) In the discussion of divine freedom, it is widely held that God’s perfect goodness includes moral perfection, and that moral perfection requires moral responsibility, and that moral responsibility, in turn, requires freedom. (There are, of course, some important dissenters. Murphy (2017) denies that God’s perfect goodness requires moral perfection, and Bergmann and Cover (2006) deny that divine moral responsibility requires divine freedom, at least of a certain sort.)

4. Kittle mentions a fifth motivation – aseity – but this is omittted here, since it pertains to God’s decision to create, not to the more general question of whether God is free.

5. For example, one translation of Psalm 135: 5-6 reads: “For I have known that the Lord is great, and our God is before all gods. All things whatsoever that he willed, the Lord did: in heaven, on earth, in the sea, and in all the deep places” (Catholic Public Domain Version).

6. Here are a few examples: Rowe (1997), Murray (2005), and Rogers (2008, Chapter 10).

7. On this topic, see, for example, Kretzmann (1991), Menssen and Sullivan (1995), Johnston (2019), and Mawson (2023). This aside is being set aside because it is a specific case of the more general question of what sort of world God will actualize, which is discussed in sections 2.2, 2.3, and 2.5.

8. Timpe (2011) defends analogical predication, but later holds that it is not needed to understand divine freedom (2014, 113).

9. Couenhoven (2016, 309) and Howard-Snyder (2017, 665), while defending different models of divine freedom from each other, nevertheless agree that a unified account of divine and human freedom is preferable. Other authors are more willing to have one model of freedom for human beings, and a different one for God.

10. It is also fair to say that the contemporary literature on divine freedom exhibits fewer positions, and is less intricate overall, than the contemporary literature on human freedom.

11. See https://survey2020.philpeople.org/survey/results/correlations, and for a discussion of this survey, see Bourget and Chalmers (2023). Vargas (2016) argues that theistic philosophers are likely to be engaged in motivated reasoning on behalf of libertarianism.

12. For criticisms of the idea that this sort of human freedom is very valuable, see Schellenberg (2007, Chapter 12; 2013) and Ekstrom (2021, Chapter 2). Appeals to human free will are, of course, irrelevant to arguments for atheism that appeal to (so-called) natural evil – the involuntary, unjustified suffering that is due to purely natural forces.

13. One way to resist this idea is to hold that God always has more than one perfectly good action available. For more on divine choice between equally good (or incomparable) alternatives, see Section 2.3 below.

14. This view is generally associated with incompatibilist (libertarian) accounts of freedom, but as O’Connor notes in the entry on free will, some compatibilists endorse agent-causation as well. See, for example, Markosian (2012).

15. Rice herself defends a different account on which God’s reasons just are causes.

16. As noted above, compatibilists can deny this.

17. Morriston (2000) offers a structurally similar thought experiment, which Timpe (2014) criticizes.

18. Morriston (2000, 2006) dismisses this response on the grounds that the doctrine of divine simplicity is so controversial. But for an attempt to harness it to secure divine freedom, see McCann (2013), and for criticisms, see Helm (2015).

19. See also Conee (1994)

20. For a sustained defence of this strategy, see Nagasawa (2017).

21. This strategy of treating God as only contingently omnipotent is not discussed, since it isn’t clear that there are any defenders of this view.

22. For arguments in a similar vein, see Manis (2011) and Howard-Snyder (2017). For criticisms of Guleserian, see Rasmussen (2013) and Franks (2015). For a standalone defence of essential moral perfection, see Garcia (1987).

23. Wierenga (1989, 204-5) adopts this stategy. This move is structurally equivalent to an important response to the ‘paradox of the stone’, which is an argument against omnipotence. According to this argument, God either has or lacks the power to create a stone that he then cannot lift. Either way, the argument continues, there is something God cannot do, in which case God is not omnipotent. The relevant response holds that ‘creating an unliftable stone’ is a logically impossible task for God (Mavrodes 1963).

24. This represents a reversal of his position in Mawson (2002). Timpe (2014) endorses Mawson’s move. For criticisms of it, see Zagzebski (2004) and Byerly (2017).

25. Wierenga (1989, 204) calls Pike’s view “outrageously unorthodox”.

26. In a similar spirit, Byerly (2017) argues that while God has the ability to act in morally imperfect ways, God lacks the ability to will to act in such ways (Byerly 2017). This move, however, seems to merely push the problem back a step, because it’s natural to think that an omnipotent being would have the power to will to act in such a way. Byerly disagrees, however, saying that God’s lacking the ability to will in this way counts for omnipotence, not against it, on the grounds that God, on this view, is maximally in control of God’s willing. Byerly further argues that God’s having the ability to act in ways inconsistent with moral perfection is sufficient to make God free in the sense of having alternate possibilities – even if God necessarily never wills to use this ability. Of course one might respond that these are not genuine alternate possibilities, if God necessarily never wills to act in such ways. That aside, God’s necessarily never willing to use this ability is consistent with models of divine freedom that prioritize the lack of external constraints, responsiveness to (morally relevant) reasons, and ultimate sourcehood.

27. Morriston (2001) criticizes this move, though not Talbott explicitly. Morriston thinks that on this view, God lacks the power to exercise the relevant powers – and holds that this is a problem for omnipotence.

28. Some material in this section is adapted from Kraay (2008b).

29. For important criticisms of this model, see Page (2022).

30. These two ways, of course, do not preclude each other: there may be some duplicate (or near-duplicate) worlds, and also some incomparable worlds, atop the hierarchy.

31. Section 2.4 will be an interlude, where the question of whether theism leads to modal collapse is discussed.

32. Adams’ argument is indirect because he criticizes two ways one might defend the claim that God will choose the best possible world, and it is partial because there are other ways to defend this claim. Those who agree with Adams that God can choose a suboptimal world include Bergmann and Cover (2006); Franks (2015); Tucker (2016); Leftow (2017); and Mawson (2017).

33. Hasker (1984) responds; Basinger (1985) replies.

34. See Quinn (1982); Wielenberg (2004); Sobel (2004); Flint (1983); Swinburne (1979, 134); Grover (1988, 2003, 2004), and Wierenga (2002).

35. David Lewis (1993, n. 16) seems to have been the first to explicitly refer to Adams’ God as a satisficer.

36. The bullet points below are taken from Kraay (2011a). Penner (2014) responds to Kraay (2011a).

37. Note that my use of terms here differs from how they are used in the entry on value incommensurability.

38. It is assumed here that there is one stable set of axiological properties that can be used to evaluate both careers: in other words, it is assumed that these careers are commensurable. Perhaps this seems extravagant, given the vast differences between these careers – but the example can easily be adapted to avoid this impression.

39. For criticisms of this sort of move, see Fales (1994) and Grover (1998).

40. For a detailed discussion, see Rescher (1969).

41. Wilson (2022) responds to Draper.

42. For a criticism of this move, see Flint (1983, 259-60).

43. The rest of this section is adapted from Kraay (2010).

44. This is not an argument from evil. First, it proceeds entirely a priori, while arguments from evil generally contain at least one a posteriori premise about the existence, scope, or distribution of evil. Second, this argument concludes that an essentially unsurpassable God is impossible – a much stronger conclusion than arguments from evil can warrant. Third, this argument could still be advanced if evil were metaphysically impossible. It is an argument from improvability, rather than from evil.

45. For a more detailed model of how God can satisfice in this scenario, see Howard-Snyder and Howard-Snyder (1994), and for criticisms of both Langtry and Howard-Snyder and Howard-Snyder, see Kraay (2010).

46. Rowe here assumes that libertarian accounts of freedom must involve alternate possibilities, and that non-libertarian ones needn’t involve them.

47. See also Guleserian (1985); Morriston (1985); Garcia (1992); Howard-Snyder (2008); and Keller (2010).

48. For example, Bergmann and Cover (2006) hold that even if God is not free in the sense of being able to do otherwise, God can properly be deemed responsible for God’s actions on an agent-causal account of responsibility. And, they continue, God’s being responsible in this way is sufficient for God to be thankworthy.

49. In a similar vein, Katherin Rogers says: “God Himself is the good, and is praiseworthy, or better ‘worshipworthy,’ simply for being what He is” (2008, 195-6, as quoted in Daeley 2022, 51). Daeley objects to Senor’s way of carving up the terrain, and holds that God can sensibly be praised not only for who he is, but also for his actions (2022, 48).